Edmund Husserl

First published Fri Aug 8, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Dan Zahavi replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Edmund Husserl (1859–1938) is the founding father of phenomenology and a figure with a decisive impact on the development of twentieth century philosophy. He influenced not only thinkers like Martin Heidegger, Edith Stein, Maurice Merleau-Ponty and Jean-Paul Sartre, but also many other figures in European philosophy. Husserl is primarily known for his analyses of intentionality, perception, temporality, embodiment and intersubjectivity, for his rehabilitation of the lifeworld and his commitment to a form of transcendental idealism and for his criticism of reductionism, objectivism, and scientism. In recent years, his analyses have influenced discussions in social philosophy, philosophy of mind and the cognitive sciences.

1. Life and work

Husserl was born on April 8, 1859, in a Jewish family in Proßnitz, Moravia. The city is currently located in the Czech Republic but was then part of the Austrian Empire. In 1876 Husserl moved to Leipzig to commence university studies in astronomy, mathematics, physics and philosophy. One of his philosophy teachers in Leipzig was Wilhelm Wundt, one of the founders of experimental psychology. In 1878, Husserl continued his studies in mathematics in Berlin under the supervision of Leopold Kronecker and Karl Weierstrass. During his time in Berlin, he became a close friend of Tomáš Masaryk, who later became the first president of Czechoslovakia. In 1881, Husserl left for Vienna to complete his PhD in mathematics. He obtained the degree in January 1883 with a work entitled Contributions to the Calculus of Variations.

Soon after, Husserl started as Weierstrass’ assistant in Berlin. But when Weierstrass became seriously ill, Masaryk suggested that Husserl should return to Vienna to study with the prominent psychologist and philosopher Franz Brentano, the author of Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint (1874). Husserl attended Brentano’s lectures from 1884 to 1886, and they made such an impression on him that he decided to switch to philosophy. Brentano recommended Husserl to his pupil Carl Stumpf in Halle, and it was in Halle that Husserl submitted his habilitation thesis On the Concept of Number in 1887.

After having obtained his habilitation, which was a requirement for a university career, Husserl became a Privatdozent at the University of Halle, where he would spend the next 14 years. In 1891, he published his first book Philosophy of Arithmetic that combined his interests in mathematics, philosophy and psychology and which sought to provide a psychological foundation for mathematics. The book was critically reviewed by Gottlob Frege, who accused Husserl of psychologism (Frege 1894).[1] In the following years, Husserl worked on foundational problems in epistemology and theory of science. His reflections on these themes ultimately led to the publication of the monumental Logical Investigations in 1900–1901, which Husserl himself considered his “breakthrough” to phenomenology (Hua 18/8 [2001/I: 3]). The publication secured Husserl a position at the Georg-August-Universität in Göttingen, where he taught from 1901 to 1916, first as an Extraordinarius Professor, and from 1906 as an Ordinarius Professor. Due to the resounding success of Logical Investigations and because of Husserl’s steadily increasing reputation, a number of young scholars including Adolf Reinach, Alexandre Koyré, Edith Stein, Helmuth Plessner, Moritz Geiger, and Roman Ingarden gathered in Göttingen (Salice 2015 [2020]), and the university quickly became one of the most important centers for philosophy in Germany.

Husserl’s initial criticism of psychologism, his sustained defense of the irreducibility of ideality, and his focus on things as they are encountered in experience were interpreted by many of his early followers as a turn away from the subject and toward the objects and as a legitimization of essentialism (Reinach 1914 [1968]). In the first decade of the twentieth century, Husserl continued to refine and modify his phenomenological approach, and it caused consternation when he in his next major work Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy I (commonly referred to as Ideas I) from 1913 endorsed a form of transcendental idealism. For many of the early phenomenologists, such a move constituted a betrayal of the core ideas of phenomenology, whereas Husserl often complained that their reluctance to follow his transcendental turn simply meant that they had failed to fully understand his philosophical project, had failed to really grasp what phenomenology was all about.

In 1916, Husserl moved to Albert-Ludwigs-Universität Freiburg, where he took over the chair in philosophy from the neo-Kantian Heinrich Rickert. In the years 1916–1918, Edith Stein worked as his assistant. Stein’s primary work was to edit Husserl’s research manuscripts and prepare them for publication. She worked on Husserl’s Ideas II (eventually published in 1952) and on his Lectures on the Phenomenology of the Consciousness of Internal Time, which was published by Martin Heidegger in 1928 (with only the slightest acknowledgment of Stein’s work). Rather than engaging with Stein’s revisions, Husserl tended to produce new texts and in the end this lack of engagement with her work made Stein resign from her position in frustration. In the period 1919–1923, Heidegger then became Husserl’s assistant. Husserl had great hopes for the collaboration and worked hard to ensure that Heidegger would become his successor in Freiburg, but while Heidegger was eager for Husserl to help him secure a permanent position and even dedicated Being and Time “to Edmund Husserl in friendship and admiration”, he also attacked and ridiculed Husserl in his own seminars and letters. As Heidegger wrote to Karl Löwith in 1923,

In the final hours of the seminar, I publicly burned and destroyed the Ideas to such an extent that I dare say that the essential foundations for the whole [of my work] are now cleanly laid out. Looking back from this vantage point to the Logical Investigations, I am now convinced that Husserl was never a philosopher, not even for one second in his life. (quoted in Sheehan 1997: 17)

When Husserl retired in 1928, he was succeeded by Heidegger. Shortly after his retirement, Husserl was invited to Paris to give a series of lectures meant to introduce a French audience to the basic ideas of phenomenology. These lectures were later translated into French by Emmanuel Levinas and Gabrielle Peiffer and published as Cartesian Meditations in 1931. During the thirties, Husserl came to suffer under the German National Socialist regime. Husserl had converted to Protestantism already in 1886, but was now barred from any kind of official academic activity due to his Jewish ancestry, and lost his right to teach and publish, and eventually also his German citizenship. Husserl was deeply affected by this development. As he wrote to his longtime friend Dietrich Mahnke on May 4, 1933,

Finally, in my old age, I had to experience something I had not deemed possible: the erection of a spiritual ghetto, into which I and my children … are to be driven … We are no longer to have the right to call ourselves German; our spiritual work is no longer to be included in German cultural history. It shall only live on with the stamp of “Jewishness”… as a poison that German people should be wary of and that must be eradicated. (Husserl 1994: iii 491–2)

In the same letter, Husserl also expressed bitterness vis-à-vis Heidegger and accused him of not only propagating a caricature of Husserl’s own philosophy, but also of giving vent to more and more explicit antisemitic sentiments (Husserl 1994: iii 493). Despite all, Husserl continued his work, insisting ever more passionately on the relevance of philosophy at a time when Europe was descending into irrationalism. In 1935, he was invited to give lectures in Vienna and Prague, and these lectures constituted the foundation for his last work, The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology (1936). Only the first two parts of Crisis initially appeared in print and were published in a Belgrade philosophy journal.

The books published by Husserl during his lifetime only made up a very small part of his enormous production. He had the habit of writing every day, and when he died on April 27, 1938, these so-called research manuscripts (together with his lectures manuscripts and still unpublished books) amounted to some 45,000 pages. In Husserl’s own estimate, the most important part of his writings was to be found in these manuscripts (Husserl 1994: iii 90). All these writings were, for evident reasons, not safe in Germany. (Almost the entire first edition of the posthumously published work Experience and Judgment, published in Prague in 1939, was destroyed by the Germans after their annexation of Czechoslovakia.) But shortly after Husserl’s death, a young Franciscan, Hermann Leo Van Breda, succeeded in smuggling Husserl’s research manuscripts out of Germany and to safety in a monastery in Belgium. Before the start of the Second World War, the Husserl Archives were established at the Institute of Philosophy in Leuven, where the original manuscripts are still to be found. The first international visitor to the archives was Merleau-Ponty, who in the spring of 1939 gained access to the unpublished third part of Crisis as well as to the typescripts for Ideas II and Experience and Judgment.

At the time of the founding of the archives, the critical edition of Husserl’s works—Husserliana—began. The critical edition, which so far contains forty-four volumes, consists not only of new editions of the works that were published during Husserl’s life, but also, and more importantly, of previously unpublished works, articles, lectures, papers, and research manuscripts. The continuing publication of the Husserliana has made it necessary to revise and modify a number of widespread and dominant interpretations. This is so not only because the new material has offered a plethora of analyses and descriptions that allow for a more precise grasp of Husserl’s phenomenological core concepts, but also because they have disclosed aspects of his thinking, including an interest in facticity, embodiment, sociality, passivity, historicity, and ethics that it would have been difficult to anticipate through a study of the few works published during Husserl’s life.

Husserl’s influence on the development of twentieth-century philosophy has been immense. This is not to say, of course, that everybody agreed with him; but the fact that subsequent phenomenologists, including Heidegger, Stein, Ingarden, Schutz, Fink, Sartre, Merleau-Ponty, Levinas, Gadamer, Ricoeur, Derrida, Henry, and Marion, as well as leading theorists from a whole range of other traditions, including hermeneutics, critical theory, deconstruction, and post-structuralism, felt a need to react and respond to Husserl’s project and program testifies to his importance.

Given its size, how to offer a concise presentation of Husserl’s work? In the following, the focus will be on the development of what is arguably the centerpiece of Husserl’s philosophy, namely his phenomenology.[2] As Husserl’s continuing efforts to write a comprehensive introduction to phenomenology makes clear, he thought of the latter as the cornerstone and framework for whatever other topics he was engaging with philosophically:

Phenomenology in our sense is the science of “origins”, of the “mothers” of all cognition; and it is the maternal ground of all philosophical method: to this ground and to the work in it, everything leads back. (Hua 5/80)

2. Ideality and intentionality in the Logical Investigations

In the preface to the massive 700+ pages Logical Investigations (1900–01), Husserl writes that his overarching aim is to provide a new foundation for logic and epistemology (Hua 18/6 [2001/I: 2]; for in depth discussions of the work, see, e.g., de Boer 1966 [1978], Benoist 2001). The main task of the first part, Prolegomena to Pure Logic, is twofold: To offer a criticism of psychologism and to argue that scientific knowledge presupposes ideality. The position Husserl is targeting claims that the task of epistemology is to investigate the nature of our perceiving, believing, judging, and knowing. Since all of these phenomena are psychical processes, it may seem that only psychology can investigate them. This also holds true for our scientific and logical reasoning, and ultimately logic must therefore be regarded as part of psychology and the laws of logic as psycho-logical regularities, whose nature and validity must be empirically investigated and established (Hua 18/64, 89 [2001/I: 40, 56]).

As Husserl argues, this line of reasoning commits the mistake of ignoring the fundamental difference between the domains of logic and psychology, “between ideal and real laws, between normative and causal regulation, between logical and real necessity, between logical and real grounds” (Hua 18/80 [2001/I: 50]). Logic is not an empirical science and is not concerned with the genesis of spatiotemporal objects or processes, but with the validity of ideal structures and laws. Psychology by contrast is an empirical science that investigates the empirical nature of consciousness. Whereas the domain of logic is characterized by certainty and exactness, the domain of psychology is characterized by the same mere probability as all empirical sciences (Hua 18/181 [2001: I/113–114]). A further mistake made by psychologism is that it doesn’t distinguish sufficiently between the object of knowledge and the act of knowing. Whereas the act of knowing is a subjective process that elapses in time and has a beginning and an end, the objects of logic, the logical truths, theories, principles, propositions, sentences, and proofs are not subjective experiences with temporal duration, but atemporal idealities. When I think of the theorem of Pythagoras and when you think of it, we must be able to think about the same theorem, even if our respective thought processes are different (Hua 19/49, 97–98 [2001/I: 195, 224–225]). If the content of our thought was reducible to our processes of thinking, we would never be able to repeat and retain the same content across numerically different acts. And that would preclude not only ordinary communication and understanding, but also the development of scientific theory. The reduction of atemporal idealities (including the universally valid laws of logic) to temporal psychic processes is consequently not only a category mistake; it also undermines the very possibility of psychologism itself qua scientific theory.

As Husserl then emphasizes, however, even though logic and psychology differ, we are still confronted with the puzzling fact that the objectivity and ideality of logic are known in and by subjective acts of cognition. And he then insists that a comprehensive analysis of the possibility of knowledge calls for a more detailed investigation of the relation between the objective and the subjective (Hua 18/7 [2001/I: 2]). This is precisely the goal of the second part of the Logical Investigations, entitled Investigations into Phenomenology and the Theory of Knowledge, which not only culminates in an extended analysis of intentionality, but also offers a new philosophical method, a method called ‘phenomenology’ (Hua 9/28).

It is in the introduction to the second part of Logical Investigations that we find Husserl’s initial formulation of a phenomenological core idea:

We can absolutely not rest content with “mere words” […]. Meanings inspired only by remote, confused, inauthentic intuitions—if by any intuitions at all—are not enough: we must go back to the “things themselves”. (Hua 19/10 [2001/I: 168])

The central idea articulated in this quote is an aversion against empty speculation and high-flying abstract theorizing and an insistence on the importance of carefully attending to what is actually given with the aim of avoiding what Spiegelberg would later call the “premature straitjacketing of the phenomena by preconceived theories” (Spiegelberg 1972: 308).

This focus on the experiential given had a decisive impact on what is arguably Husserl’s main accomplishment in the Logical Investigations, namely his detailed analysis of intentionality. Every intentional experience is an experience of a specific type, i.e., an experience of hoping, desiring, regretting, affirming, doubting, wondering, fearing, etc., and each of these experiences is characterized by being of or about or directed at an object in a particular and distinctive way. For Husserl, a central task was to analyze these differences in detail, to map out the way they are systematically interrelated, and more generally to inquire into and investigate how objects can appear to us in the way they do and with the meaning they have.

For Husserl, intentionality is a distinctive feature of our experiential life (although he also allows for a subset of non-intentional sensations such as pain or dizziness) (Hua 3/192). It is a feature that is inherent to the conscious states in question, it is an integral part of their being and is not one they only come to possess in virtue of being influenced by an external cause. As Husserl would formulate it in a later text:

The specific experience of this house, this body, of a world as such, is and remains, however, according to its own essential content and thus inseparably, experience “of this house”, this body, this world; this is so for every mode of consciousness which is directed towards an object. It is, after all, quite impossible to describe an intentional experience—even if illusionary, an invalid judgment, or the like—without at the same time describing the object of that consciousness as such. (Hua 9/282; see also Hua 19/451 [2001/II: 133])

One important conceptual distinction drawn by Husserl is between what he calls the matter and the quality of the intentional experience. On the one hand, we have the component that determines not only what the intentional experience is about, but also as what it is intended. Husserl calls this component the matter of the act. Thinking about Bilbao as the de facto capital of the Basque Country and thinking about Bilbao as the city with a Guggenheim Museum designed by Frank Gehry, are intentional experiences with different matters. Occasionally, Husserl also designates the matter of the act as the ideal meaning or sense of the act and argues that the intentional reference to an object is secured through the meaning (Hua 19/54 [2001/I: 198]; Hua 24/53, 150). As he writes “In meaning, a relation to an object is constituted” (Hua 19/59 [2001/I: 201]). Importantly, however, when assigning this important role to meaning, Husserl does not merely have linguistically articulated meanings in mind, since he also operates with notions of pre-predicative and perceptual meaning (Hua 3/285).

On the other hand, we have the component that determines the specific character of the intentional reference. I can doubt, hope or firmly believe that the Frank Gehry designed Guggenheim Museum is located in Bilbao. Husserl calls this component the quality of the act (Hua 19/425–426 [2001/II: 119–120]). The same act-quality can be combined with different matters, and the same matter can be combined with different act-qualities. It is possible to doubt “that the financial crisis will continue”, to doubt “that the election was fair”, or to doubt “that the climate crisis is fake news”, just as it is possible to doubt “that it rains”, hope “that it rains”, or deny “that it rains” (Hua 19/381 [2001/II: 96]). Although the matter and quality are independently variable, they cannot occur independently of each other. You cannot simply judge, or imagine, or fear, nor can you be intentionally directed at a certain object without being directed at the object in a specific manner.

