Bayesian Epistemology

1.2 Two Core Norms

The two Bayesian norms sketched above can be stated a bit more generally as follows. (A formal statement will be provided after this tutorial, in section 2.) Suppose that there are some possibilities under consideration, which are mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive. A proposition under consideration is one that is true or false in each of those possibilities, so it can be identified with the set of the possibilities in which it is true. When those possibilities are finite in number, and when you have credences in all of them, Probabilism takes a simple form, saying that your credences ought to be probabilistic in this sense:

While this norm is synchronic in that it constrains your credences at each time, the next norm is diachronic. Suppose that you just received a piece of evidence E, which is true in at least some possibilities under consideration. Suppose further that E exhausts all the evidence you just received. Then the Principle of Conditionalization says that your credences ought to change as if you followed the procedure below (although it is possible to design other procedures to the same effect):

The second step, rescaling, deserves attention. It is designed to ensure compliance with Probabilism, but it also has an independent, intuitive appeal. Consider any two possibilities in which new evidence E is true. Thus the new evidence alone cannot distinguish those two possibilities and, hence, it seems to favor the two equally. So it seems that, if a person starts out being twice as confident in one of those two possibilities as in the other, she should remain so after the credence change in light of E, as required by the rescaling step. The essence of conditionalization is preservation of certain ratios of credences, which is a feature inherited by generalizations of conditionalization (see section 5 for details).

So there you have it: Probabilism and the Principle of Conditionalization, which are held by most Bayesians to be the two core norms in Bayesian epistemology.

1.3 Applications

Bayesian epistemology features an ambition: to develop a simple normative framework that consists of little or nothing more than the two core Bayesian norms, with the goal of explaining or justifying a wide range of intuitively good epistemic practices and perhaps also of guiding our inquiries, all done with a focus on credence change. That sounds quite ambitious, given the narrow focus on credence change. But many Bayesians maintain that credence change is a unifying theme that underlies many different aspects of our epistemic endeavors. Let me mention some examples below.

First of all, it seems that a hypothesis H is confirmed by new evidence E exactly when one’s credence in H ought to increase in response to the acquisition of E. Extending that idea, it also seems that how much H is confirmed correlates with how much its credence ought to be raised. With those ideas in mind, Bayesians have developed several accounts of confirmation; see section 3 of the entry on confirmation. Through the concept of confirmation, some Bayesians have also developed accounts of closely related concepts. For example, being supported by evidence seems to be the same as or similar to being confirmed by evidence, which is ultimately explained by Bayesians in terms of credence change. So there are some Bayesian accounts of evidential support; see section 3 of the entry on Bayes’ theorem and sections 2.3–2.5 of the entry on imprecise probabilities. Here is another example: how well a theory explains a body of evidence seems to be closely related to how well the theory is confirmed by the evidence, which is ultimately explained by Bayesians in terms of credence change. So there are some Bayesian accounts of explanatory power; see section 2 of the entry on abduction.

The focus on credence change also sheds light on another aspect of our epistemic practices: inductive inference. An inductive inference is often understood as a process that results in the formation of an all-or-nothing attitude: believing or accepting the truth of a hypothesis H on the basis of one’s evidence E. That does not appear to fit the Bayesian picture well. But to Bayesians, what really matters is how new evidence E ought to change one’s credence in H—whether one’s credence ought to be raised or lowered, and by how much. To be sure, there is the issue of whether the resulting credence would be high enough to warrant the formation of the attitude of believing or accepting. But to many Bayesians, that issue seems only secondary, or better forgone as argued by Jeffrey (1970). If so, the fundamental issue about inductive inference is ultimately how credences ought to change in light of new evidence. So Bayesians have had much to say about various kinds of inductive inferences and related classic problems in philosophy of science. See the following footnote for a long list of relevant survey articles (or research papers, in cases where survey articles are not yet available).^[1]

For monographs on applications in epistemology and philosophy of science, see Earman (1992), Bovens & Hartmann (2004), Howson & Urbach (2006), and Sprenger & Hartmann (2019). In fact, there are also applications to natural language semantics and pragmatics: for indicative conditionals, see the survey by Briggs (2019: sec. 6 and 7) and sections 3 and 4.2 of the entry on indicative conditionals; for epistemic modals, see Yalcin (2012).

The applications mentioned above rely on the assumption of some or other norms for credences. Although the correct norms are held by most Bayesians to include at least Probabilism and the Principle of Conditionalization, it is debated whether there are more and, if so, what they are. It is to this issue that I now turn.

