Policy on Course Readers

Entries in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy are freely available in HTML from https://plato.stanford.edu/, and PDF versions may be obtained as a benefit of membership in the Friends of the SEP Society at http://leibniz.stanford.edu/friends/. There are three options open to those course instructors who wish to include a reprint of an SEP entry in a course reader. These options are governed by SEP policies, and the policies were developed to protect the long-term sustainability of the SEP. Basically, if you want to distribute printed copies of an SEP entry in a course reader (i.e., distribute a photocopied printout of the HTML or PDF version), you will need permission of the author. By contrast, the electronic distribution of SEP entries in course readers (via the internet, e.g., web, email, etc.), is restricted. The SEP rarely grants permission for such electronic distribution, for the reasons explained in Section 3 below.

1. The Options

Option #1: Point students to the free version

Instead of including SEP entries in course readers, point your students to the free HTML version at https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/entryname/. Students may prefer to read that version on their computer screen without incurring any costs. Alternatively, they may be able to print that version more cheaply than the amount you would be charging for reproducing those pages in your course reader. Indeed, they can print in their preferred font and font size. Note that since each student may have set his/her browser to to a different default font and size, pagination on their own printouts might vary, and so when you discuss passages in SEP entries in class, you should those passages by section, subsection, and paragraph number.

Option #2: Include a printout of the HTML version in course reader

  1. Write to the author to obtain permission to distribute photocopies of his or her entry. There is a link to the author's email address in the entry footer (i.e., in the brown band at the very bottom of the entry).
  2. If the author gives you permission, print out the HTML version from
    https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/entryname/

    [Note that this may involve handling several HTML files, since some SEP entries include footnotes and supplementary documents which are separate HTML files. (This isn't an issue with Option #3 below, since the PDF versions of SEP entries combine all the supplementary documents into a single downloadable file.)

  3. Photocopy the printout for inclusion in the course reader.
  4. Since your browser may not stamp the URL of the HTML entry on the printout, be sure to include a title page that cites the URL, by following our guidelines at
    https://plato.stanford.edu/cite.html

    or by following the instructions in the “Cite This Entry” link displayed at the top left corner of the Navigation Panel when viewing an entry.

The instructor may not distribute the HTML to the students electronically over the Internet (e.g., via email or by posting it on his/her webpage or coursepage) but is encouraged to provide students with a link to the free copy at

https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/entryname/

Note: On this option, the instructor would be asking the students to pay for something (namely, the printed copy of the SEP entry in the course reader) the content of which can be freely accessed in HTML using their web browsers.

Option #3: Include a printout of the PDF version in the course reader

  1. Write to the author to obtain permission to distribute photocopies of his or her entry. There is a link to the author's email address in the entry footer (i.e., in the brown band at the very bottom of the entry).
  2. If the author gives you permission to distribute photocopies, join (if you aren't already a member of) the Friends of the SEP Society (https://leibniz.stanford.edu/friends/join/) as an Associate Member ($10/year) or Professional Member ($25/year).
  3. Log in to the Friends Society and download a PDF version of an SEP entry.
  4. Provide that PDF version to the course-reader producer for printing/photocopying and inclusion in the course reader.

The instructor may not distribute the PDF to the students electronically over the Internet (e.g., via email or by posting it on his/her webpage or coursepage) but is encouraged to provide students with a link to the free copy at

https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/entryname/

This option doesn't entail that the students will have to pay for something they can freely download from the Internet, since these PDF versions are available only to those who pay membership dues to join the Friends of the SEP Society.

2. The Policies Behind the Options

The SEP holds the exclusive right to distribute copies of SEP entries in HTML or PDF electronically via the Internet or World Wide Web. SEP authors, however, retain copyright over the printed and reprinted versions of their entries, and they are free to republish them in print media and grant you permission for reproduction in a course reader. Our full copyright policies are stated on the following pages:

Consequently, anyone who wishes to include a printed copy of the HTML or PDF version of an SEP entry must obtain permission of the author before such a copy may be included in a course reader. However, a printed collection consisting solely of entries from the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy is a special case, and for such a collection, you would have to apply to the SEP editors about copyright matters. The underlying theme behind the above policies is that the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy project and its mirror sites have the exclusive right and authority to distribute electronic HTML and PDF files of SEP entries over the Internet.

3. The Rationale Behind the Policies

There are reasons why our copyright policy does not allow authors, course instructors, or anyone else to deliver SEP entries electronically over the internet (e.g., through a web server or via email). The principal problem is that it negatively affects the long-term survival of the SEP. The long-term survival of the SEP depends in part on the impact it has. The greater its impact, the more libraries will join to support it. By distributing SEP entries electronically from another server or via email, one would diminish our impact in several ways. First, not as many people would be accessing our servers. This reduced access count on our server logs would indicate that we are having less of an impact. Second (for the case where one puts the SEP entry up on a local university web page or private home page), readers would be able to create links to the page on your server instead of creating links to the page on our server. This reduces our impact at Google, which ranks our page (on a list of matches to a keyword search) on the basis of how many links there are to it on the web. Google has become a de facto measure of authoritativeness on the web. In addition to these problems, you also make it more difficult to assess the particular impact your entry is having, since we can no longer easily count and compile all the accesses to it.

There are two other problems with putting an entry on another server: (1) Changes could be made to the version on the other server without going through our referee process. This undermines the “imprimatur” of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (authors might add content to the other version that was not acceptable to our referees, and people wouldn't necessarily know what the differences are between the two versions). (2) There would no longer be a single stable citation path — each non-affiliated server which serves the entry introduces a new citation path. People might not know which of these is the official version and it introduces confusion as to the provenance of the piece.

Finally, we note that “re-publication” of web materials is not the same as re-publication of print materials. The re-publication of print materials really does make them more accessible and the extra copies helps to ensure preservation for the long term. However, there is no increase in accessibility by putting copies on other servers, since everyone can access our servers, which are available 24/7/365, and we have 3 mirror sites also available 24/7/365. Nor is there a benefit to the long-term preservation of the entries: our servers, and all of our mirror site servers, have backups, and all the libraries that have supported the SEP by joining SEPIA are entitled to download copies of our archives.