As long as we focus on our ability to mean something, we can make do with the quality-matter dyad, or with what Husserl also calls the intentional essence (Hua 19/431 [2001/I: 122]). But as Husserl then points out, two intentional acts can have one and the same intentional essence and still differ descriptively, namely in terms of how their object is given. A further central distinction in Logical Investigations is that between signitive and intuitive forms of givenness

I can think that my passport is lying in my desk drawer. I can also perceive that it is lying in my desk drawer. In the latter case, the passport is not simply meant or represented, but presented. As long as I am simply thinking about the passport, the passport is my intentional object, but it is not given in any intuitive manner. When I, by contrast, look at the passport, it is given to me directly in its bodily presence (leibhaftig) (Hua 19/365 [2001/II: 86]). Husserl also talks of the perceptual givenness as the self-givenness or self-presentation of the object (Hua 19/646 [2001/II: 260]). As he writes in Thing and Space,

the object stands in perception as there in the flesh, it stands, to speak still more precisely, as actually present, as self-given there in the current now. (Hua 16/14)

First having a belief about the location of the passport and then seeing it being there constitutes a situation where what was initially merely meant is then also intuitively given. The object that is intended remains one and the same, but the how of its givenness differs between being ‘empty’ and being intuitively ‘fulfilled’ (Rang 1973: 23), and this difference in the mode of givenness of the object along the signitive-intuitive spectrum is not due to any difference in the intentional essence (Hua 30/72; Hua 19/435 [2001/II: 124]). Thinking about the passport being in the drawer and seeing it in the drawer are two acts with the same quality and matter; they target the same intentional object, but the object is given differently in the two cases. Apart from the quality and the matter of the act, there is consequently a further feature of intentionality, which is of particular relevance for knowledge, namely intuitive content (Fülle). While present in intuitive acts, it is absent in signitive acts (Hua 19/600, 626 [2001/II: 229, 246]).

For Husserl, justification and truth must be understood on the basis of a model of epistemic fulfillment. If I happen to believe that my passport is in the desk drawer, and if I want to know whether my belief is true, the obvious thing to do is to look. Perceiving that the passport is in the drawer offers a very different kind of reason for believing that the passport is in the drawer than simply thinking or imagining that the passport is in the drawer. It offers an immediate non-inferential form of justification by bringing us the fullness of the thing itself. Another term used by Husserl in this context is that of evidence (Hua 11/72). For Husserl, evidence is not some ineffable feeling of certainty (Hua 24/156), but the name for a synthesis of coincidence (Deckungssynthesis) between the meant and the given. When an object is given intuitively just as it is meant, it is given evidentially, and as Husserl then continues, the objective correlate of this evidence is “being in the sense of truth or simply truth” (Hua 19/651 [2001/II: 263]).

Given the central role ascribed to intuition, it cannot wonder that it figures prominently in an epistemic principle that Husserl would endorse in Ideas I, and which he called the principle of all principles:

that every originary presentive intuition is a legitimizing source of cognition, that everything originarily (so to speak, in its “personal” actuality) offered to us in “intuition” is to be accepted simply as what it is presented as being, but also only within the limits in which it is presented there. (Hua 3/51, italics removed)

There has been ample discussion of how exactly to interpret this principle, but Wiltsche has recently proposed the following reconstruction:

If object P is exhibited to a subject S in intuitive givenness, then S has at least prima facie justification for believing that P exists and that P has those properties which are exhibited intuitively. (Wiltsche 2015: 68; for more on Husserl’s theory of truth and knowledge, see Tugendhat 1970; Hopp 2011, 2020: 217–235)

To complicate matters, epistemic fulfillment can come in degrees and it is therefore also necessary to distinguish different types of evidence. When an empty or signitive intention is completely fulfilled by a corresponding intuition, Husserl speaks of the object as being given with adequate evidence (Hua 19/647 [2001/II: 260–261]). But this ideal is never satisfied in ordinary perception, which always remains inadequate. When I look at my desk, the desk is my intentional object, but I never see the entire desk from all sides at once. There is always more to the intended desk than what shows itself at any given moment (Hua 11/3). This is not to say that there is no room for evidence in perceptual experience, but it is precisely a type of inadequate evidence (Hua 3/319), i.e., one that is “capable of being increased and decreased” (Hua 3/321). More generally speaking, Husserl readily recognizes that our beliefs can be overturned and that what seemed evident can turn out not to be so—though only on the basis of further evidence. As he writes in Formal and Transcendental Logic:

The possibility of deception is inherent in the evidence of experience and does not annul either its fundamental character or its effect […]. This too holds for every evidence, for every “experience” in the amplified sense. Even an ostensibly apodictic evidence can become disclosed as deception and, in that event, presupposes a similar evidence by which it is “shattered”. (Hua 17/164)

A further complication to add, concerns Husserl’s distinction between simple intentions and more complex or categorial intentions. I can think about and see a passport. But I can also see that the passport is purple and that the passport is lying in the drawer, i.e., I can not only perceive individuals and individual properties, but also the passport’s-being-purple and state of affairs with formal or categorial elements. Importantly, just as one can distinguish between merely thinking about a tree and intuiting the tree in its self-presence, Husserl argues that, say, state of affairs can be given not only signitively, but also intuitively. It is possible to intuit that the passport is lying in the drawer, but only by means of a higher-order act which, although based or founded on perceptions of the passport and the drawer, nevertheless intends something that transcends these objects, namely their relationship. Husserl consequently operates with an enlarged concept of intuition: We can not only speak of a sensuous intuition, but also of a categorial intuition (Hua 19/670–685 [2001/II: 280–289]). Formally speaking, the intuition is an act that brings us the object itself in propria persona, and this often calls for a complex intellectual performance (see also Zahavi 2003: 35–37).

Given the way Husserl speaks of perception, it should by now not come as a surprise that he explicitly rejects the idea that perceptual consciousness is representationally mediated (Hua 22/305). Nothing might seem more natural than to say that the objects I see are outside my consciousness and that I am able to do so because my consciousness contains internal representations of these external objects. However, as Husserl argues, this theory does not only not offer any real clarification of perceptual intentionality (Hua 19/436 [2001/II: 125]; Hua 24/151), but is ultimately countersensical. It conceives of consciousness as a box containing representations that resemble external objects, but it forgets to ask how the subject is supposed to know that the representations are in fact representations of external objects. As Husserl writes,

The ego is not a tiny man in a box that looks at the pictures and then occasionally leaves his box in order to compare the external objects with the internal ones etc. For such a picture observing ego, the picture would itself be something external; it would require its own matching internal picture, and so on ad infinitum. (Hua 36/106)

If we actually do pay attention to perceptual intentionality, we should realize that it does not confront us with pictures or signs of objects—except, of course, in so far as we are perceiving paintings or photographs—but with the objects themselves. When we see a photo of the Guggenheim Museum or Dürer’s portrait of Emperor Maximilian, we are faced with a complicated form of intentionality, where our awareness of one entity (the photo or painting) allows us to be aware of another thing (the building or person). We are directed not at that which we perceive, but through it, at something else. In ordinary perception, by contrast, the perceptually given does not function as a sign or picture of something else. Some have argued that a picture is something that resembles what it depicts, and that it is the resemblance that imbues the picture with its pictorial or representational quality. But mere resemblances will not do. A matchbox contains numerous matches that resemble each other, but that does not make one a picture or sign of the other. Rather, according to Husserl we should realize that a picture must be consciously apprehended as a picture in order to function as a representation of something else (Hua 36/106–107). It only acquires its representational quality by means of a special cognitive apprehension (Hua 19/437 [2001/II: 125–126]). More specifically, we must perceive the object that is to function as a sign or picture in order to confer its representational quality upon it. This is why the representational theory of perception must be rejected. It presupposes that which it seeks to explain (for recent discussions of Husserl’s theory of perception, see Overgaard 2022, Doyon 2024).

3. The transcendental turn: Epoché, phenomenological reduction, and transcendental idealism

The very attempt to offer a careful description of our psychological life, the very idea that intentionality is a distinctive feature of mental states, can already be found in the work of Brentano, whose lectures in Vienna, as we have seen, Husserl had attended in the 1880s. It is consequently natural to ask whether Husserl was not simply continuing the project commenced by Brentano. There are good reasons to resist this conclusion, however. One reason is that Brentano explicitly defended the claim that psychology is the theoretical science on which other disciplines including logic ought to be based (Brentano 1874 [1973: 15–16]). A further number of reasons is listed by Husserl in a late letter to Marvin Farber from June 18, 1937:

Even though I began in my youth as an enthusiastic admirer of Brentano, I must admit I deluded myself, for too long, and in a way hard to understand now, into believing that I was a co-worker on his philosophy, especially, his psychology. But in truth, my way of thinking was a totally different one from that of Brentano already in my first work […]. In a formal sense, Brentano asks for and provides a psychology whose whole topic is the “psychic phenomena” which he on occasions defines also as “consciousness of something”. But his psychology is anything but a science of intentionality, the proper problems of intentionality never dawned upon him. He even failed to see that no given experience of consciousness can be described without a description of the correlated “intentional object ‘as such’” (for example, that this perception of the desk can only be described, when I describe this desk as what and just as it is perceived). (Husserl 1994: iv 82)

One important feature of Husserl’s theory of intentionality that is highlighted in the quote is the idea that one cannot analyze intentional experiences properly without also considering their objective correlate, i.e., the intended object (Hua 9/282). Ultimately, however, Husserl would also argue for the reverse implication: We cannot philosophically comprehend what it means for something to be a perceived object, a remembered event, a judged state of affairs, if we ignore the intentional states (the perception, the remembering, the judging) that reveal these objects to us. In his last work Crisis, Husserl would refer to this discovery of the correlational a priori as the decisive accomplishment of Logical Investigations:

The first breakthrough of this universal a priori of correlation between experienced object and manners of givenness (which occurred during work on my Logical Investigations around 1898) affected me so deeply that my whole subsequent life-work has been dominated by the task of systematically elaborating on this a priori of correlation. (Hua 6/169 [1970: 166]; see also Beck 1928: 611)

In the first edition of Logical Investigations, Husserl had been so imprudent as to characterize phenomenology as descriptive psychology (Hua 19/23–24 [2001/I: 176]). He soon came to regret this as a serious mischaracterization (Hua 22/206–208), and a few years later, Husserl would argue that if one really wishes to develop phenomenology as an a priori epistemology, if one really wishes to understand the intentionality of consciousness and the phenomena, then one would have to leave a purely descriptive phenomenology behind in favor of a transcendental phenomenology (Hua 24/425–427).

For Husserl, Descartes should always be recognized as the thinker who inaugurated a new epoch-making type of philosophy by effectuating a radical first-personal turn from “naïve Objectivism to transcendental subjectivism” (Hua 1/46, see also Hua 6/83 [1970: 81]). At the same time, however, Husserl also considered Descartes’ own execution of this turn so flawed that he found it necessary to “reject nearly all the well-known doctrinal content of the Cartesian philosophy” (Hua 1/43). As for Kant, Husserl had initially been strongly influenced by Brentano’s negative appraisal, but he eventually came to realize the deep affinity between his own project and that of Kant (Husserl 1994: v 4). And as Husserl explicitly admits, when he decided to designate his own phenomenology as ‘transcendental’, he was precisely pointing to the Kantian legacy (Hua 7/230, 240).

Ideas I from 1913 marks Husserl’s explicit embrace of transcendental philosophy. One significant difference between Logical Investigations and Ideas I is that Husserl in the intervening years came to the realization that certain methodological steps—the epoché and transcendental reduction—were required if phenomenology was to accomplish its designated task. Whereas both methodological concepts are absent in Logical Investigations, they came to play a decisive role as part of Husserl’s transcendental turn. In his introductory remarks to the third part of Ideas I, which contains an in-depth analysis of intentionality, Husserl writes that one can use the term ‘phenomenology’ without having apprehended the transcendental attitude, but that one in this case will be using the term with no proper grasp of what it designates (Hua 3/200). But what is the epoché and the reduction? One way to answer this question is by looking closer at their motivation. Why were they introduced in the first place?

Husserl kept revising and refining his account in the years following the publication of Ideas I, but one recurrent idea is his emphasis on the difference between the philosophical attitude and other modes of experience and thinking. In ordinary life we are so absorbed in the world that we simply take its reality for granted; it is simply there waiting to be discovered and investigated. This stance towards the world is so fundamental and deeply rooted that Husserl calls it the natural attitude. It is an attitude that also pervades positive science, but it must be contrasted with the properly philosophical attitude, which critically questions the very foundation of experience and scientific thought (Hua 25/13–14). Philosophy is a discipline that does not simply contribute to or augment the scope of our positive knowledge, but which instead investigates the basis of this knowledge and asks how it is possible. Rather than simply taking reality as the unquestioned point of departure, rather than focusing on what the world contains, we need to attend to the question of what it means for something to be given as real in the first place, we need to focus on the how of its givenness. Every object-oriented investigation presupposes that objects can appear in such a manner that they can be targets of further exploration and explanation. And in order to examine the structures that allow and enable such object-manifestation, a new type of inquiry is called for, a type of reflective inquiry that “is prior to all natural knowledge and science and is on an entirely different plane than natural science” (Hua 24/176). But for this investigation to be possible, we cannot simply continue to live in the natural attitude. We keep it, in order to be able to investigate it, but we bracket its validity. It is this procedure that is known by the name of epoché. The purpose of the epoché is not to doubt, neglect, abandon, or exclude reality from our research; rather its aim is to suspend or neutralize a certain dogmatic attitude towards reality. We must take a step back from our naive and unexamined immersion in the world and thematize the fact that reality is always revealed and examined from some perspective or another. As Husserl points out in a lecture from 1931, the only thing that is excluded as a result of the epoché is a certain naivety, the naivety of simply taken the world for granted, thereby ignoring the contribution of consciousness (Hua 27/173). And as Husserl repeatedly insists in this 1931 lecture, the turn from a naïve exploration of the world to a reflective exploration of its givenness does not entail a turning away from the world, rather, it is a turn that for the first time makes the world accessible for philosophical inquiry (Hua 27/178). We do not lose the world as a result of the epoché, but from now it must be consider as intentional correlate (Hua 34/58):

“The” world is not lost as a result of the epoché. The epoché is by no means a suspension of the being of the world and of every world-oriented judgment; rather, it is the path leading to the discovery of correlational judgements. (Hua 15/366)

The world as “phenomenon”, as world in the epoché, is merely a modality, in which the same ego, for whom the world is pregiven, reflects on this pregivenness and on what it contains, and for that reason doesn’t abandon the world and its validity, nor makes it disappear. (Hua 34/223)

To put it differently, by adopting the phenomenological attitude, we do not turn the gaze inwards in order to examine the happenings in a private interior sphere. Rather we look at how the world shows up to the subject. We pay attention to how and as what worldly objects are given to us. But in doing so, by analyzing how and as what any object presents itself to us, we also come to discover the intentional acts and experiential structures in relation to which any appearing object must necessarily be understood. We realize our own subjective accomplishments and the intentionality that is at play in order for worldly objects to appear in the way they do and with the validity and meaning that they have. This is why Husserl in Crisis can compare the performance of the epoché to the transition from a two-dimensional to a three-dimensional life (Hua 6/121 [1970: 119]). It is a reflective move that allows for an expansion rather than a narrowing of the field of research (Hua 1/66, 6/154 [1970: 151]).