1.4 Bayesians Divided: What Does Coherence Require?

Probabilism is often regarded as a coherence norm, which says how one’s opinions ought to fit together on pain of incoherence. So, if Probabilism matters, the reason seems to be that coherence matters. This raises a question that divides Bayesians: What does the coherence of credences require? A typical Bayesian thinks that coherence requires at least that one’s credences follow Probabilism. But there are actually different versions of Probabilism and Bayesians disagree about which one is correct. Bayesians also disagree about whether the coherence of credences requires more than Probabilism and, if so, to what extent. For example, does coherence require that one’s credence in a contingent proposition lie strictly between 0 and 1? Another issue is what coherence requires of conditional credences, i.e., the credences that one has on the supposition of the truth of one or another proposition. Those and other related questions have far-reaching impacts on applications of Bayesian epistemology. For more on the issue of what coherence requires, see section 3.

1.5 Bayesians Divided: The Problem of the Priors

There is another issue that divides Bayesians. The package of Probabilism and the Principle of Conditionalization seems to explain well why one’s credence in General Relativity ought to rise in Eddington’s Observation Case. But that particular Bayesian explanation relies on a crucial feature of the case: the evidence E is entailed by the hypothesis H in question. But such an entailment is missing in many interesting cases, such as this one:

Now, should the credence in the hypothesis be increased or lowered, according to the two core Bayesian norms? Well, it depends. Note that in the present case H entails neither E nor its negation, so the possibilities in H can be categorized into two groups: those compatible with E, and those incompatible with E. As a result of conditionalization, the possibilities incompatible with E will have their credences be dropped down to zero; those compatible, scaled up. If the scaling up outweighs the dropping down for the possibilities inside H, the credence in H will rise and thus behave inductively; otherwise, it will stay constant or even go down and thus behave counter-inductively. So it all depends on the specific details of the prior, which is shorthand for the assignment of credences that one has before one acquires the new evidence in question. To sum up: Probabilism and the Principle of Conditionalization, alone, are too weak to entitle us to say whether one’s credence ought to change inductively or counter-inductively in the above example.

This point just made generalizes to most applications of Bayesian epistemology. For example, some coherent priors lead to enumerative induction and some don’t (Carnap 1955), and some coherent priors lead to Ockham’s razor and some don’t (Forster 1995: sec. 3). So, besides the coherence norms (such as Probabilism), are there any other norms that govern one’s prior? This is known as the problem of the priors.

This issue divides Bayesians. First of all, there is the party of subjective Bayesians, who hold that every prior is permitted unless it fails to be coherent. So, to those Bayesians, the correct norms for priors are exhausted by Probabilism and the other coherence norms if any. Second, there is the party of objective Bayesians, who propose that the correct norms for priors include not just the coherence norms but also a norm that codifies the epistemic virtue of freedom from bias. Those Bayesians think that freedom from bias requires at least that, roughly speaking, one’s credences be evenly distributed to certain possibilities unless there is a reason not to. This norm, known as the Principle of Indifference, has long been a source of controversy. Last but not the least, some Bayesians even propose to take seriously certain epistemic virtues that have been extensively studied in other epistemological traditions, and argue that those virtues need to be codified into norms for priors. For more on those attempted solutions to the problem of the priors, see section 4 below. Also see section 3.3 of the entry on interpretations of probability.

So far I have been mostly taking for granted the package of Probabilism and the Principle of Conditionalization. But is there any good reason to accept those two norms? This is the next topic.

1.6 An Attempted Foundation: Dutch Book Arguments

There have been a number of arguments advanced in support of the two core Bayesian norms. Perhaps the most influential is of the kind called Dutch Book arguments. Dutch Book arguments are motivated by a simple, intuitive idea: Belief guides action. So, the more strongly you believe that it will rain tomorrow, the more inclined you are, or ought to be, to bet on bad weather. This idea, which connects degrees of belief to betting dispositions, can be captured at least partially by the following:

This bridge principle might be construed as part of a definition or as a necessary truth that captures the nature of credences, or understood as a norm that jointly constrains credences and betting dispositions (Christensen 1996; Pettigrew 2020a: sec. 3.1). The hope is that, through this bridge principle or perhaps a refined one, bad credences generate bad symptoms in betting dispositions. If so, a close look at betting dispositions might help us sort out bad credences from good ones. This is the strategy that underlies Dutch Book arguments.

To illustrate, consider an agent who has a .75 credence in proposition A and a .30 credence in its negation \(\neg A\) (which violates Probabilism). Assuming the bridge principle stated above, the agent is willing to bet as follows:

• Buy “win $100 if A is true” at \(\$75\).
• Buy “win $100 if \(\neg A\) is true” at \(\$30\).