Strictly speaking, the epoché can be seen as the first step towards what Husserl terms the transcendental reduction, which is his name for the systematic analysis of the intentional correlation between subjectivity and world. This is a more prolonged analysis that leads from the natural sphere back to (re-ducere) its transcendental foundation (Hua 1/21). Both epoché and reduction can consequently be seen as elements of a transcendental reflection, the purpose of which is to liberate us from our natural(istic) dogmatism and make the “correlation between constituting subjectivity and constituted objectivity intelligible” (Hua 9/336). Indeed, as Husserl already pointed out in Ideas I, the greatest and most important problems in phenomenology are related to the question of how objectivities of different kinds, from the prescientific to those of the highest scientific dignity, are constituted by consciousness (Hua 3/196). It is for this very reason, that Husserl can write that there is not only a phenomenology of natural scientific thinking, but also a phenomenology of nature (qua correlate of consciousness) (Hua 3/159). That Husserl’s philosophical development has led him beyond any kind of (Brentanian) descriptive psychology is also made clear by the following quote:

His [Kant’s] eternal significance lies in the much discussed but little understood “Copernican” turn to a fundamentally new and, what is more, strictly scientific interpretation of the sense of the world; but at the same time it lies in the first establishment of a corresponding, and “entirely new”, science—the science of the transcendental. (Hua 7/240)

In Crisis, Husserl describes phenomenology as the final gestalt (Endform) of transcendental philosophy (Hua 6/71 [1970: 70]); a transcendental philosophy that is characterized by its criticism of objectivism and by its elucidation of subjectivity as the locus of all objective formations of sense and validity (Hua 6/102 [1970: 99]). Rather than simply amounting to a limited exploration of the psychological domain, for Husserl an in-depth investigation of intentionality led towards a transcendental philosophical elucidation of reality and objectivity and eventually towards a form of transcendental idealism that insisted on the essential interconnection between reason, truth, and being (Hua 1/117). As Husserl writes in a lecture course from 1924,

In the phenomenological reduction, rightly understood, is predelineated in essence the marching route towards transcendental idealism, just as phenomenology as a whole is nothing but the first rigorous scientific form of this idealism. (Hua 8/181)

That Husserl is an idealist is incontestable, but the precise character of this idealism remains contested. For some, Husserl’s idealism amounts to nothing more than a defense of the irreducibility of ideality (Willard 2011) or an insistence on the extent to which our intentional directedness relies on ideal meaning (D. W. Smith 2013: 166). For others, Husserl is a reductive idealist for whom every being is to be deduced from or created by consciousness (Ingarden 1963 [1975]; Philipse 1995). There are also interpreters who argue that Husserl’s transcendental method is concerned with meaning rather than being; that it is the meaning of the world, rather than its being, that is constituted by transcendental subjectivity, and that Husser’s transcendental idealism can precisely be distinguished from metaphysical idealism in that the latter, but not the former, makes first-order claims about the nature of objects (Carr 1999, Crowell 2001, Thomasson 2007).

Matters are not made easier by the fact that Husserl often insisted that his own idealism differed radically from traditional forms of idealism (Hua 5/149–53, 17/178, 1/33–34, 118), which—precisely in their opposition to realism—betrayed their inadequacy (Hua 5/151), and in the end, it is easier to say what Husserl’s idealism is not, than to characterize it positively. Husserl is quite explicit in his rejection of phenomenalism and subjective idealism. As he writes in Ideas I, a material thing “is intrinsically not an experience but instead a totally different kind of being” (Hua 3/71). That his idealism amounts to more than simply an emphasis on the irreducibility of ideality, is on the other hand clear from Husserl’s rejection of the idea that the world is completely mind-independent:

The being-in-itself of the world might make good sense, but one thing is absolutely certain, it cannot have the sense that the world is independent of an actually existing consciousness. (Hua 36/78)

And as for attempts to read Husserl as somebody not interested in metaphysical questions, they are hard to reconcile with Husserl’s unequivocal dismissal of any non-metaphysical interpretations of transcendental phenomenology:

[T]ranscendental phenomenology in the sense I conceive it does in fact encompass the universal horizon of the problems of philosophy […] including as well all so-called metaphysical questions, insofar as they have possible sense in the first place. (Hua 5/141)

As Husserl also writes, the topics of existence and non-existence, of being and non-being, are all-embracing themes for phenomenology (Hua 1/91), and it is the latter that offer a genuine transcendental method for dealing with metaphysical problems (Hua 9/253). Indeed, as Eugen Fink, Husserl’s last assistant and close collaborator, wrote in an article from 1939, only a fundamental misunderstanding of the aim of phenomenology would lead to the mistaken but often repeated claim that Husserl’s phenomenology is not interested in reality or the question of being, but only in subjective meaning-formations in intentional consciousness (Fink 1939 [1981: 44]).

That there is a tight link between Husserl’s phenomenological method and his account of intentionality, and that one’s understanding of the former will influence one’s understanding of the latter (and vice versa) can be further illustrated by considering and comparing two very different interpretations of Husserl’s concept of noema.

In Ideas III, Husserl writes that a phenomenological investigation of consciousness doesn’t merely have to include an analysis of the act of consciousness, the noesis, but also of the correlate of consciousness, the noema (Hua 5/84). But what exactly is this correlate? According to what has become known as the Fregean interpretation, an interpretation originally proposed by Føllesdal (1969), the noema must be interpreted in line with the Fregean notion of sense (‘Sinn’) (D. W. Smith & McIntyre 1982: 81–82), and the intentionality of consciousness in analogy with the reference of linguistic expressions (Føllesdal 1974: 96). According to this interpretation, the noema must be sharply distinguished from both act and object. It is an abstract meaning or sense that mediates the intentional relation between act and object. The noema is consequently not that toward which consciousness is directed, but that by means of which it is directed, that by virtue of which we achieve a reference to the external object. As Smith and McIntyre write, “for Husserl, an act is directed toward an object via an intermediate ‘intentional’ entity, the act’s noema” (D. W. Smith & McIntyre 1982: 87), or as McIntyre puts it a later article, “Intentionality, or representation, is again a ‘mediated’ affair: a mental state represents an object only ‘via’ its noema” (McIntyre 1986: 105). This representationalist interpretation often goes hand in hand with a particular understanding of Husserl’s transcendental methodology according to which Husserl is a committed methodological solipsist and internalist. The very purpose of the epoché and reduction is to bracket all questions concerning external reality. It is to turn our attention away from objects transcendent to consciousness and towards the internal mental representations, the noemata, in virtue of which we can be said to be directed at said objects (Dreyfus 1982: 108; McIntyre 1986: 102). On this account, our mental representations have the function they have regardless of how the world is and regardless of whether that which we are intentionally directed at exists at all (Dreyfus & Hall 1982b: 14). Indeed, as McIntyre puts it, for Husserl, the problem of intentionality was not a question of how mental states relate to the world, but rather of how mental states come to have an internal representational character, “which makes them as though actually related to extra-mental things whether they are so or not” (McIntyre 1986: 108).

An alternative interpretation has been offered by Sokolowski and Drummond. On their understanding, we continue to be concerned with worldly objects after the reduction, but we now no longer consider them naively, rather we examine them precisely as they are intended and given, that is qua intentional correlates. But to investigate the correlate of consciousness, the noema, the object-as-it-is-intended, i.e., the perceived object as perceived, the recollected episode as recollected, the judged state-of-affair as judged etc., is precisely to investigate the object itself in its significance for us (Sokolowski 1987: 525, 527); it is not to suddenly redirect the attention towards some abstract representational intermediary between subject and object. On this presentationalist interpretation of Husserl, the object-as-it-intended and the object-that-is-intended are consequently not two different ontological entities (Drummond 1990: 108–109), but two different perspectives on one and the same, and it is paramount not to conflate the ordinary worldly object considered in a non-ordinary (transcendental) attitude with a non-ordinary abstract mental representation, and to suggest that Husserl’s concern is with the latter (Drummond 1992: 89).

One possible explanation for the existence of such divergent interpretations is the ambiguity of Husserl’s early discussion of the noema (Bernet 1990). Some interpreters have argued that Husserl’s discussion in Ideas I vacillates between a psychological and a transcendental conception of the noema and both Ströker and Fink have argued that whereas it is possible to distinguish between the noema and the intended object as long as one remains within the natural attitude, such a distinction is no longer appropriate the moment one adopts a transcendental attitude. From that perspective, the noema is the constituted object and it would be a mistake to suggest that the real object should lie beyond the noematic sphere (Fink 1933 [2000: 117]; Ströker 1987: 194–200).

As these disagreements make clear, however, any plausible interpretation of Husserl’s theory of intentionality must go hand-in-hand with a proper grasp of his phenomenological method, and that will also involve taking a stance on the nature of his transcendental idealism (Zahavi 2017).

Husserl’s transcendental idealism is not a form of monism. Its adversary is not materialism, or dualism, and it is not making any claims about the ultimate ‘stuff’ of reality. Its core claim is that the study of intentionality doesn’t merely tell us something about the workings of the mind, but also provides us with insights into the status of reality. It does so since mind and world are bound together. For Husserl, the world cannot be reduced to or dissolved in consciousness, but nor can it be divorced from consciousness. Already in Logical Investigations, Husserl argued that the facile divide between inside and outside has its origin in a naïve metaphysics and is inappropriate for a proper understanding of the nature of intentionality (Hua 19/673, 708 [2001/II: 281–282, 304]). Husserl’s dismissal of the commonsensical divide between mind and world is even more pronounced after his transcendental turn. For Husserl, it is as misleading to regard the world as somehow external to the mind as it is to conceive of consciousness as some kind of container. It is as wrong to claim that consciousness absorbs the world in knowing it as it is to say that consciousness must literally get outside of itself in order to reach the world. The lesson of intentionality is precisely that consciousness is open to the world, a world that is accessible to and constituted by consciousness.

Husserl’s main objection to naturalism is that it by reducing consciousness to an object in the world fails to recognize the transcendental dimension of consciousness. As he occasionally puts it, the “naturalization of the psychic” and more generally, the rise of “physicalistically oriented naturalism” (Hua 6/64 [1970: 63]) is due to a “blindness to the transcendental” (Hua 6/269 [1970: 265]). Rather than simply being an object in the world, consciousness is also a subject for the world, i.e., a necessary condition of possibility for any entity to appear as an object in the way it does and with the meaning it has. Husserl would agree with Kant that reality is necessarily a reality for-us and that the right place to locate objectivity is in, rather than beyond, the world of experience. But since Husserl also rejects the Kantian notion of an inaccessible and ungraspable thing-in-itself (Ding an sich) as unintelligible and countersensical (Hua 1/38–39, 11/19–20, 39/726), he removes any reason to demote the status of the reality we experience to one that is “merely” for us.

4. Time- and self-consciousness

Husserl’s first significant writings on temporality can be found early on, namely in his Lectures on the Phenomenology of the Consciousness of Internal Time (1905). It was a topic that in Husserl’s own words, would constitute one of the most difficult and fundamental areas in phenomenology (Hua 10/276, 334, 3/182), and which would preoccupy him for the rest of his life (for extensive treatments of Husserl’s philosophy of time, see Held 1966, Brough 1972, Kortooms 2002, Rodemeyer 2006, Lohmar & Yamaguchi 2010, de Warren 2009).

Husserl early on recognized that his investigation of intentionality would remain incomplete as long as he ignored the temporal dimension of the intentional acts and intentional objects. We can explore the different sides of a table, we can hear an enduring tone, we can see the flight of a bird. In each of these cases, the object under investigation is temporally extended. But how is it that the different sides of the table are perceived as synthetically integrated moments, rather than as disjointed fragments? How is it that we can actually see the smooth continuous movement of the bird? Husserl’s main claim is that a perception of a temporally extended object as well as the perception of succession and change would be impossible if consciousness provided us only with a momentary or pure now-slice of the object and if the stream of consciousness itself was a series of unconnected points of experiencing, like a line of pearls. If our perception was restricted to being conscious of what exists right now, it would be impossible to perceive anything with temporal extension and duration, for a succession of isolated, punctual, conscious states does not, as such, enable us to be conscious of succession and duration. Since we obviously do experience succession and duration, we must acknowledge that our consciousness, one way or the other, can encompass more than what is given right now—it must be co-conscious of what has just been, and what is just about to occur. The crucial question is how? One suggestion would be to say that we perceive what occurs right now, remember what is no longer and imagine what has not yet occurred. But according to Husserl, we do have an intuitive presentation of succession and he would consequently insist on the phenomenological difference between hearing a melody or seeing a movement (that necessarily extends in time) and remembering or imagining either.

Husserl’s own alternative is to insist on the width of presence. Consider the case where we are hearing a short sequence of a melody consisting of the tones C, D, and E. If we focus on the last part of this perception, the one that occurs when the tone E sounds, we do not find a consciousness that is exclusively conscious of the tone E, but a consciousness that is still conscious of the two former notes D and C. And not only that, we find a consciousness that still hears the first two notes (it neither imagines nor remembers them). This does not mean that there is no difference between our consciousness of the present tone E and our consciousness of the tones D and C. D and C are not simultaneous with E, on the contrary, we are hearing a temporal succession. D and C are tones that have been and they are being perceived as sinking into the past, which is why we are experiencing the sequence in its temporal duration, rather than isolated tones that replace each other abruptly.

Husserl employs three technical terms to describe the temporal structure of consciousness: There is (i) a ‘primal impression’ narrowly directed toward the strictly circumscribed now-phase of the object. The primal impression never occurs in isolation and is an abstract component that by itself cannot provide us with a perception of a temporal object. The primal impression is accompanied by (ii) a ‘retention’, or retentional aspect, which provides us with a consciousness of the just-elapsed phase of the object thereby furnishing the primal impression with a past-directed temporal context, and by (iii) a ‘protention’, or protentional aspect, which in a more-or-less indefinite way intends the phase of the object about to occur thereby providing a future-oriented temporal context for the primal impression (Hua 9/201).

In this way, it becomes evident that concrete perception as original consciousness (original givenness) of a temporally extended object is structured internally as itself a streaming system of momentary perceptions (so-called primary impressions). But each such momentary perception is the nuclear phase of a continuity, a continuity of momentary gradated retentions on the one side, and a horizon of what is coming on the other side: a horizon of ‘protention’, which is disclosed to be characterized as a constantly gradated coming. (Hua 9/202)

The concrete and full temporal structure of any ongoing experience is consequently primal impression-retention-protention. Although the specific experiential contents will change progressively from moment to moment, at any given moment this threefold structure of inner time-consciousness is present as a unified field of experiencing.

Let us take another look at the sequence C, D, and E. When C is first heard, it is presenced in the primal impression. When it is succeeded by D, D is given in the primal impression, whereas C is retained in the retention, and when E sounds, it replaces D in the primal impression, whereas D is retained in the retention. However, the retention is not merely a retention of the tone which has just passed. Every time a new tone is presenced in a primal impression, the entire retentional sequence is recapitulated and modified. When the tone C is succeeded by the tone D, our impressional consciousness of D is accompanied by a retention of C (Dc). When D is succeeded by the tone E, our impressional consciousness of E is accompanied both by a retention of D (Ed) and by a retention of the tone retained in D (Ec), and so forth (Hua 10/81, 100). Each phase of consciousness retains the previous phase of consciousness. Since the previous phase includes its own retention of a previous phase, there is a retentional continuum that stretches back through prior experience. When a tone sinks into the past, it retains its identity and position vis-à-vis the other tones, although its mode of givenness changes, i.e., although it is constantly given in new temporal perspectives (for instance, C, Dc, Ec, Fc).

It is important to distinguish retention and protention, which are structural components of any ongoing intentional act and which occur without our active or deliberate contribution, from episodic memory and episodic future thinking that are intentional acts in their own right, which presuppose the work of retention and protention. There is a clear difference between retaining notes that have just sounded and remembering listening to a certain melody last summer. Unlike episodic memory, retention offers an intuitive grasp of the just-past; it doesn’t just re-present or reconstruct it. Likewise, there is a clear difference between protending notes about to sound and looking forward to tonight’s concert. As Husserl also points out, it is protention that allows for the experience of surprise. If I am listening to a favorite melody and someone hits the wrong note, I am surprised or disappointed. I will likewise be surprised if I open a door and find a stone wall behind it. But it only makes sense to speak of surprise in the light of a certain anticipation of what the imminent course of experience will provide (Hua 11/7).

Why does Husserl ascribe such fundamental importance to this analysis of time-consciousness? We have already come across one reason. Were it not for the specific temporal organization of the stream of consciousness, it would be impossible to experience temporally unified objects. When I move around a tree in order to gain a fuller perceptual presentation of it, then the various profiles of the tree—its front, sides, and back—are perceived as synthetically integrated moments. Temporal synthesis is a precondition for this perceptual synthesis. But let me point to two further reasons.

Towards the end of World War I, Husserl’s growing appreciation of the persisting influence of the past made him start operating with a distinction between what he called static and genetic phenomenology. Static phenomenology is the type of phenomenology that we encounter in Logical Investigations. If we consider some of its formative analyses of perceptual intentionality, they were all conducted with no regard for genesis and historicity. The primary task was to account for the relation between the act and the object, but in either case the type of intentional act and the type of object were taken to be readily available. As Husserl came to realize, however, what appears as a straightforward experience might in fact be enabled by earlier experiences. Through a process of sedimentation, prior experiences leave their trace in us and thereby contribute to the formation of cognitive schemas and different forms of apprehension and expectations which guide, motivate, and influence subsequent experiences. As Husserl writes in Ideas II,

The Ego always lives in the medium of its ‘history’; all its earlier lived experiences have sunk down, but they have aftereffects in tendencies, sudden ideas, transformations or assimilations of earlier lived experiences, and from such assimilations new formations are merged together. (Hua 4/338)

More generally speaking, Husserl would not only argue that more complex and demanding forms of intentionality (say conceptual judgments) presuppose more basic types of pre-predicative, perceptual, intentionality (Husserl 1939: 66 [1973: 64]), but also that even the most primitive intentional activity presupposes a preceding passivity, since to be active is to react to something, something that is affecting us passively (Hua 4/213, 337, 11/64, 84; see also Holenstein 1972, Montavont 1999). The task of genetic phenomenology was then to explore these temporally layered processes of constitution (Hua 11/345). The scope of genetic phenomenology remained restricted to the experiential life of an individual ego, but in the last phase of his thinking, Husserl ventured into what has been called generative phenomenology (Steinbock 1995). The focus was broadened to investigate the constitutive role of tradition and history. In what way are the accomplishments of previous generations operative in our individual experiences? As Husserl would put it in a manuscript from the twenties, “everything of my own is founded, in part through the tradition of my ancestors, in part through the tradition of my contemporaries” (Hua 14/223).

The most important reason for Husserl’s insistence on the importance of time is, however, to be located elsewhere. In Logical Investigations, Husserl had confined himself to an analysis of the relation between the constituted object and the constituting consciousness. He accounted for the way in which the givenness of objects is conditioned by intentional subjectivity, but apart from stressing that experiences are not given in the same way as spatial objects, he did not pursue the question concerning the givenness of subjectivity itself in any detail. This was, however, a clear lacuna. As Husserl writes,

[E]very experience is ‘consciousness’, and consciousness is consciousness of … But every experience is itself experienced [erlebt], and to that extent also ‘conscious’ [bewußt]. (Hua 10/291)

The reason why Husserl came to speak of the analysis of temporality as constituting the bedrock of phenomenology was precisely because it was supposed to account for the temporal self-givenness of consciousness. On the one hand, Husserl was faced with the following conundrum. Our perceptual objects are temporal, but what about our very perceptions of these objects. Are they also subjugated to the strict laws of temporal constitution? Are they also temporal unities, which arise, endure, and perish? And if they are, how do we avoid an infinite regress? If the experienced duration and unity of a melody are constituted by consciousness, and if our consciousness of the melody is itself experienced with duration and unity, are we then not forced to posit yet another consciousness to account for the experience of this duration and unity, and so forth ad infinitum (Hua 10/80)? To avoid this conclusion, Husserl rejected the assumption that the temporality of the objects of consciousness and the temporality of the consciousness of objects coincide:

Is it inherently absurd to regard the flow of time as an objective movement? Certainly! On the other hand, memory is surely something that itself has its now, and the same now as a tone, for example. No. There lurks the fundamental mistake. The flow of the modes of consciousness is not a process; the consciousness of the now is not itself now. The retention that exists ‘together’ with the consciousness of the now is not ‘now’, is not simultaneous with the now, and it would make no sense to say that it is. (Hua 10/333)

One way to understand this enigmatic statement is by recognizing that consciousness is not simply a consciousness of time, but is itself a form of time, and that it might be problematic to ascribe temporal predicates to time itself. Just as my experience of a red circle is neither circular nor red, the primal impressions, retentions, and protentions are not ‘present’, ‘past’, or ‘future’ in the way empirical objects are (Hua 10/75, 376). Their relations are not relations among items located within the temporal flow; but are relations that constitute the flow in question. It is their very conjunction which in the first instance makes possible the senses of present, past, and future.

On the other hand, Husserl’s analysis of the temporal structure of consciousness eventually led him to the vexed problem of self-consciousness (Zahavi 1999), where he would defend the existence of pre-reflective self-consciousness and argue that consciousness is characterized by an inherent reflexivity already prior to any act of reflection (Hua 17/279–80, 4/118, 15/492–3). As a central passage has it:

The flow of the consciousness that constitutes immanent time not only exists but is so remarkably and yet intelligibly fashioned that a self-appearance of the flow necessarily exists in it, and therefore the flow itself must necessarily be apprehensible in the flowing. The self-appearance of the flow does not require a second flow; on the contrary, it constitutes itself as a phenomenon in itself. (Hua 10/83)

Whereas objects, by definition, appear as objects for a subject, and not for themselves (Hua 35/278), subjects are self-manifesting or self-constituting. This is one reason why Husserl occasionally speaks of objects as relative and dependent, and subjects as absolute (Hua 35/282).

Husserl’s view on whether phenomenology had something significant to say about not only intentional experiences, but also about the subject, I, or ego of these experiences underwent decisive changes over the years. In the first edition of the Logical Investigations, Husserl denied that intentional states are necessarily owned by anybody and explicitly rejected the existence of some kind of pure identical ego-pole (Hua 19/390 [2001/II: 100]). Indeed, referring to the Kantian notion of the ego of pure apperception, Husserl writes that he has been “quite unable to find this ego, this primitive, necessary centre of relations” (Hua 19/374 [2001/II: 92]). By the time of the second edition of Logical Investigations (1913), Husserl had, however, changed his mind, and now writes that he no longer endorses his old attitude regarding the existence of the pure ego. As he remarks, he had in the meantime learned to find it or rather learned not to let his aversion to different forms of ego-metaphysics blind him to its phenomenological presence (Hua 19/374 [2001/II: 92], see also Marbach 1974). On Husserl’s later view, a consideration of experiences such as concentrating on a task, making a decision, suffering a slight, feeling ashamed or scolding somebody, will not only disclose that the experiences are intentional, are experiences of something, but also that they are for someone, they also include a reference to the subject as the agent or patient of the act (Hua 4/310, 9/315), for which reason their full intentional structure must be named ego-cogito-cogitatum (Hua 6/173 [1970: 170]). As Husserl makes clear, however, the pure ego is not something “mysterious or mystical” but simply another name for the subject of experience (Hua 4/97). It doesn’t “harbor any hidden inner richness” (Hua 4/105). It is not only pure, but also poor in terms of content.

Although the pure ego must be distinguished from the experiences in which it lives and functions, since the former preserves its identity, whereas the latter arise and perish in the stream of consciousness, it cannot in any way exist independently of them, or be thought in separation from them (and vice versa):

On the one hand, we must definitely here distinguish the pure Ego from the acts themselves, as that which functions in them and which, through them, relates to Objects; on the other hand, this distinction can only be an abstract one. It is abstract to the extent that the Ego cannot be thought of as something separated from these lived experiences, from its ‘life’, just as, conversely, the lived experiences are not thinkable except as the medium of the life of the Ego. (Hua 4/99)

Despite the obvious changes that occur after the first edition of Logical Investigations, it is noteworthy that Husserl never argued that the temporal unity of consciousness is secured by the ego. This remains true even after Husserl’s “egological” turn. As he repeatedly emphasizes, the most fundamental constitutive synthesis of them all, the very process of temporalization, is a purely passive process that by no means is controlled by the ego (Hua 11/235–236). Indeed, as Husserl would eventually put it, a “structural analysis of the primal present (the standing living stream) leads us to the ego-structure and to the constant substratum of egoless streaming which founds it” (Hua 15/598).

5. Embodiment, intersubjectivity and objectivity

Already in lectures on Thing and Space from 1907, Husserl stressed the importance of embodiment for perceptual intentionality (see also Heinämaa 2003, Taipale 2014). Spatial objects appear perspectivally. When we perceive an object, it never appears in its totality, but always from a certain limited perspective. When we realize that that which appears spatially always appears at a certain distance and from a certain angle, the implication is straightforward: Every perspectival appearance presupposes that the experiencing subject is itself located in space, and since the subject only possesses a spatial location due to its embodiment (Hua 4/33), spatial objects can only appear for and be constituted by embodied subjects. There is no pure point of view and there is no view from nowhere, there is only an embodied point of view. As an experiencing, embodied subject, I am the point of reference, the experiential zero-point or absolute here, in relation to which all of my perceptual objects, be they near or far, left or right, up or down, are uniquely related:

It is thus that all things of the surrounding world possess an orientation to the body […]. The ‘far’ is far from me, from my body; the ‘to the right’ refers back to the right side of my lived body, e.g., to my right hand. […] I have all things over and against me; they are all ‘there’—with the exception of one and only one, namely the body, which is always ‘here’. (Hua 4/158)

More generally, Husserl argues that the body is essentially involved in the perception of and interaction with spatial objects, and that every worldly experience is mediated by and made possible by our embodiment (Hua 4/56). In fact, we cannot first study the body and next investigate it in its relation to the world. The world is given to us as bodily explored, and the body is revealed to us in its exploration of the world (Hua 15/287).

A central distinction introduced by Husserl is the one between (a) our original unthematic, pre-reflectively lived body-awareness that accompanies and conditions every spatial experience, and (b) the subsequent thematic experience of the body as an object. It is necessary to distinguish the body as it is subjectively lived through (Leib), and the body as an object among others (Körper). As Husserl insists, the latter form of body-awareness depends upon the former:

Here it must also be noted that in all experience of things, the lived body is co-experienced as a functioning lived body (thus not as a mere thing), and that when it itself is experienced as a thing, it is experienced in a double way—i.e., precisely as an experienced thing and as a functioning lived body together in one. (Hua 14/57)

But why is it that the tactually or visually explored body can still be experienced as the exteriority of my own body? Husserl here highlights the importance of double-sensation or double-touch (something that was subsequently picked up by Merleau-Ponty (1945 [2012: 194])). When my left hand touches my right hand, the left touching hand feels the surface of the right touched hand. But the touched right hand is not simply given as a mere object, since it feels the touch itself (Hua 4/145). Moreover, the relation between the touching and the touched is reversible, since the right hand can also touch the left hand. The reversibility demonstrates not only that the bodily interiority and exteriority are different manifestations of the same (Hua 14/75) but also points to the dual nature of the body, which is “simultaneously a spatial externality and a subjective internality” (Hua 9/197).

Husserl’s discussion of embodiment did not only feed into his account of perceptual intentionality and self-consciousness, but also influenced his extensive and wide-reaching investigation of intersubjectivity, which ranges from explorations of concrete interpersonal encounters, through investigations of the constitution of various forms of sociality and historical communities, to the development of a new type of transcendental philosophy. Let me discuss each of these topics in turn.

Whereas Husserl’s investigation of intentionality in Logische Untersuchungen (1900–1) paid scant attention to the problem of intersubjectivity, the situation soon changed. Within five years, Husserl was working on empathy (as shown by texts gathered in Husserliana 13). Initially, Husserl’s discussion of empathy was informed by his encounter with the work of Theodor Lipps, the influential philosopher and psychologist, who was also the teacher of a number of Munich phenomenologists. In various writings, Lipps had defended the view that empathy is a sui generis kind of knowledge, one that provides us with knowledge of other minds, and which could be explained in terms of specific mechanisms of imitation and projection (Lipps 1909). Husserl disagreed with Lipps’ explanation and in his own writings often used the term empathy (Einfühlung) interchangeably with the terms other-experience (Fremderfahrung) or other-perception (Fremdwahrnehmung). In Phenomenological Psychology, Husserl declared that “the so-called ‘empathy’” is “the intentionality in one’s own ego which leads into the alien ego” (Hua 9/321), and one of the recurrent questions that kept preoccupying Husserl was precisely how to understand the intentional structure of empathy (see also Depraz 1995; A. D. Smith 2003; Zahavi 2014).

The answer provided by Husserl is remarkably consistent throughout his career, though it is an answer that remains characterized by an important vacillation: Empathy is both like and unlike perception. In some places, Husserl writes that empathy is a distinct and direct kind of empirical experience, one that allows the empathizing ego to experience the psychical life of other subjects (Hua 13/187). Husserl also claims that empathy is what allows the other to be present to me, perceptually present (Hua 15/514), and that the other is given in his being-for-me (für-mich-sein) in empathy, and that this counts as a form of perception (Hua 14/352, 15/641). Indeed,

It would be countersensical to say that it [alien subjectivity] is inferred and not experienced when given in this original form of empathic presentation. For every hypothesis concerning an alien subject presupposes the ‘perception’ of this subject as alien, and empathy is precisely this perception. (Hua 14/352; see also Hua 8/63)

The link between empathy and embodiment comes to the fore, when Husserl writes that the mindedness of others is present in their gestures, in their facial expressions and intonation, and that it is empathy that allows us to grasp the psychological significance of the others’ expressivity (Hua 4/235, 244).

At the same time, however, Husserl also insists that even the most perfect perception of the psychical life of another lacks the originality of self-experience. There will always, and by necessity, be a difference in givenness between that which I am aware of when I empathize with the other, and that which the other is experiencing. Empathy cannot give us the empathized experience itself in its original first-personal presence (Hua 13/347, 440).

As Husserl repeatedly stresses, however, the fact that my experiential access to the minds of others differs from my experiential access to my own mind is not an imperfection or shortcoming. On the contrary, it is a difference that is constitutional. It is precisely because of this difference, precisely because of this asymmetry, that we can claim that the minds we experience are other minds. As Husserl points out, had I had the same access to the consciousness of the other as I have to my own, the other would cease being another and would instead become a part of me (Hua 1/139).

That we can actually experience (rather than merely infer or imagine) the minds of others is not to say that everything is open to view. Directness does not entail infallibility or exhaustiveness. Another person’s psychical life is not exposed in such a way that we immediately, effortlessly, and infallibly have complete access to her innermost thoughts and feelings. As Husserl points out, the perception of others is always partial and is always open for correction (Hua 13/225). In fact, there will always be an indeterminate horizon of not expressed interiority (Hua 20–2/70), and a complete knowledge of the other will forever remain impossible. Furthermore, sometimes our direct acquaintance with others might be limited to the bare recognition of their existence.