So the agent is willing to accept each of those two offers. But it is actually very bad to accept both at the same time, for that leads to a sure loss (of $5):

So this agent’s betting dispositions make her susceptible to a set of bets that are individually acceptable but jointly inflict a sure loss. Such a set of bets is called a Dutch Book. The above agent is susceptible to a Dutch Book, which sounds bad for the agent. So what has gone wrong? The problem seems to be this: Belief guides action, and in this case, bad beliefs result in bad actions: garbage in, garbage out. Therefore, the agent should not have had the combination of credence .75 in \(A\) and .30 in \(\neg A\) to begin with—or so a Dutch Book argument would conclude.

The above line of thought can be generalized and turned into a template for Dutch Book arguments:

There is a Dutch Book argument for Probabilism (Ramsey 1926, de Finetti 1937). The idea can be extended to develop an argument for the Principle of Conditionalization (Lewis 1999, Teller 1973). Dutch Book arguments have also been developed for other norms for credences, but they require modifying the concept of a Dutch Book in one way or another. See section 3 for references.

An immediate worry about Dutch Book arguments is that a higher credence might not be correlated with a stronger disposition to bet. Consider a person who loathes very much the anxiety caused by placing a bet. So, though she is very confident in a proposition, she might still refuse to buy a bet on its truth even at a low price—and rightly so. This seems to be a counterexample to premise 1 in the above. For more on Dutch Book arguments, including objections to them as well as refinements of them, see the survey by Hájek (2009) and the entry on Dutch Book arguments.

There is a notable worry that applies even if we have a Dutch Book argument that is logically valid and only has true premises. A Dutch Book argument seems to give only a practical reason for accepting an epistemic norm: “Don’t have such and such combinations of credences, for otherwise there would be something bad pragmatically”. Such a reason seems unsatisfactory for those who wish to explain the correctness of the Bayesian norms with a reason that is distinctively epistemic or at least non-pragmatic. Some Bayesians still think that Dutch Book arguments are good, and address the present worry by trying to give a non-pragmatic reformulation of Dutch Book arguments (Christensen 1996; Christensen 2004: sec. 5.3). Some other Bayesians abandon Dutch Book arguments and pursue alternative foundations of Bayesian epistemology, to which I turn now.

1.7 Alternative Foundations

A second proposed type of foundation for Bayesian epistemology is based on the idea of accurate estimation. This idea has two parts: estimation, and its accuracy. On this approach, one’s credence in a proposition A is one’s estimate of the truth value of A, where A’s truth value is identified with 1 if it is true and 0 if it is false (Jeffrey 1986). The closer one’s credence in A is to the truth value of A, the more accurate one’s estimate is. Then a Bayesian may argue that one’s credences ought to be probabilistic, for otherwise the overall accuracy of one’s credence assignment would be dominated—namely, it would, come what may, be lower than the overall accuracy of another credence assignment that one could have adopted. To some Bayesians, this gives a distinctively epistemic reason or explanation why one’s credences ought to be probabilistic. The result is the so-called accuracy-dominance argument for Probabilism (Joyce 1998). This approach has also been extended to argue for the Principle of Conditionalization (Briggs & Pettigrew 2020). For more on this approach, see the entry on epistemic utility arguments for probabilism as well as Pettigrew (2016).

There is a third proposed type of foundation for Bayesian epistemology. It appeals to a kind of doxastic state called comparative probability, which concerns a person’s taking one proposition to be more probable than, or as probable as, or less probable than another proposition. On this approach, we postulate some bridge principles that connect one’s credences to one’s comparative probabilities. Here is an example of such a bridge principle: for any propositions X and Y, if X is equivalent to the disjunction of two incompatible propositions, each of which one takes to be more probable than Y, then one’s credence in X should be more than twice of that in Y. With such bridge principles, a Bayesian may argue from norms for comparative probabilities to norms for credences, such as Probabilism. See Fishburn (1986) for the historical development of this approach. See Stefánsson (2017) for a recent defense and development. For a general survey of this approach, see Konek (2019). This approach has been extended by Joyce (2003: sec. 4) to justify the Principle of Conditionalization.

The above are just some of the attempts to provide foundations for Bayesian epistemology. For more, see the surveys by Weisberg (2011: sec. 4) and Easwaran (2011).

There is a distinctive class of worries for all the three proposed foundations presented above, due to the fact that they rely on one or another account of the nature of credences. This is where Bayesian epistemology meets philosophy of mind. Recall that they try to understand credences in relation to some other mental states: (i) betting dispositions, (ii) estimates of truth values, or (iii) comparative probabilities. But those accounts of credences are apparently vulnerable to counterexamples. (An example was mentioned above: a person who dislikes the anxiety caused by betting seems to be a counterexample to the betting account of credences). For more on such worries, see Eriksson and Hájek (2007). For more on accounts of credences, see section 3.3 of the entry on interpretations of probability and section 3.4 of the entry on imprecise probabilities.