When I empathically understand the embodied other, the other is not given to me as a pure nucleus of experience, but as a centre of intentionality, as a different perspective on the very world that I also inhabit. Rather than facing the other as an isolated object, her intentionality will typically pull me along and make me co-attend her worldly objects (Hua 13/411, 14/140, 287, 4/168).

This is, of course, one reason why our perception of others is so unlike our ordinary perception of objects. As soon as the other appears, my relation to the world will change, since the other will always be given to me in a situation or meaningful context that points back to the other as a new centre of reference. The meaning the world has for the other affects the meaning it has for me. In general, my own perspective on the world will be enriched through my empathic understanding of the other. Husserl consequently emphasizes the interrelation between the experience of others and the constitution of a shared world.

We are in a relation to a common surrounding world—we are in a personal association: these belong together. We could not be persons for others if a common surrounding world did not stand there for us in a community, in an intentional linkage of our lives. Correlatively spoken, the one is constituted essentially with the other. (Hua 4/191)

At the same time, however, as Husserl notes, I can also be part of what the other intends. So again, when I experience others, I do not merely experience them as psychophysical objects in the world, rather I experience them as subjects who experience worldly objects, myself included (Hua 15/4–5, 1/158). We encounter others as such when we encounter them as experiencing subjects, and this means as subjects that have a perspective not just upon the world of objects, but upon us as well. In fact, through my experience of others, I can also come to attain a new experience of myself. To that extent, empathy can function as an important source of self-knowledge (Hua 1/149). It is, for instance, by indirectly experiencing myself as one viewed by others, i.e., through a process of mediated self-experience, that I according to Husserl can come to experience myself as a human being (Hua 15/13, 665).

In manuscripts from the early twenties and thirties, Husserl argues that my empathic experience of another, who is, in turn, experientially directed at myself, such that my experience of the other involves a co-experience of myself, is a condition of possibility for we-intentionality (Hua 8/136–137). More specifically, Husserl explores what happens when I address the other and when the other is aware that he is being addressed and when he reciprocates. When both of us become aware that we are being experienced and understood by the other, we are dealing with communicative acts through which a higher interpersonal unity—a we—can be established (Hua 4/192–194, 242). Husserl consequently emphasizes the centrality of communication for the constitution of the we (Hua 14/473). It is precisely by “speaking, listening, and replying” that subjects “form a we that is unified, communalized in a specific way” (Hua 15/476). Husserl often refers to the we that is generated out of this intentional co-determination or interlocking as an “I-you community” (Hua 15/476) or as a “communicative community” (Mitteilungsgemeinschaft) (Hua 15/475).

Husserl’s analysis of the constitution of communities, which can be seen as a contribution to both social philosophy and social ontology (the latter concept was already used by Husserl in 1910 (Hua 13/98)) is wide-ranging and characterized by a distinct bottom-up approach (Perreau 2013, Szanto 2016, Zahavi 2025). Not only does his investigation move from dyadic relations to increasingly complex social formations, but he also emphasizes the extent to which social formations that are established through specific forms of intentional activity are founded upon pre-theoretical, passive, and instinctual forms of connectedness (Hua 9/486, 514). Husserl speaks of the parent-child connection as the most original of all, and then explains how the scope of one’s social environment as a result of one’s socialization increasingly widens to include siblings, friends, the local community and eventually “my nation with its customs, its language, etc.” (Hua 15/511).

In § 61 of Cartesian Meditations, Husserl criticized Scheler for having overlooked that our experience of others has transcendental implications, insofar as objectivity is intersubjectively constituted. Or as he also puts it, only constitutive (or transcendental) phenomenology can capture the true sense of the problem of empathy (Hua 1/173). How should one understand a claim like this? In his analysis of perceptual intentionality, Husserl often emphasized that perception presents me with intersubjectively accessible being, that is being that does not exist for me alone, but for everybody (Hua 17/243). I perceive objects, events, and actions as public, not as private (Hua 1/123, 15/5). Indeed, it is when I realize that my intentional objects can also be experienced by others, it is when I understand that the same object can appear for different subjects, and that there is a difference between the object as such and the specific way it appears to me, that the very notions of subjectivity and objectivity begin to make sense (Hua 13/9, 382, 388–89, 420–21).

An idea that gained increasing prominence in Husserl’s thinking was that a proper clarification of objectivity understood as that which is ‘valid for everybody’ requires an in-depth analysis of intersubjectivity (Hua 17/209). Husserl occasionally writes that his phenomenological treatment of intersubjectivity has the goal of bringing his constitutive analyses to completion; a completion that is achieved the moment it is realized that transcendental intersubjective sociality is the basis in which all objective truth and all true being have their intentional source (cf. Hua 1/35, 182, 8/449, 9/344). As he writes in a late text:

Transcendental intersubjectivity is the absolute and only self-sufficient ontological foundation [Seinsboden], out of which everything objective (the totality of objectively real entities, but also every objective ideal world) draws its sense and its validity. (Hua 9/344)

When claiming that there is no other meaningful true reality than the one we would agree upon at the end of the road of inquiry, and that objectivity is the correlate of an ideal intersubjective concordance (Hua 1/138), Husserl comes close to the position of Peirce (1868 [1955: 247]).

In one of his longest texts on Kant, the text Kant and the Idea of Transcendental Philosophy, a text written for and presented in commemoration of Kant’s bicentennial in 1924, Husserl writes that transcendental philosophy should be based upon a systematic description and analysis of consciousness in all of its modalities (Hua 7/234–235). It is this demand which eventually necessitates an extension of Kant’s concept of the transcendental, since it proves necessary to include the humanities and the manifold of human sociality and culture in the transcendental analysis (Hua 7/282). This line of thinking is further elaborated some years later, when Husserl writes that

as long as one interprets transcendental subjectivity as an isolated ego and—like the Kantian tradition—ignores the whole task of establishing the legitimacy of the transcendental community of subjects, any prospect of a transcendental knowledge of self and world is lost. (Hua 29/120)

It is consequently no coincidence that Husserl at times describes his own project as a sociological transcendental philosophy (Hua 9/539) and even declares that the development of phenomenology necessarily implies the move from an

‘egological’ … phenomenology into a transcendental sociological phenomenology having reference to a manifest multiplicity of conscious subjects communicating with one another. (Husserl 1981: 68)

In research manuscripts subsequently published in Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität III, we find Husserl developing these ideas further, for instance through extensive analyses of the role of normality.

Initially, Husserl had primarily discussed the extent to which our experiences and apprehensions are guided by anticipations of normality as part of his investigation of individual intentionality. But as he came to realize, what counts as normal is primarily something I learn from others (Hua 15/428–29, 569, 602–4). Normality is also a tradition-bound set of norms. Husserl also refers to normal life as generative life and states that every (normal) human being is historical by virtue of being constituted as a member of a historically enduring community (Hua 15/138–39, 431). Already in Ideas II, Husserl had pointed to the fact that there, next to the tendencies originating from other persons, also exist indeterminate general demands made by custom and tradition: ‘One’ judges thus, ‘one’ holds the fork in such and such a way, etc. (Hua 4/269). Eventually, Husserl would go on to claim that the subject's birth into a living tradition has constitutive implications. It is not merely the case that I live in a world, which is permeated by references to others, and which others have already furnished with meaning, or that I understand the world (and myself) through a traditional, handed down, linguistic conventionality. The very meaning that the world has for me is such that it has its origin outside of me, in a historical past. As Husserl writes in Crisis, being embedded in “the unitary flow of a historical development”—in a generative nexus of birth and death—belongs as indissolubly to the I as does its temporal form (Hua 6/256 [1970: 253]). We are typically born into the natural community of a family, and the family is embedded within a larger cultural community, a community with its own transmitted beliefs, practices, customs, and rules. By being socialized, we inherit and appropriate a tradition that is passed down over generations; a tradition that comes to normatively regulate, orient, and organize our experiences and actions by serving as a guide for how one ought to act and think (Hua 15/136). In the volume Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität III, Husserl even argues that the being and truth of absolute objectivity corresponds to a subject-relative normality (Hua 15/35), and that its constitution can be understood as the culmination of the development of transcendental intersubjectivity, which is to be conceived precisely as an ongoing unified process of cultivating ever newer system of norms at ever higher levels (Hua 15/421).

The fact that Husserl’s phenomenology operates with an enlarged notion of the transcendental, the fact that it includes topics such as embodiment and intersubjectivity in its transcendental analysis, the fact that reality for Husserl is transcendentally correlated with a community of embodied subjects (Hua 36/135) gives Husserl’s conception of transcendental philosophy a quite different scope and character than the classical Kantian conception (Zahavi 1996 [2001]). As Merleau-Ponty rightly points out in the preface to Phenomenology of Perception “Husserl’s transcendental is not Kant’s” (1945 [2012: lxxvii]), or as it has been articulated more recently by Heinämaa, Hartimo, and Miettinen:

Husserl’s relation to the very content of transcendental philosophy can be viewed as a radicalization, a rearticulation, and a distention of the Kantian concept of the transcendental. It was a radicalization insofar as Husserl extended the transcendental critique also to logic that Kant had taken for granted. It was a rearticulation insofar as Husserl, by emphasizing the idea of givenness rather than deduction, located the domain of transcendental within the individual ego, thus making the transcendental ego inextricably personal and singular. But it was also a distention, as Husserl significantly broadened the scope of transcendental investigation to include the temporal development of the ego, its bodily existence, and intersubjective relations. (Heinämaa, Hartimo, & Miettinen 2014: 8)

It must also, however, be admitted that this distention or transformation generates new challenges of its own. If a transcendental investigation cannot ignore the historicity of human life, if transcendental structures develop over the course of time and can be modified under the influence of experience, it is faced with the task of countering the threat of historicism and cultural relativism. It should be clear, however, that Husserl, by endorsing the view that the only justification obtainable and the only justification required is one that is internal to the world of experience and to its intersubjective practices, offers a view on the transcendental that points forward in time rather than backwards to Kant. To that extent, Husserl’s conception of the transcendental is distinctly modern.

6. The lifeworld

Husserl’s dictum “to the things themselves” can be seen as an endorsement of the idea that the investigation should be guided by the subject matter itself, rather than by what we expect to find given our prior theoretical commitments: “The true method follows the nature of the things to be investigated and not our prejudices and preconceptions” (Hua 25/26 [1965: 102]). In Formal and Transcendental Logic, Husserl explicitly warns against the danger of letting oneself be dazzled by the methodology and ideals of the exact sciences, as if they constituted the absolute norms for what counts as true and real (Hua 17/245). As he points out, the scientists might well employ more exact measurements than the market sellers, but this precision also has its own limitations. In fact, it is not of much use to the trader. If you want to sell a kilogram of oranges, you do not want to and do not need to measure the weight in micrograms. What is sufficient and appropriate and precise enough depends on the concrete context and cannot be defined in absolute terms (Hua 17/245).

In the course of discussing the accomplishments and limitations of science, Husserl brings up the importance of the lifeworld. The lifeworld is, not surprisingly, the world we live and feel at home in. It is the world of experience, which we are all acquainted with, which we take for granted and which forms the basis for our daily actions. It is a subject-relative world that contains objects with affordances—cups to drink from, spoons to eat with, chairs to sit on, trees to climb in or seek shelter under. It is also a historically and culturally shaped world, a world of cumulative traditions and sedimented meaning that we as bodily subjects are anchored and socialized into. The natural sciences are often praised for their attempt to surpass the limitations of our bodily experience of the world. On a widespread view, science seeks to offer a description from a view from nowhere, where all traces of ourselves have been removed, and to acquire knowledge not of how the world is for us, but of how it is “in itself” independently of any thought and experience (6/309, 13/381, 4/207). For Husserl, this understanding of science is, however, fundamentally mistaken. It is not that Husserl doesn’t respect science, but as he put it in Ideas I,

When it is actually natural science that speaks, we listen gladly and as disciples. But it is not always natural science that speaks when natural scientists are speaking; and it assuredly is not when they are talking about “philosophy of Nature” and “epistemology as a natural science”. (Hua 3/45)

For Husserl, the rise of modern science owes a crucial debt to Galileo, whose great accomplishment was the “mathematizing reinterpretation of nature” (Hua 6/54 [1970: 53]). Mathematics became the method to unlock the inner workings of nature, but very quickly this quantifying method of theoretical abstraction and idealization was subjected to an ontological hypostatization; to be was to be measurable and people started, as Husserl writes, to “take for true being what is actually a method” (Hua 6/52 [1970: 51]). The insistence that everything that exists can and must be studied with natural scientific methods and is ontologically reducible to natural scientific facts, led not only to a depreciation of the lifeworld, but also to what Husserl viewed as the crisis of modern science, its alienation from human experience, and its inability to address questions of existential significance, of value and meaning.

The distrust in everything that cannot be quantified led to the view that the perceptually appearing world is itself nothing but a subjective illusion, a misleading representation of the physically existing world, and the claim was then made that science must transcend the realm of the given if it is to capture reality as it truly is (Hua 6/54 [1970: 54]). For Husserl, however, the idea that true reality is to be identified with some kind of behind-the-scenes world that transcends every kind of experiential evidence is nothing but a piece of mythologizing (Hua 3/115). More generally speaking, Husserl would insist that the difference between the world of perceptual experience and the world as determined by the natural sciences is not a difference between the world for us and the world in itself, but rather a difference between two ways in which one and the same world can appear to us. The world as described by science is not an autonomous world, a world behind or below the manifest world. Rather, it is the same world as that of everyday experience—namely, manifest reality—but now enriched theoretically.

Although there are divergent accounts available regarding Husserl’s final position on the status of theoretically postulated unobservable entities, especially when it comes to the question of whether Husserl is an instrumentalist (see, e.g., Soffer 1990, Wiltsche 2012, Hardy 2013, Trizio 2020), most interpreters would agree that the lifeworld for Husserl remains the basis and meaning-foundation for scientific research, even if the latter in its precision and abstraction supersede that which is intuitively given (Hua 6/48 [1970: 48]).

The physical thing which [the physicist] observes, with which he experiments, which he continually sees, takes in his hand, puts on the scale or in the melting furnace: that physical thing, and no other, becomes the subject of the predicates ascribed in physics, such as weight, temperature, electrical resistance, and so forth. (Hua 3/113)

It is the planetary bodies I observe in the sky, the water I drink, the flower I admire, etc. that the natural scientist is also investigating and whose true nature she seeks to determine in as exact and objective a manner as possible. Even in those cases, where the object of the scientific investigation is far removed from everyday practice, the shared lifeworld remains in play, when planning and setting up the experiments, when reading the measuring instruments, when interpreting, comparing, and discussing the results with one’s colleagues. In fact, as Husserl argues at length in his last work The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology, as much as the search for objectivity is laudable, we should never forget that scientifically valid knowledge has first-person plural intentionality as its precondition. Science is a theoretical attitude we can adopt upon the world. It is an intersubjective achievement with its own presuppositions and genesis. Its abstract idealized models have their roots in the lifeworld, which serves as the soil from which scientific concepts grow, and depend not only on the world of immediate, perceptual, experience, but also on a long tradition of cultural and linguistic acquisitions and accomplishments (Carr 1970). To make the latter observation is also to acknowledge that one should not conceive of the relation between lifeworld and the world of science as a static relation. Science draws on the lifeworld, but it also affects the lifeworld, and gradually some of its theoretical claims and insights will be absorbed by and integrated into the latter.

The lifeworld is not simply a brute given, but is itself an achievement of intentional constitution. Indeed, Husserl’s discussion and analysis of the lifeworld was not only meant to clarify the relation between the manifest image and the scientific image, to use Sellars’ terms, but also to show to what extent both involve and presuppose transcendental subjectivity (Hua 6/147 [1970: 144]). To put it differently, Husserl’s lifeworld analysis can be seen as a particular entry point into his transcendental phenomenology (Kern 1977) and serve as a reminder that Husserl is not only a transcendental idealist, but also an empirical realist, if this is understood as someone who defends the reality of the world of experience. At the same time, however, and this adds another level of complexity to Husserl’s analysis, Husserl is also offering an ontology of the lifeworld, i.e., attempting to map out those essential structures that will always characterize the lifeworld, regardless of how diverse it might otherwise be geographically, historically and culturally. Sometimes Husserl points to the existence of certain fairly formal features, such as a common spatiotemporal structure (Hua 1/161, Hua 6/145 [1970: 142]), but on other occasions, he highlights the role of embodiment and argues that every conceivable lifeworld is structured with reference to the lived body (Hua 15/433). In either case, however, it is the existence of certain universal structures which is supposed to allow for transhistorical and intercultural understanding.

In writings from the 1930s, Husserl introduces the distinction between the homeworld (Heimwelt) and the alienworld (Fremdwelt), both of which can be seen as different sections of the lifeworld (Held 1991, Steinbock 1995). We are all situated in a homeworld of our own, a familiar and communal background of shared traditions, norms and meaning where we feel at home. This is then contrasted with the alienworld(s), which denote unfamiliar and divergent cultural norms and practices. Central to Husserl’s late reflections on these topics is the interdependence of the two notions. Without a basis in one’s homeworld, one cannot encounter and recognize an alienworld. But it is only by doing the latter, that one comes to recognize one homeworld for what it is, a particular communal perspective on the world:

An alien humankind is constituted, an alien humanity, an alien people, for example. Precisely thereby, there is constituted for me and for us ‘our own’ community of homecomrades. (Hua 15/214)

Husserl’s reflections on intercultural encounters reaches a certain culmination in Crisis, where he explicitly links the birth of theōría in Greece to the fact that its maritime trade allowed for cultural exchange and contact with “the great and already highly cultivated nations of its surrounding world” (Hua 6/331–332 [1970: 285]). It was on his view precisely this encounter with different cultures and alternative worldviews and practices that made the Greeks realize the relativity and specificity of their own cultural-historical normality and thereby launched them on a search for a truth that would be valid for everybody (Hua 6/142, 326 [1970: 139, 280], see also Held 1989, Moran 2011, Miettinen 2020).

7. Personhood and ethics

As we saw in section 4, Husserl assigns an important role to the pure ego in his account of consciousness, consciousness is egologically structured, but as Husserl also points out, each of us has character traits, abilities, dispositions, interests, habits and convictions, and since this is all something that the pure ego lacks, the latter should not “be confused with the Ego as the real person, with the real subject of the real human being” (Hua 4/104). If I want to get to know the latter, if I want to know who I am as a real person, I have to enter the “infinity of experience” (Hua 4/104). In fact, obtaining that kind of self-knowledge is ultimately an unending quest since the person, as Husserl explains, is a unit of infinite development (Hua 14/204). Whereas the pure ego is a given, a basic feature of conscious life, the personal ego is not merely under constant development, but also the result of an accomplishment.

Given the right conditions and circumstances, you can become a person (Hua 4/265–6). How does this happen? As Husserl points out, the ego isn’t simply a dead pole of identity (Hua 9/208). Passing through the stages of life—infancy, youth, maturity, and old age—the ego continuously lives through intentional acts of different kinds. These acts leave their mark behind in consciousness and might create lasting tendencies and habitualities (Hua 1/100–1, 9/211, 4/265–266). The moment experiences are acquired, sedimentations accrue, and enduring habits are established, the subject will acquire a more concrete and personalized kind of individuality, a personal style, and individual history (Hua 4/253, 300). This process does not take place in isolation, however. On the contrary, it is very much a matter of a continuing socialization. Every child is “raised into the form of a tradition” (Hua 15/144), and ultimately my being as a person is not my own achievement but the result of what Husserl would call my “communicative intertwinement” with others (Hua 15/603). As a central passage has it:

The origin of personality is found in empathy and in the further social acts that grow out of it. For personality, it is not enough that the subject becomes aware of itself as the center of its acts; rather, personality is constituted only as the subject enters into social relations with others. (Hua 14/175)

Even though my experiential life will come to possess a content based type of individuality as a result of the particular surrounding world it finds itself in and as a result of the passive-associatively established sedimentations and habits (Hua 13/407), Husserl, however, also insists that none of this will suffice for true personhood (Hua 27/24). The personal ego is not—as Husserl adds in a critical note to earlier work of his—an associative-inductive unit (Hua 13/435), but rather something that requires active and critical deliberation and position-taking (Stellungnahme):

I can only be a person insofar as I do not merely have persisting apperceptions and through them a resisting and opposed world that is given to me as non-egoic, but also have persisting ‘convictions’, valuations, and volitions; convictions that I have acquired through my own activities, through my own active position-taking. (Hua 14/196)

Our identity as persons, our personal character and individuality, is accordingly also constituted by our personal convictions, commitments and decisions (Hua 9/214). Husserl is not blind to the fact that many of an individual’s convictions do not have their origin in that individual. In many cases, I come to hold convictions simply because I qua community member accept the beliefs and values of other members. Sometimes, I am able to reconstruct the rational reasons behind others’ convictions and actively make them my own. In other cases, I am simply yielding passively to the influences and suggestions of others without even realizing it. Husserl is consequently quite clear about the distinction between acting in accordance with norms and acting in the light of norms and he differentiates situations where I simply go along, situations where I actively endorse and appropriate the opinions of others, and situations where my opinions, decisions and convictions are based on rational motives, on intuited evidence. In the latter case, I am able to justify my decision to myself and for Husserl this exemplifies a virtuous and authentic type of rational self-responsibility, one in which my autonomy is affirmed. As he writes at one point “Be a true person; lead a life that you can consistently justify with insight, a life of practical reason” (Hua 27/36). Occasionally, Husserl also brings up the issue of self-preservation (Selbsterhaltung) and discusses how the identity of the personal ego is secured through the unity and coherence of its different convictions. In this context, self-preservation is clearly to be understood as a normative ideal, as an achievement rather than as a given (Hua 9/214).

As should be readily apparent, Husserl’s notion of personal ego is very much situated in the ethical-normative domain. It is by being committed and devoted to a certain set of central values and by leading a life in the light of specific norms, that I come to have a view and voice of my own, that I come to be a true individual in the robust sense of the term. This is where the deepest center or kernel of my being is located. It is only here that the very notion of being true or faithful to oneself starts to make sense. To abandon the values that I love with “my entire soul” and which belong inseparably to the person that I am (Hua 27/28), would be to “betray one’s true ego”, as Husserl states in a manuscript from the mid-twenties (quoted in Melle 1991: 131).

Husserl is not ordinarily thought of as a moral philosopher, but he regularly lectured on ethics, and the posthumous publication of some of these lectures (Hua 28, Hua 37, Hua 42, Husserl 2025) has generated an increasing interest in this aspect of his thinking (Melle 1991, Hart 1992, Drummond 1995, Donohoe 2004, Loidolt 2009, Heinämaa 2024).

It has become customary to distinguish at least two phases in Husserl’s ethical thought. In his early lectures on ethics from the Göttingen period, Husserl defended a rationalist and consequentialist ethics. The rationalism comes to the fore in Husserl’s claim that our valuing and willing are subjected to rational norms just like our theoretical reasoning and that ethics is comparable in its rigor and universality to logic. Husserl even speaks of formal axiology and formal praxeology as being analogous to formal logic (Hua 28/36). On the one hand, Husserl’s efforts are directed at developing a theory about how to value and will reasonably and consistently. Central to these efforts is what Husserl refers to as the highest formal principle or axiom of willing, namely an imperative formulated by Brentano: “Do what is best among what is achievable” (Hua 28/221). As Drummond has argued, Husserl’s elaboration of this imperative eventually commits him to an idealized consequentialism where we should always act “for the greatest summative good” (Drummond 2018: 140). On the other hand, however, Husserl also argues that our ethical judgments should be tied to intuitive evidence and our decisions be guided by axiological intuitions or value experiences. For Husserl, values are disclosed in intentional feelings of value-perceptions (Wertnehmung) (Hua 4/9), and part of Husserl’s early ethics is consequently taken up by an analysis of the intentionality of evaluative acts.

In the following decades, partially as a result of his continuing philosophical work on the person and partially as a result of the traumatic war years, where his youngest son was killed in battle, Husserl abandoned his rationalist consequentialism (Hua 42/391–392) in favor of an ethics of love that eventually made Husserl engage with a number of more existential themes (Cavallaro & Heffernan 2022, Heinämaa with Steinbock 2024). Husserl still highlights the importance of leading a life in evidence, a life where one bears responsibility for one’s cognitive, evaluative and practical beliefs. He explicitly refers to the Socratic-Platonic idea of philosophy as involving a commitment to a way of life characterized by unremitting self-reflection and a radical critique of one’s own lifegoals (Hua 7/9) and insists that phenomenology itself is a praxis of decisive personal and existential significance (Hua 6/140 [1970: 137]). But Husserl also speaks of how certain values can be experienced by one individual as an ethical call (Hua 42/388–90), as a vocation and absolute duty. An example he often mentions is that of the mother who is faced with the choice of saving her child and where he then rejects the idea that her choice ought to be based on a deliberation about the highest practical good (Husserl 42/344, 391). Indeed, as he even puts it in a lecture from 1919/20, “It is clear that an ethics realized merely on the basis of the categorical imperative […] is no ethics at all” (Hua Mat 9/146). In cases such as that of the mother, there might be an unconditional “you should and must” which precedes any rational explanation and deliberation, and whose legitimacy is experienced in the form of an “I would betray myself if I acted differently” (Hua 42/392).

Husserl often talks of the effort of being true to oneself, i.e., of leading one’s life in accordance with one’s central values, in terms of an individual renewal. And it is at this stage that his preoccupation with sociality then reasserts itself, since there for Husserl cannot be an individual renewal without a social and cultural renewal. As he emphasizes in a text from 1924, as an individual subject I am a member of a community, and as such my self-responsibility encompasses also a responsibility for the other community members. I am responsible for helping others to act properly. Indeed,

my self-responsibility extends to all others […]. [I]t belongs to my self-responsibility that I make the other responsible, that I possibly turn against him and against the violations that he commits against the demand of his self-responsibility. (Hua 8/198)

The same holds true for others, and so ultimately “Everybody is co-responsible for everybody else” (Hua 8/198). Husserl’s later ethics is also a social ethics (Hua 27/22), which culminates in the ideal of a love community (Liebesgemeinschaft) (Hua 14/174–175, 42/512) where subjects reciprocally can help each other realize their true selves (Hart 1992).

Bibliography

A. Primary Literature

References to the Husserliana, the text critical edition of Husserl’s work, are given by volume number, with the page number(s) following a slash (e.g., Hua 25/104–5). Most English translations include references to the Hua pagination in the margin or inserted into the text. Where translations lack such references, a parallel citation is provided to the translation.

A.1 Husserliana (Cited Hua)