There is a fourth, application-driven style of argument for norms for credences that seems to be explicit or implicit in the minds of many Bayesians. The idea is that a good argument for the two core Bayesian norms can be obtained by appealing to applications. The goal is to account for a comprehensive range of intuitively good epistemic practices, all done with a simple set of general norms consisting of little or nothing more than the two core Bayesian norms. If this Bayesian normative system is so good that, of the known competitors, it strikes the best balance of those two virtues just mentioned—comprehensiveness and simplicity—then that is a good reason for accepting the two core Bayesian norms. In fact, the method just described is applicable to any norm, for credences or for actions, in epistemology or in ethics. Some philosophers argue that this method in its full generality, called Reflective Equilibrium, is the ultimate method for finding a good reason for or against norms (Goodman 1955; Rawls 1971). For more on this method and its controversies, see the entry on reflective equilibrium.

The above are some ways to argue for Bayesian norms. The rest of this introductory tutorial is meant to sketch some general objections, leaving detailed discussions to subsequent sections.

1.8 Objections to Conditionalization

The Principle of Conditionalization requires one to react to new evidence by conditionalizing on it. So this principle, when construed literally, appears to be silent on the case in which one receives no new evidence. That is, it seems to be too weak to require that one shouldn’t arbitrarily change credences when there is no new evidence. To remedy this, the Principle of Conditionalization is usually understood such that the case of no new evidence is identified with the limiting case in which one acquires a logical truth as trivial new evidence, which rules out no possibilities. In that case, conditionalization on the trivial new evidence lowers no credences, and thus rescales credences only by a factor of 1—no credence change at all—as desired. Once the Principle of Conditionalization is construed that way, it is no longer too weak, but then the worry is that it becomes too strong. Consider the following case, which Earman (1992) adapts from Glymour (1980):

Note that, during his derivation and calculation, Einstein does not perform any experiment or collect any new astronomical data, so the body of his evidence seems to remain unchanged, only consisting of the old data. Despite gaining no new evidence, Einstein changes (in fact, raises) his credence in the new theory, and rightly so—against the usual construal of the Principle of Conditionalization. Therefore, there is a dilemma for that principle: when construed literally, it is too weak to prohibit arbitrary credence change; when construed in the usual way, it is too strong to accommodate Einstein’s credence change in the Mercury Case. This problem is Earman’s problem of old evidence.

The problem of old evidence is sometimes presented in a different way—in Glymour’s (1980) way—whose target of attack is not the Principle of Conditionalization but this:

If E is an old piece of evidence that a person had received before, this person’s credence in E is currently 1. So, conditionalization on E at the present time would involve dropping no credence, followed by rescaling credences with a factor of 1—so there is no credence change at all. Then, by the Bayesian account of confirmation stated above, old evidence E must fail to confirm new theory H. But that result seems to be wrong because the old data about the advance of Mercury’s perihelion confirmed Einstein’s new theory; this is Glymour’s problem of old evidence, construed as a challenge to a Bayesian account of confirmation. But, if Earman (1992) is right, the Mercury Case challenges not just Bayesian confirmation theory, but actually cuts deeper, all the way to one of the two core Bayesian norms—namely, the Principle of Conditionalization—as suggested by Earman’s problem of old evidence. For attempted solutions to Earman’s old evidence problem (about conditionalization), see section 5.1 below. For more on Glymour’s old evidence problem (about confirmation), see section 3.5 of the entry on confirmation.

The above is just the beginning of a series of problems for the Principle of Conditionalization, which will be discussed after this tutorial, in section 5. But here is a rough sketch: The problem of old evidence arises when a new theory is developed to accommodate some old evidence. When the focus is shifted from old evidence to new theory, we shall discover another problem, no less thorny. Also note that the problem of old evidence results from a kind of inflexibility in conditionalization: no credence change is permitted without new evidence. Additional problems have been directed at other kinds of inflexibility in conditionalization, such as the preservation of fully certain credences. In response, some Bayesians defend the Principle of Conditionalization by trying to develop it into better versions, as you will see in section 5.

1.9 Objections about Idealization

Another worry is that the two core Bayesian norms are not the kind of norms that we ought to follow, in that they are too demanding to be actually followed by ordinary human beings—after all, ought implies can. More specifically, those Bayesian norms are often thought to be too demanding for at least three reasons:

1. (Sharpness) Probabilism demands that one’s credence in a proposition be extremely sharp, as sharp as an individual real number, precise to potentially infinitely many digits.
2. (Perfect Fit) Probabilism demands that one’s credences fit together nicely; for example, some credences are required to sum to exactly 1, no more and no less—a perfect fit. The Principle of Conditionalization also demands a perfect fit among three things: prior credences, posterior credences, and new evidence.
3. (Logical Omniscience) Probabilism is often thought to demand that one be logically omniscient, having credence 1 in every logical truth and credence 0 in every logical falsehood.

The last point, logical omniscience, might not be immediately clear from the preceding presentation, but it can be seen from this observation: A logical truth is true in all possibilities, so it has to be assigned credence 1 by Sum-to-One and Additivity in Probabilism.

So the worry is that, although Bayesians have a simple normative framework, they seem to enjoy the simplicity because they idealize away from the complications in humans’ epistemic endeavors and turn instead to normative standards that can be met only by highly idealized agents. If so, there are pervasive counterexamples to the two core Bayesian norms: all human beings. Call this the problem of idealization. For different ways of presenting this problem, see Harman (1986: ch. 3), Foley (1992: sec. 4.4), Pollock (2006: ch. 6), and Horgan (2017).

In reply, Bayesians have developed at least three strategies, which might complement each other. The first strategy is to remove idealization gradually, one step at a time, and explain why this is a good way of doing epistemology—just like this has long been taken as a good way of doing science. The second strategy is to explain why it makes sense for we human beings to strive for some ideals, including the ideals that the two core Bayesian norms point to, even though human beings cannot attain those ideals. The third strategy is to explain how the kind of idealization in question actually empowers and facilitates the applications of Bayesian epistemology in science (including especially scientists’ use of Bayesian statistics). For more on those replies to the problem of idealization, see section 6.

2. A Bit of Mathematical Formalism

To facilitate subsequent discussions, a bit of mathematical formalism is needed. Indeed, the two core Bayesian norms were only stated above in a simple, finite setting (section 1.2), but there can be an infinity of possibilities under consideration. For example, think about this question: What’s the objective, physical chance for a carbon-14 atom to decay in 20 years? Every possible chance in the unit interval \([0, 1]\) is a possibility to which a credence can be assigned. So the two core Bayesian norms need to be stated in a more general way than above.

Let \(\Omega\) be a set of possibilities that are mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive. There is no restriction on the size of \(\Omega\); it can be finite or infinite. Let \(\cal A\) be a set of propositions identified with some subsets of \(\Omega\). Assume that \(\cal A\) contains \(\Omega\) and the empty set \(\varnothing\), and is closed under the standard Boolean operations: conjunction (intersection), disjunction (union), and negation (complement). This closure assumption means that, whenever \(A\) and \(B\) are in \(\cal A\), so are their intersection \(A \cap B\), union \(A \cup B\), and complement \(\Omega \mcomplement A\), which are often written in logical notation as conjunction \(A \wedge B\), disjunction \(A \vee B\), and negation \(\neg A\). When \(\cal A\) satisfies the assumption just stated, it is called an algebra of sets/propositions.^[2]

Let \(\Cr\) be an assignment of credences to some propositions. We will often think of \(\Cr(A)\) as denoting one’s credence in proposition \(A\) and refer to \(\Cr\) as one’s credence function or credence assignment. Next, we need a definition from probability theory:

Now Probabilism can be stated as follows:

When it is clear from the context that the credence assignment \(\Cr\) is assumed to be probabilistic, it is often written \(\Pr\) or \(P\). The process of conditionalization can be defined as follows:

Conditionalization changes the credence in \(X\) from \(\Cr(X)\) to \(\Cr'(X)\), which can be understood as involving two steps:

Transition (i) corresponds to the zeroing step in the informal presentation in section 1.2 of conditionalization; transition (ii), the rescaling step. Now the second norm can be stated as follows:

The two norms just stated reduce to the informal versions presented in the tutorial section 1.2 when \(\Omega\) contains only finitely many possibilities and \(\cal A\) is the set of all subsets of \(\Omega\).

Let \(\Cr(X \mid E)\) denote one’s credence in \(X\) on the supposition of the truth of \(E\) (whether or not one will actually receive \(E\) as new evidence); it is also called credence in \(X\) given \(E\), or credence in \(X\) conditional on \(E\). So \(\Cr(X \mid E)\) denotes a conditional credence, while \(\Cr(X)\) denotes an unconditional one. The connection between those two kinds of credences is often expressed by

It is debatable whether this formula should be construed as a definition or as a normative constraint. See Hájek (2003) for some objections to the definitional construal and for further discussion. \(\Cr(X \mid E)\) is often taken as shorthand for the credence in \(X\) that results from conditionalization on \(E\), assuming that the Ratio Formula holds.