  • Husserliana 1: Cartesianische Meditationen und Pariser Vorträge, Stephan Strasser (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1950. Pages 3–39 translated as The Paris Lectures, Peter Koestenbaum (trans.), The Hague: M. Nijhoff, 1964. Pages 43–183 translated as Cartesian Meditations: An Introduction to Phenomenology, Dorion Cairns (trans.), The Hague: M. Nijhoff, 1960.
  • Husserliana 2: Die Idee der Phänomenologie: Fünf Vorlesungen, Walter Biemel (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1950. Translated as The Idea of Phenomenology (Edmund Husserl Collected Works 8), Lee Hardy (trans.), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic, 1999.
  • Husserliana 3, 1–2: Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Erstes Buch: Allgemeine Einführung in die reine Phänomenologie, Karl Schuhmann (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1976. Translated as Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy. First Book: General Introduction to a Pure Phenomenology, F. Kersten (trans.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1982.
  • Husserliana 4: Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Zweites Buch: Phänomenologische Untersuchungen zur Konstitution, M. Biemel (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1952. Translated as Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy. Second Book: Studies in the Phenomenology of Constitution, R. Rojcewicz and A. Schuwer (trans), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1989.
  • Husserliana 5: Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Drittes Buch: Die Phänomenologie und die Fundamente der Wissenschaften, M. Biemel (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1952. Pages 1–137 translated as Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy. Third Book: Phenomenology and the Foundations of the Sciences, T. E. Klein and W. E. Pohl (trans), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1980. Pages 138–62 translated as Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy. Second Book: Studies in the Phenomenology of Constitution, R. Rojcewicz and A. Schuwer (trans.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1989, 405–30.
  • Husserliana 6: Die Krisis der europäischen Wissenschaften und die transzendentale Phänomenologie: Eine Einleitung in die phänomenologische Philosophie, Walter Biemel (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1954. Translated as The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology: An Introduction to Phenomenological Philosophy (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology & Existential Philosophy), David Carr (trans.), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1970.
  • Husserliana 7: Erste Philosophie (1923/24). Erster Teil: Kritische Ideengeschichte, Rudolf Boehm (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1956. Translated as First Philosophy: Lectures 1923/24 and Related Texts from the Manuscripts (1920–1925) (Collected Works 14), Sebastian Luft and Thane M. Naberhaus (trans), Dordrecht: Springer, 2019.
  • Husserliana 8: Erste Philosophie (1923/24). Zweiter Teil: Theorie der phänomenologischen Reduktion, Rudolf Boehm (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1959. Translated in First Philosophy: Lectures 1923/24 and Related Texts from the Manuscripts (1920–1925) (Collected Works 14), Sebastian Luft and Thane M. Naberhaus (trans), Dordrecht: Springer, 2019.
  • Husserliana 9: Phänomenologische Psychologie: Vorlesungen Sommersemester 1925, Walter Biemel (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1962; second edition 1968. Pages 3–234 translated as Phenomenological Psychology: Lectures, Summer Semester, 1925, J. Scanlon (trans.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1977. Pages 237–349, 517–526 translated as Psychological and Transcendental Phenomenology and the Confrontation with Heidegger (1927–1931), Thomas Sheehan and Richard E. Palmer (eds/trans), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1997.
  • Husserliana 10: Zur Phänomenologie des inneren Zeitbewusstseins (1893–1917), Rudolf Boehm (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1966. Translated as On the Phenomenology of the Consciousness of Internal Time (1893–1917) (Collected Works 4), John B. Brough (trans.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1991.
  • Husserliana 11: Analysen zur passiven Synthesis: Aus Vorlesungs- und Forschungsmanuskripten 1918–1926, Margot Fleischer (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1966. Translated as Analyses Concerning Passive and Active Synthesis: Lectures on Transcendental Logic (Edmund Husserl Collected Works 9), Anthony J. Steinbeck (trans.), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic, 2001.
  • Husserliana 12: Philosophie der Arithmetik. Mit ergänzenden Texten (1890–1901), Lothar Eley (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1970. Translated as Philosophy of Arithmetic: Psychological and Logical Investigations with Supplementary Texts from 1887–1901 (Collected Works 10), Dallas Willard (trans.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2003. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-0060-4
  • Husserliana 13: Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität: Texte aus dem Nachlass. Erster Teil: 1905–1920, Iso Kern (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973. Pages 8–9, 77–98, 111–235 translated as The Basic Problems of Phenomenology: From the Lectures, Winter Semester, 1910–1911 (Collected Works 12), Ingo Farin and James G. Hart (trans), Dordrecht: Springer, 2006.
  • Husserliana 14: Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität: Texte aus dem Nachlass. Zweiter Teil: 1921–1928, Iso Kern (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973.
  • Husserliana 15: Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität: Texte aus dem Nachlass. Dritter Teil: 1929–1935, Iso Kern (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973.
  • Husserliana 16: Ding und Raum. Vorlesungen 1907, Ulrich Claesges (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1973. Translated as Thing and Space: Lectures of 1907 (Collected Works 7), Richard Rojcewicz (trans.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1997.
  • Husserliana 17: Formale und transzendentale Logik: Versuch einer Kritik der logischen Vernunft, Paul Janssen (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1974. Translated as Formal and Transcendental Logic, Dorion Cairns (trans.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1969. doi:10.1007/978-94-017-4900-8
  • Husserliana 18: Logische Untersuchungen. Erster Band: Prolegomena zur reinen Logik, Elmar Holenstein (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1975. Translated in Logical Investigations Volume 1, Dermot Moran (ed.), J. N. Findlay (trans.), London: Routledge, 2001, 1–161. doi:10.4324/9780203879054
  • Husserliana 19, 1–2: Logische Untersuchungen. Zweiter Band: Untersuchungen zur Phänomenologie und Theorie der Erkenntnis, Ursula Panzer (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1984. Translated in Logical Investigations Volumes 1 and 2, Dermot Moran (ed.); J. N. Findlay (trans.), London: Routledge, 1: 162–331, 2: 1–364.
  • Husserliana 20, 1: Logische Untersuchungen: Ergänzungsband. Erster Teil: Entwürfe zur Umarbeitung der VI. Untersuchung und zur Vorrede für die Neuauflage der Logischen Untersuchungen (Sommer 1913), Ullrich Melle (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2002.
  • Husserliana 20, 2: Logische Untersuchungen: Ergänzungsband. Zweiter Teil: Texte für die Neufassung der VI. Untersuchung. Zur Phänomenologie des Ausdrucks und der Erkenntnis (1893/94–1921), Ullrich Melle (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2005.
  • Husserliana 21: Studien zur Arithmetik und Geometrie. Texte aus dem Nachlass (1886–1901), Ingeborg Strohmeyer (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1983.
  • Husserliana 22: Aufsätze und Rezensionen (1890–1910), Bernhard Rang (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1979. Translated in Early Writings in the Philosophy of Logic and Mathematics (Collected Works 5), Dallas Willard (trans.), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic, 1994.
  • Husserliana 23: Phantasie, Bildbewusstsein, Erinnerung. Zur Phänomenologie der anschaulichen Vergegenwärtigungen. Texte aus dem Nachlass (1898–1925), Eduard Marbach (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1980. Translated as Phantasy, Image Consciousness, and Memory (1898–1925) (Collected Works 11), John B. Brough (trans.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2005. doi:10.1007/1-4020-2642-0
  • Husserliana 24: Einleitung in die Logik und Erkenntnistheorie: Vorlesungen 1906/07, Ullrich Melle (ed.), Dordrecht: Martinus Nijhoff, 1984. Translated as Introduction to Logic and Theory of Knowledge: Lectures 1906/07 (Collected Works 13), Claire Ortiz Hill (trans.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2008. doi:10.1007/978-1-4020-6727-3
  • Husserliana 25: Aufsätze und Vorträge (1911–1921), Thomas Nenon and Hans Rainer Sepp (eds), Dordrecht: Martinus Nijhoff, 1987. Pages 3–62 translated as “Philosophy as rigorous science”, in Q. Lauer (ed./trans.), Phenomenology and the Crisis of Philosophy, New York: Harper & Row, 1965, 71–147.
  • Husserliana 26: Vorlesungen über Bedeutungslehre. Sommersemester 1908, Ursula Panzer (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1987.
  • Husserliana 27: Aufsätze und Vorträge (1922–1937), Thomas Nenon and Hans Rainer Sepp (eds), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1989.
  • Husserliana 28: Vorlesungen über Ethik und Wertlehre (1908–1914), Ullrich Melle (ed.), The Hague: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1988.
  • Husserliana 29: Die Krisis der europäischen Wissenschaften und die transzendentale Phänomenologie: Ergänzungsband. Texte aus dem Nachlass 1934–1937, R. N. Smid (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1993.
  • Husserliana 30: Logik und allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie. Vorlesungen 1917/18. Mit ergänzenden Texten aus der ersten Fassung 1910/11, Ursula Panzer (ed.), The Hague: Kluwer Academic, 1995. Translated as Logic and General Theory of Science: Lectures 1917/18 with Supplementary Texts from the First Version of 1910/11 (Collected Works 15), Claire Ortiz Hill (trans.), Cham, Switzerland: Springer, 2019. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-14529-3
  • Husserliana 31: Aktive Synthesen: Aus der Vorlesung “Transzendentale Logik” 1920/21. Ergänzungsband zu “Analysen zur passiven Synthesis”, Roland Breeur (ed.), The Hague: Kluwer Academic, 2000.
  • Husserliana 32: Natur und Geist: Vorlesungen Sommersemester 1927, Michael Weiler (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2001.
  • Husserliana 33: Die ‘Bernauer Manuskripte’ über das Zeitbewußtsein (1917/18), Rudolf Bernet and Dieter Lohmar (eds), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2001.
  • Husserliana 34: Zur phänomenologischen Reduktion: Texte aus dem Nachlass (1926–1935), Sebastian Luft (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2002.
  • Husserliana 35: Einleitung in die Philosophie: Vorlesungen 1922/23, Berndt Goossens (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2002.
  • Husserliana 36: Transzendentaler Idealismus: Texte aus dem Nachlass (1908–1921), Robin D. Rollinger (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2003.
  • Husserliana 37: Einleitung in die Ethik. Vorlesungen Sommersemester 1920 und 1924, Henning Peucker (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 2004.
  • Husserliana 38: Wahrnehmung und Aufmerksamkeit. Texte aus dem Nachlass (1893–1912), Thomas Vongehr and Regula Giuliani (eds), New York: Springer, 2005.
  • Husserliana 39: Die Lebenswelt: Auslegungen der vorgegebenen Welt und ihrer Konstitution. Texte aus dem Nachlass (1916–1937), Rochus Sowa (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer.
  • Husserliana 40: Untersuchungen zur Urteilstheorie. Texte aus dem Nachlass (1893–1918), Robin Rollinger (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2009. doi:10.1007/978-1-4020-6897-3
  • Husserliana 41: Zur Lehre vom Wesen und zur Methode der eidetischen Variation. Texte aus dem Nachlass, 1891–1935, Dirk Fonfara (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2012. doi:10.1007/978-94-007-2625-3
  • Husserliana 42: Grenzprobleme der Phänomenologie. Analysen des Unbewusstseins und der Instinkte. Metaphysik. Späte Ethik. Texte aus dem Nachlass 1908–1937, Robin Sowa and Thomas Vongehr (eds), New York: Springer, 2013. doi:10.1007/978-94-007-6801-7
  • Husserliana 43: Studien zur Struktur des Bewusstseins. Teilbände I–IV, Ullrich Melle and Thomas Vongehr (eds), Dordrecht: Springer, 2020.
  • Husserliana 44: Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Zweites Buch: Phänomenologische Untersuchungen zur Konstitution und Wissenschaftstheorie sowie das Nachwort zu meinen Ideen, Dirk Fonfara (ed.), Cham: Springer, 2025).

A.2 Husserliana Materialenband (cited Hua Mat)

  • Husserliana Materialienband 1: Logik. Vorlesung 1896, E. Schuhmann (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2001.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 2: Logik. Vorlesung 1902/03, E. Schuhmann (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2001.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 3: Allgemeine Erkenntnistheorie. Vorlesung 1902/03, E. Schuhmann (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2001.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 4: Natur und Geist. Vorlesungen Sommersemester 1919, ed. M. Weiler, Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2002.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 5: Urteilstheorie. Vorlesung 1905, E. Schuhmann (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2002.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 6: Alte und neue Logik. Vorlesung 1908/09, E. Schuhmann (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2003.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 7: Einführung in die Phänomenologie der Erkenntnis. Vorlesung 1909, E. Schuhmann (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2005.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 8: Späte Texte über Zeitkonstitution (1929–1934). Die C-Manuskripte, D. Lohmar (ed.), New York: Springer, 2006.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 9: Einleitung in die Philosophie. Vorlesungen 1916–1919, H. Jacobs (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2012.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 10: Einleitung in die Phänomenologie. Vorlesung 1912, T. Vongehr (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2023.
  • Husserliana Materialienband 11: Manuskripte zur Konstitution von Raumdingen – aus den D-Manuskripten, D. Lohmar (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer, 2024.

A.3 Other Cited Works by Husserl

  • 1939 [1973], Erfahrung Und Urteil: Untersuchungen Zur Genealogie Der Logik, Ludwig Landgrebe (ed.), Prague: Academia verlagsbuchhandlung. Translated as Experience and Judgment: Investigations in a Genealogy of Logic (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology & Existential Philosophy), James S. Churchill and Karl Ameriks (trans), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1973.
  • 1981. Shorter Works, P. McCormick and F. A. Elliston (eds.), Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press.
  • 1994, Briefwechsel I–X (Husserliana Dokumente, Bd. 3), Elisabeth Schuhmann and Karl Schuhmann (eds), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic.
  • 2024, Values of Love and Ethical Reflection (Husserlian Legacies: Themes for the 21st Century), Sara Heinämaa and Anthony J. Steinbock (eds), Andrew D. Barrette (trans.), Cham: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-031-68698-6