Many applications of Bayesian epistemology make use Bayes’ theorem. It has different versions, of which two are particularly simple:

This theorem is often useful for calculating credences that result from conditionalization on evidence \(E\), which are represented on the left side of the formula. Indeed, this theorem is very useful and important in statistical applications of Bayesian epistemology (see section 3.5 below). For more on the significance of this theorem, see the entry on Bayes’ theorem. But this theorem is not essential to some other applications of Bayesian epistemology. Indeed, the case studies in the tutorial section make no reference to Bayes’ theorem. As Earman (1992: ch. 1) points out in his presentation of Bayes’ (1763) seminal essay, Bayesian epistemology is Bayesian not really because Bayes’ theorem is used in a certain way, but because Bayes’ essay already contains the core ideas of Bayesian epistemology: Probabilism and the Principle of Conditionalization.

Here are some introductory textbooks on Bayesian epistemology (and related topics) that include presentations of elementary probability theory: Skyrms (1966 [2000]), Hacking (2001), Howson & Urbach (2006), Huber (2018), Weisberg (2019 [Other Internet Resources]), and Titelbaum (forthcoming).

3. Synchronic Norms (I): Requirements of Coherence

A coherence norm states how one’s opinions ought to fit together on pain of incoherence. Most Bayesians agree that the correct coherence norms include at least Probabilism, but they disagree over which version of Probabilism is right. There is also the question of whether there are correct coherence norms that go beyond Probabilism and, if so, what they are. Those issues were only sketched in the tutorial section 1.4. They will be detailed in this section.

To argue that a certain norm is not just correct but ought to be followed on pain of incoherence, Bayesians traditionally proceed by way of a Dutch Book argument (as presented in the tutorial section 1.6). For the susceptibility to a Dutch Book is traditionally taken by Bayesians to imply one’s personal incoherence. So, as you will see below, the norms discussed in this section have all been defended with one or another type of Dutch Book argument, although it is debatable whether some types are more plausible than others.

3.6 Reflection and Other Deference Principles

We have just discussed the Principal Principle, which in a sense asks one to defer to a kind of expert (Gaifman 1986): the chance of an event \(E\) can be understood as an expert at predicting whether \(E\) will come out true. So, conditional on that expert’s saying so and so about \(E\), one’s opinion ought to defer to that expert. Construed that way, the Principal Principle is a kind of deference principle. There can be different deference principles, referring to different kinds of experts.

Here is another example of a deference principle, proposed by van Fraassen (1984):

Here, one’s future self is taken as an expert to which one ought to defer. The Reflection Principle admits of a Dutch Book argument (van Fraassen 1984). There is another way to defend the Reflection Principle: this synchronic norm is argued to follow from the synchronic norm that one ought, at any time, to be fully certain that one will follow the diachronic Principle of Conditionalization (as suggested by Weisberg’s 2007 modification of van Fraassen’s 1995 argument).

The Reflection Principle has invited some putative counterexamples. Here is one, adapted from Talbott (1991):

So, this person’s current assignment of credences \(\Cr_\textrm{1989}\) has the following properties, where \(A\) is the proposition that she has spaghetti for dinner on March 15, 1989:

But conditionalization on a proposition with a high credence can only slightly change the credence assignment. For such a conditionalization involves lowering just a small bit of credence down to zero and hence it only requires a slight rescaling, by a factor close to 1. So, assuming that \(\Cr\) is a probability measure, we have:

which violates the Reflection Principle.

The Dinner Case serves as a putative counterexample to the Reflection Principle by allowing one to suspect that one will lose some memories. So it allows one to have a specific kind of epistemic self-doubt—to doubt one’s own ability to achieve or retain an epistemically favorable state. In fact, some are worried that the Reflection Principle is generally incompatible with epistemic self-doubt, which seems rational and permissible. For more on this worry, see the entry on epistemic self-doubt.

4. Synchronic Norms (II): The Problem of the Priors

Much of what Bayesians have to say about confirmation and inductive inference depends crucially on the norms that govern one’s prior credences (the credences that one has at the beginning of an inquiry). But what are those norms? This is known as the problem of the priors. Some potential solutions were only sketched in the tutorial section 1.5. They will be detailed in this section.

4.2 Objective Bayesianism

Objective Bayesians contend that, in addition to coherence, there is another epistemic virtue or ideal that needs to be codified into a norm for prior credences: freedom from bias and avoidance of overly strong opinions (Jeffreys 1939; Carnap 1945; Jaynes 1957, 1968; Rosenkrantz 1981; J. Williamson 2010). This view is often motivated by a case like this:

An intuitive answer is \(1/6\), for it seems that we ought to distribute our credences evenly, with an equal credence, \(1/6\), in each of the six possible outcomes. While subjective Bayesians would only say that we may do so, objective Bayesians would make the stronger claim that we ought to do so. More generally, objective Bayesians are sympathetic to this norm:

A standard worry about the Indifference Principle comes from Bertrand’s paradox. Here is a simplified version (adapted from van Fraassen 1989):

Now, have a look at the two groups of propositions listed in the table below. The left group (1)–(3) focuses on possible side lengths and divides up possibilities by 1-cm-long intervals; the right group \((1')\)–\((15')\) focuses on possible areas instead:

The Indifference Principle seems ask us to assign a \(1/3\) credence to each proposition in the left group \((1)\)–\((3)\) and, simultaneously, assign \(1/15\) to each one in the right group \((1')\)–\((15')\). If so, it asks us to assign unequal credences to equivalent propositions: \(1/3\) to \((1)\), and \(3/15\) to the disjunction \((1') \!\vee (2') \!\vee (3')\). That violates Probabilism.

In reply, objective Bayesians may reply that Bertrand’s paradox provides no conclusive reason against the Indifference Principle and perhaps the fault lies elsewhere. Following White (2010), let’s think about how the Indifference Principle works: it outputs a normative recommendation for credence assignment only when it receives one or another input, which is a judgement about insufficient reason or evidential symmetry. Indeed, Bertrand’s paradox has to be generated by at least two inputs, such as, first, the lack-of-evidence judgement about the left group in the above table and, second, that about the right group. So perhaps the fault lies not with the Indifference Principle but with one of the two inputs—after all, garbage in, garbage out. White (2010) substantiates the above idea with an argument to this effect: at least one of the two inputs in Bertrand’s paradox must be mistaken, because they already contradict each other even when we only assume certain weak, plausible principles that have nothing to do with credences and concern just the evidential support relation.

There still remains the task of developing a systematic account to guide one’s judgments of evidential symmetry (or insufficient reason) before those judgments are passed as inputs to the Indifference Principle. An important source of inspiration has been the symmetry in the Six-Faced Die Case: it is a kind of physical symmetry due to the cubic shape of the die; it is also a kind of permutation symmetry because nothing essential changes when the six faces of the die are relabeled. Those two aspects of the symmetry—physical and permutational—are extended by two influential approaches to the Indifference Principle, respectively, which are presented in turn below.

The first approach to the Indifference Principle looks for a wider range of physical symmetries, including especially the symmetries associated with a change of coordinate or unit. This approach, developed by Jeffreys (1946) and Jaynes (1968, 1973), yields a consistent, somewhat surprising answer 1/2 (rather than 1/3 or 1/15) to the question in the Square Case. See supplement C for some non-technical details.

The second approach to the Indifference Principle focuses on permutation symmetries and proposes to look for those not in a physical system but in the language in use. This approach is due to Carnap (1945, 1955). He maintains, for example, that two sentences ought to be assigned equal prior credences if one differs from the other only by a permutation of the names in use. Although Carnap says little about the Square Case, he has much to say about how his approach to the Indifference Principle helps to justify enumerative induction; see the survey by Fitelson (2006). So objective Bayesianism is often regarded as a substantive account of inductive inference, while many subjective Bayesians often take their view as a quantitative analogue of deductive logic (as presented in section 4.1). For refinement of Carnap’s approach, see Maher (2004). The most common worry for Carnap’s approach is that it renders the normative import of the Indifference Principle too sensitive to the choice of a language; for a reply, see J. Williamson (2010: chap. 9). For more criticisms, see Kelly & Glymour (2004).

The Indifference Principle has been challenged for another reason. This principle is often understood to dictate equal real-valued credences in cases of ignorance, but there is the worry that sometimes we are too ignorant to be justified in having sharp, real-valued credences, as suggested by this case (Keynes 1921: ch. 4):

By the Principle of Indifference, the answers seems to be 0.5 and 0.5, respectively. If so, there should be equal credences (namely 0.5) in A and in B. But this result sounds wrong to Keynes. He thinks that, compared with urn a, we have much less background information about urn b, and that this severe lack of background information should be reflected in the difference between the doxastic attitudes toward propositions A and B—a difference that the Principle of Indifference fails to make. If so, what is the difference? It is relatively uncontroversial that the credence in A should be 0.5, being the ratio of the white balls in urn a (perhaps thanks to the Principal Principle). On the other hand, some Bayesians (Keynes 1921; Joyce 2005) argue that the credence in B does not have to be an individual real number but, instead, is at least permitted to be unsharp, being the interval \([0, 1]\), which covers all the possible white-to-black ratios under consideration. This is only one motivation for an interval account of unsharp credences; for another motivation, see supplement A.