B. Secondary Literature

B.1 Cited works

  • Beck, Maximilian, 1928, “Die Neue Problemlage der Erkenntnistheorie”, Deutsche Vierteljahrsschrift für Literaturwissenschaft und Geistesgeschichte, 6: 611–639.
  • Benoist, Jocelyn, 2001, Intentionalité et langage dans les «recherches logiques» de Husserl (Epiméthée), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Bernet, Rudolf, 1990, “Husserls Begriff des Noema”, in Husserl-Ausgabe und Husserl-Forschung (Phaenomenologica 115), Samuel IJsseling (ed.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 61–80. doi:10.1007/978-94-009-2427-7_5
  • Bernet, Rudolf, Iso Kern, and Eduard Marbach, 1993, An Introduction to Husserlian Phenomenology (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Brentano, Franz, 1874 [1973], Psychologie vom empirischen Standpunkt, Leipzig: Duncker & Humblot. Translated from the 1924 edition as Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint (International Library of Philosophy and Scientific Method), Oskar Kraus (ed.) and Linda L. McAlister (English ed.), Linda L. McAlister, Antos C. Rancurello, and D. B. Terrell (trans), London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1973.
  • Brough, John, 1972, “The Emergence of an Absolute Consciousness in Husserl’s Early Writings on Time-Consciousness”, Man and World, 5(3): 298–326. doi:10.1007/BF01248638
  • Carr, David, 1970, “Husserl’s Problematic Concept of the Life-World”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 7(4): 331–339.
  • –––, 1999, The Paradox of Subjectivity: The Self in the Transcendental Tradition, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780195126907.001.0001
  • Cavallaro, Marco and George Heffernan (eds), 2022, The Existential Husserl: A Collection of Critical Essays (Contributions to Phenomenology 120), Dordrecht: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-031-05095-4
  • Crowell, Steven Galt, 2001, Husserl, Heidegger, and the Space of Meaning: Paths toward Transcendental Phenomenology (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • De Boer, Theodore, 1966 [1978], De ontwikkelingsgang in het denken van Husserl (Wijsgerige teksten en studies 14), Assen: Van Gorcum. Translated as The Development of Husserl’s Thought (Phaenomenologica 76), Theodore Plantinga. (trans.), The Hague/Boston: Nijhoff, 1978. doi:10.1007/978-94-009-9691-5
  • de Warren, Nicolas, 2009, Husserl and the Promise of Time: Subjectivity in Transcendental Phenomenology (Modern European Philosophy), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511657412
  • Depraz, Natalie, 1995, Transcendance et incarnation: le statut de l’intersubjectivité comme altérité à soi chez Husserl (Bibliothèque d’histoire de la philosophie Nouvelle série), Paris: Vrin.
  • Donohoe, Janet, 2004, Husserl on Ethics and Intersubjectivity: From Static to Genetic Phenomenology, Amherst, NY: Humanity Books.
  • Doyon, Maxime, 2024, Phenomenology and the Norms of Perception, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/9780191993527.001.0001
  • Dreyfus, Hubert L., 1982, “Husserl’s Perceptual Noema”, in Dreyfus and Hall (eds) 1982a: 97–123.
  • Dreyfus, Hubert L. and Harrison Hall (eds), 1982a, Husserl, Intentionality, and Cognitive Science, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press/Bradford Books.
  • –––, 1982b, “Introduction”, in Dreyfus and Hall (eds) 1982a: 1–27.
  • Drummond, John J., 1990, Husserlian Intentionality and Non-Foundational Realism: Noema and Object (Contributions to Phenomenology 4), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers. doi:10.1007/978-94-009-1974-7
  • –––, 1992, “An Abstract Consideration: De-Ontologizing the Noema”, in The Phenomenology of the Noema (Contributions to Phenomenology 10), John J. Drummond and Lester Embree (eds), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 89–109. doi:10.1007/978-94-017-3425-7_7
  • –––, 1995, “Moral Objectivity: Husserl’s Sentiments of the Understanding”, Husserl Studies, 12(2): 165–183. doi:10.1007/BF01417589
  • –––, 2018, “Husserl’s Middle Period and the Development of His Ethics”, in The Oxford Handbook of the History of Phenomenology, Dan Zahavi (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 135–154 (ch. 7).
  • Fink, Eugen, 1933 [2000], “Die phänomenologische Philosophie Edmund Husserls in der gegenwärtigen Kritik”, Kant-Studien, 38(1–2): 319–383. Translated as “The Phenomenological Philosophy of Edumund Husserl and Contemporary Criticism”, in The Phenomenology of Husserl: Selected Critical Readings, R. O. Elveton (ed./trans.), Chicago: Quadrangle Books, 1970. Second edition, Seattle: Noesis Press, 2000, 70–139. doi:10.1515/kant.1933.38.1-2.319 (1933)
  • –––, 1939 [1981], “Das Problem der Phänomenologie Edmund Husserls”, Revue Internationale de Philosophie, 1(2): 226–270. Translated as “The problem of the phenomenology of Edmund Husserl”, in Apriori and World: European Contributions to Husserlian Phenomenology, W. McKenna, R. M. Harlan, and L. E. Winters (eds), R. M. Harlan (trans.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1981, 21–55.
  • Frege, Gottlob, 1894, “Rezension von: E. Husserl, Philosophie der Arithmetik I”, Zeitschrift für Philosophie und philosophische Kritik, 103: 313–332.
  • Føllesdal, Dagfinn, 1958, Husserl und Frege: ein Beitrag zur Beleuchtung der Entstehung der phänomenologischen Philosophie (Avhandlinger utgitt av det Norske videnskaps-akademi i Oslo. 2:Hist.-filos. klasse, 1958, no. 2), Oslo: I kommisjon hos Aschehoug.
  • –––, 1969, “Husserl’s Notion of Noema”, The Journal of Philosophy, 66(20): 680–687. doi:10.2307/2024451
  • –––, 1974, “Husserl’s Theory of Perception”, Ajatus, 36: 95–103.
  • Hart, James G., 1992, The Person and the Common Life: Studies in a Husserlian Social Ethics (Phaenomenologica 126), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers. doi:10.1007/978-94-015-7991-9
  • Hardy, Lee, 2013, Nature’s Suit: Husserl’s Phenomenological Philosophy of the Physical Sciences (Series in Continental Thought 45), Athens, OH: Ohio University Press.
  • Heinämaa, Sara, 2003, Toward a Phenomenology of Sexual Difference: Husserl, Merleau-Ponty, Beauvoir, Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers.
  • –––, 2020, “Values of Love: Two Forms of Infinity Characteristic of Human Persons”, Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences, 19(3): 431–450. doi:10.1007/s11097-019-09653-2
  • Heinämaa, Sara, Mirja Hartimo, and Timo Miettinen, 2014, “Introduction: Methodological, Historical, and Conceptual Starting Points”, in Phenomenology and the Transcendental, Sara Heinämaa, Mirja Hartimo, and Timo Miettinen (eds), New York: Routledge, 1–18. doi:10.4324/9780203797037
  • Heinämaa, Sara in collaboration with Anthony J. Steinbock, 2024, “Husserl’s Investigations into Love and Values of Love: Axiology, Praxeology, and Ethics” in Values of Love and Ethical Reflection (Husserlian Legacies: Themes for the 21st Century 1), by Edmund Husserl, Sara Heinämaa and Anthony J. Steinbock (eds), Cham: Springer, xi–xxxviii. doi:10.1007/978-3-031-68698-6
  • Held, Klaus, 1966, Lebendige Gegenwart: die Frage nach der Seinsweise des Transzendentalen ich bei Edmund Husserl, entwickelt am Leitfaden der Zeitproblematik (Phaenomenologica 23), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • –––, 1989, “Husserl und die Griechen”, Phänomenologische Forschungen, 22: 137–176.
  • –––, 1991, “Heimwelt, Fremdwelt, die eine Welt”, Phänomenologische Forschungen, 24/25: 305–337.
  • Holenstein, Elmar, 1972, Phänomenologie der Assoziation: Zu Struktur und Funktion eines Grundprinzips der passiven Genesis bei E. Husserl (Phaenomenologica 44), Den Haag: Nijhoff.
  • Hopp, Walter, 2011, Perception and Knowledge: A Phenomenological Account, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511758621
  • –––, 2020, Phenomenology: A Contemporary Introduction (Routledge Contemporary Introductions to Philosophy), New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781003047216
  • Ingarden, Roman, 1963 [1975], “Motywach, które doprowadziły Husserla do transcendentalnego idealizmu”, in his Z badań nad filosofia̦ współczesna̦, Państwowe Wydawn. Naukowe. Translated as On the Motives Which Led Husserl to Transcendental Idealism (Phaenomenologica 64), Arnór Hannibalsson (trans.), Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • Kern, Iso, 1962 [1977], “Die drei Wege zur transzendentalphänomenologischen Reduktion in der
    Philosophie Edmund Husserls”, Tijdskrift voor Filosofie, 24: 303–349. Translated as “The Three Ways to the Transcendental Phenomenological Reduction in the Philosophy of Edmund Husserl”, in Husserl: Expositions and Appraisals, Frederick A. Elliston and Peter McCormick (eds), Notre Dame, IN/New York: University of Notre Dame Press, 1977, 126–149.
  • Kortooms, Antonie Johannes Maria, 2002, Phenomenology of Time: Edmund Husserl’s Analysis of Time-Consciousness (Phaenomenologica 161), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers. doi:10.1007/978-94-015-9918-4
  • Lipps, Theodor, 1909, Leitfaden der Psychologie, 3. teilweise umgearb. aufl, Leipzig: W. Engelmann.
  • Loidolt, Sophie, 2009, Anspruch und Rechtfertigung: eine Theorie des rechtlichen Denkens im Anschluss an die Phänomenologie Edmund Husserls (Phaenomenologica 191), Dordrecht: Springer.
  • Lohmar, Dieter and Ichirō Yamaguchi (eds), 2010, On Time: New Contributions to the Husserlian Phenomenology of Time (Phaenomenologica 197), Dordrecht/New York: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-90-481-8766-9
  • Marbach, Eduard, 1974, Das Problem des Ich in der Phänomenologie Husserls (Phaenomenologica 59), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-2020-6
  • McIntyre, Ronald, 1982, “Intending and Referring”, in Dreyfus and Hall (eds) 1982a: 215–231.
  • –––, 1986, “Husserl and the Representational Theory of Mind”, Topoi, 5(2): 101–113. doi:10.1007/BF00139224
  • Melle, Ullrich, 1991, “The Development of Husserl’s Ethics:”, Études Phénoménologiques, 7(13–14): 115–135. doi:10.5840/etudphen1991713/144
  • Merleau-Ponty, Maurice, 1945 [2012], Phénoménologie de la perception (Bibliothèque des idées), Paris: Gallimard. Translated as Phenomenology of Perception, Donald A. Landes (trans.), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203720714
  • Miettinen, Timo, 2020, Husserl and the Idea of Europe (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Mohanty, J. N., 1977, “Husserl and Frege: A New Look at Their Relationship”, in Readings on Edmund Husserl’s Logical Investigations, J. N. Mohanty (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 22–32. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-1055-9_3
  • Moran, Dermot, 2011, “‘Even the Papuan Is a Man and Not a Beast’: Husserl on Universalism and the Relativity of Cultures”, Journal of the History of Philosophy, 49(4): 463–494. doi:10.1353/hph.2011.0088
  • Montavont, Anne, 1999, De la passivité dans la phénoménologie de Husserl, Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Overgaard, Søren, 2022, “Phenomenologists on Perception and Hallucination: Husserl and Merleau‐Ponty”, Philosophy Compass, 17(8): e12861. doi:10.1111/phc3.12861
  • Peirce, C. S., 1868 [1955], “Some Consequences of Four Incapacities”, The Journal of Speculative Philosophy, 2(3): 140–157. Abridged version in Philosophical Writings of Peirce (Dover Books on Philosophy T217), Justus Buchler (ed.), New York: Dover Publications, 228–250 (ch. 16).
  • Perreau, Laurent, 2013, Le monde social selon Husserl (Phaenomenologica 209), Dordrecht/New York: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-94-007-5401-0
  • Philipse, Herman, 1995, “Transcendental Idealism”, in The Cambridge Companion to Husserl, Barry Smith and David Woodruff Smith (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 239–322 (ch. 6). doi:10.1017/CCOL0521430232.007
  • Rang, Bernhard, 1973, Kausalität und Motivation: Untersuchungen zum Verhältnis von Perspektivität und Objektivität in der Phänomenologie Edmund Husserls (Phaenomenologica 53), Haag: Martinus Nijhoff. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-2393-1
  • Reinach, Adolf, 1914 [1968], “Über Phänomenologie”. Lecture at Marburg, January, 1914. Published as Was ist Phänomenologie?, München: Kösel-Verlag, 1951. Translated as “What Is Phenomenology?”, Derek Kelly (trans.), Philosophical Forum, 1(2): 234–256.
  • Rodemeyer, Lanei M., 2006, Intersubjective Temporality: It’s about Time (Phaenomenologica 176), Dordrecht: Springer. doi:10.1007/1-4020-4214-0
  • Salice, Alessandro, 2015 [2020], “The Phenomenology of the Munich and Göttingen Circles”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Winter 2020), Edward N. Zalta and Uri Nodelman (eds), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/win2020/entries/phenomenology-mg/>.
  • Sheehan, Thomas, 1997, “Husserl and Heidegger: The making and unmaking for a relationship”, in Psychological and Transcendental Phenomenology and the Confrontation with Heidegger (1927–1931), Thomas Sheehan and Richard E. Palmer (eds/trans), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic, 1–32.
  • Smith, A. D., 2003, Routledge Philosophy Guidebook to Husserl and the Cartesian Meditations (Routledge Philosophy Guidebooks), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203422663
  • Smith, David Woodruff, 2013, Husserl (Routledge Philosophers), second edition, London/New York: Routledge. First edition, 2007. doi:10.4324/9780203742952
  • Smith, David Woodruff and Ronald McIntyre, 1982, Husserl and Intentionality: A Study of Mind, Meaning, and Language (Synthese Library 154), Dordrecht: D. Reidel. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-9383-5
  • Soffer, Gail, 1990, “Phenomenology and Scientific Realism: Husserl’s Critique of Galileo”, The Review of Metaphysics, 44(1): 67–94.
  • Sokolowski, Robert, 1987, “Husserl and Frege”, The Journal of Philosophy, 84(10): 521–528.
  • Spiegelberg, Herbert, 1972, Phenomenology in Psychology and Psychiatry: A Historical Introduction (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology & Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Steinbock, Anthony J., 1995, Home and beyond: Generative Phenomenology after Husserl (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Ströker, Elisabeth, 1987, Husserls transzendentale Phänomenologie, Frankfurt am Main: V. Klostermann.
  • Szanto, Thomas, 2016, “Husserl on Collective Intentionality”, in The Phenomenological Approach to Social Reality: History, Concepts, Problems (Studies in the Philosophy of Sociality 6), Alessandro Salice and Bernhard Schmid (eds), Dordrecht: Springer, 145–172. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-27692-2_7
  • Taipale, Joona, 2014, Phenomenology and Embodiment: Husserl and the Constitution of Subjectivity (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Thomasson, Amie L., 2007, “In What Sense Is Phenomenology Transcendental?”, The Southern Journal of Philosophy, 45(S1): 85–92. doi:10.1111/j.2041-6962.2007.tb00114.x
  • Trizio, Emiliano, 2020, Philosophy’s Nature: Husserl’s Phenomenology, Natural Science, and Metaphysics, London: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781003007470
  • Tugendhat, Ernst, 1970, Der Wahrheitsbegriff bei Husserl und Heidegger, Berlin: de Gruyter.
  • Willard, D. 2011. “Realism sustained? Interpreting Husserl’s progression into idealism”, paper presented at the Early Phenomenology Conference held at Franciscan University of Steubenville, April 29–30, 2011. http://www.dwillard.org/articles/artview.asp?artID=151
  • Wiltsche, Harald A., 2012, “What Is Wrong with Husserl’s Scientific Anti-Realism?”, Inquiry, 55(2): 105–130. doi:10.1080/0020174X.2012.661572
  • –––, 2015, “Intuitions, Seemings, and Phenomenology”, Teorema: Revista Internacional de Filosofía, 34(3): 57–78.
  • Zahavi, Dan, 1996 [2001], Husserl und die transzendentale Intersubjektivität: eine Antwort auf die sprachpragmatische Kritik (Phaenomenologica 135), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers. Translated as Husserl and Transcendental Intersubjectivity: A Response to the Linguistic-Pragmatic Critique (Series in Continental Thought 29), Elizabeth A. Behnke (trans.), Athens, OH: Ohio University Press, 2001.
  • –––, 1999, Self-Awareness and Alterity: A Phenomenological Investigation (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • –––, 2003, Husserl’s Phenomenology (Cultural Memory in the Present), translated by the author, Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • –––, 2014, Self and Other: Exploring Subjectivity, Empathy, and Shame, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199590681.001.0001
  • –––, 2017, Husserl’s Legacy: Phenomenology, Metaphysics, and Transcendental Philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780199684830.001.0001
  • –––, 2025, Being We: Phenomenological Contributions to Social Ontology, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/9780191915482.001.0001

B.2 Other major critical works

  • Bernet, Rudolf, Donn Welton, and Gina Zavota (eds), 2005, Edmund Husserl: Critical Assessments of Leading Philosophers, 5 vols., London/New York: Routledge.
  • Beyer, Christian, 2000, Intentionalität und Referenz: Eine sprachanalytische Studie zu Husserls transzendentaler Phänomenologie, Paderborn: Brill/mentis. doi:10.30965/9783969751985
  • Boehm, Rudolf, 1968, Vom Gesichtspunkt der Phänomenologie (Phaenomenologica 26), Den Haag: Nijhoff. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-3436-4
  • Carr, David, 1987, Interpreting Husserl: Critical and Comparative Studies (Phaenomenologica 106), Dordrecht/Boston: M. Nijhoff. doi:10.1007/978-94-009-3595-2
  • Centrone, Stefania, 2010, Logic and Philosophy of Mathematics in the Early Husserl (Synthese Library. Studies in Epistemology, Logic, Methodology, and Philosophy of Science 345), Dordrecht/New York: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-90-481-3246-1
  • Claesges, Ulrich, 1964, Edmund Husserls Theorie der Raumkonstitution (Phaenomenologica 19), Den Haag: M. Nijhoff. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-3573-6
  • Gallagher, Shaun, 1998, The Inordinance of Time (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Gander, Hans-Helmuth (ed.), 2010, Husserl-Lexikon, Darmstadt: Wissenschaftliche Buchgesellschaft.
  • Gurwitsch, Aron, 1966, Studies in Phenomenology and Psychology (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology & Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Hartimo, Mirja, 2021, Husserl and Mathematics, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/9781108990905
  • Ierna, Carlo, Hanne Jacobs, and Filip Mattens (eds), 2010, Philosophy, Phenomenology, Sciences: Essays in Commemoration of Edmund Husserl (Phaenomenologica 200), Dordrecht/New York: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-94-007-0071-0
  • IJsseling, Samuel (ed.), 1990, Husserl-Ausgabe und Husserl-Forschung (Phaenomenologica 115), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publischers.
  • Jacobs, Hanne (ed.), 2021, The Husserlian Mind, London: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780429243790
  • Jardine, James, 2022, Empathy, Embodiment, and the Person: Husserlian Investigations of Social Experience and the Self (Phaenomenologica 233), Cham: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-84463-9
  • Lee, Nam-in, 1993, Edmund Husserls Phänomenologie der Instinkte (Phaenomenologica 128), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
  • Luft, Sebastian, 2011, Subjectivity and Lifeworld in Transcendental Phenomenology, Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Mohanty, J. N., 1989, Transcendental Phenomenology: An Analytic Account, Oxford/Cambridge, MA: Basil Blackwell.
  • Moran, Dermot, 2012, Husserl’s “Crisis of the European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology”: An Introduction (Cambridge Introductions to Key Philosophical Texts), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9781139025935
  • Moran, Dermot and Joseph D. Cohen, 2012, The Husserl Dictionary (Continuum Philosophy Dictionaries), London/New York: Continuum.
  • Overgaard, Søren, 2004, Husserl and Heidegger on Being in the World (Phaenomenologica 173), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers. doi:10.1007/978-1-4020-2239-5
  • Peucker, Henning, 2008, “From Logic to the Person: An Introduction to Edmund Husserl’s Ethics”, The Review of Metaphysics, 62(2): 307–325.
  • Rinofner-Kreidl, Sonja, 2000, Edmund Husserl: Zeitlichkeit und Intentionalität (Phänomenologie 8), München: Alber.
  • Rollinger, R. D., 1999, Husserl’s Position in the School of Brentano (Phaenomenologica 150), Dordrecht/Boston, MA: Kluwer Academic.
  • Schuhmann, Karl, 1977, Husserl-Chronik: Denk- und Lebensweg Edmund Husserls (Husserliana Dokumente 1), Den Haag: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • –––, 1988, Husserls Staatsphilosophie (Alber-Reihe Praktische Philosophie, Bd. 29), Freiburg/Br.: K. Alber.
  • Sokolowski, Robert, 1964, The Formation of Husserl’s Concept of Constitution (Phaenomenologica 18), The Hague: M. Nijhoff. doi:10.1007/978-94-017-3325-0
  • –––, 1974, Husserlian Meditations; How Words Present Things (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology & Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Volonté, Paolo, 1997, Husserls Phänomenologie der Imagination: zur Funktion der Phantasie bei der Konstitution von Erkenntnis (Phänomenologie, Bd. 2), Freiburg im Breisgau: K. Alber.
  • Waldenfels, Bernhard, 1971, Das Zwischenreich des Dialogs: Sozialphilosophische Untersuchungen in Anschluss an Edmund Husserl (Phaenomenologica 41), Den Haag: M. Nijhoff. doi:10.1007/978-94-010-3000-7
  • Welton, Donn, 2000, The Other Husserl: The Horizons of Transcendental Phenomenology (Studies in Continental Thought), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • ––– (ed.), 2003, The New Husserl: A Critical Reader (Studies in Continental Thought), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.

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