In reply to the Two Urns Case, objective Bayesians have defended one or another version of the Indifference Principle. White (2010) does it while maintaining that credences ought to be sharp. Weatherson (2007: sec. 4) defends a version that allows credences to be unsharp. Eva (2019) defends a version that governs comparative probabilities rather than numerical credences. For more on this debate, see the survey by Mahtani (2019) and the entry on imprecise probabilities.

The Principle of Indifference appears unhelpful when one has had substantive reason or evidence against some assignments of credences (making the principle inapplicable with a false if-clause). The standard remedy appeals to a generalization of the Indifference Principle, called the Principle of Maximum Entropy (Jaynes 1968); for more on this, see supplement D.

The above has only mentioned the versions of objective Bayesianism that are more well-known in philosophy. There are other versions, developed and discussed mostly by statisticians. For a survey, see Kass & Wasserman (1996) and Berger (2006).

4.3 Forward-Looking Bayesianism

Some Bayesians propose that some norms for priors can be obtained by looking into possible futures, with two steps (Good 1976):

For lack of a standard name, this approach may be called forward-looking Bayesianism. This name is used here as an umbrella term to cover different possible implementations, of which two are presented below.

Here is one implementation. It might be held that one ought to favor a hypothesis if it explains the available evidence better than any other competing hypotheses do. This view is called inference to the best explanation (IBE) if construed as a method for theory choice, as originally developed in the epistemology of all-or-nothing beliefs (Harman 1986). It can be carried over to Bayesian epistemology as follows:

What’s stated here is only a preliminary version. More sophisticated versions are developed by Lipton (2004: ch. 7) and Weisberg (2009a). This view is resisted by some Bayesians to varying degrees. van Fraassen (1989: ch. 7) argues that IBE should be rejected because it is in tension with the two core Bayesian norms. Okasha (2000) argues that IBE only serves as a good heuristic for guiding one’s credence change. Henderson (2014) argues that IBE need not be assumed to guide one’s credence change because it can be justified by little more than the two core Bayesian norms. For more on IBE, see the entry on abduction, in which sections 3.1 and 4 discuss explanationist Bayesianism.

Here is another implementation of forward-looking Bayesianism. It might be thought that, although a scientific method for theory choice is subject to error due to its inductive nature, it is supposed to be able, in a sense, to correct itself. This view is called the self-corrective thesis, originally developed in the epistemology of all-or-nothing beliefs by Peirce (1903) and Reichenbach (1938: sec. 38–40). But it can be carried over to Bayesian epistemology as follows:

An early version of this view is developed by Freedman (1963) in statistics; see Wasserman (1998: sec. 1–3) for a minimally technical overview. The self-corrective property concerns the long run, so it invites the standard, Keynesian worry that the long run might be too long. For replies, see Diaconis & Freedman (1986b: pp. 63–64) and Kelly (2000: sec. 7). A related worry is that a long-run norm puts no constraint on what matters, namely, our doxastic states in the short run (Carnap 1945). A possible reply is that the self-corrective property is only a minimum qualification of permissible priors and can be conjoined with other norms for credences to generate a significant constraint on priors. To substantiate that reply, it has been argued that such a constraint on priors is actually stronger than what the rival Bayesians have to offer in some important cases of statistical inference (Diaconis & Freedman 1986a) and enumerative induction (Lin forthcoming).

The above two versions of forward-looking Bayesianism both encourage Bayesians to do this: assimilate some ideas (such as IBE or self-correction) that have long been taken seriously in some non-Bayesian traditions of epistemology. Forward-looking Bayesianism seems to be a convenient template for doing that.

4.4 Connection to the Uniqueness Debate

The above approaches to the problem of the priors are mostly developed with this question in mind:

The interest in this question leads naturally to a different but closely related question. Imagine that you are unsympathetic to subjective Bayesianism. Then you might try to add one norm after another to narrow down the candidate pool for the permissible priors, and you might be wondering what this process might end up with. This raises a more abstract question:

Impermissive Bayesianism is the view that says “yes”; permissive Bayesianism says “no”. The question of uniqueness is often addressed in a way that is somewhat orthogonal to the question of norms, as is suggested by the ‘whether-or-not’ clause in the parentheses. Moreover, the uniqueness question is often debated in a broader context that considers not just credences but all possible doxastic states, thus going beyond Bayesian epistemology. Readers interested in the uniqueness question are referred to the survey by Kopec and Titelbaum (2016).

Let me close this section with some clarifications. The two terms ‘objective Bayesianism’ and ‘impermissive Bayesianism’ are sometimes used interchangeably. But those two terms are used in the present entry to distinguish two different views, and neither implies the other. For example, many prominent objective Bayesians such as Carnap (1955), Jaynes (1968), and J. Williamson (2010) are not committed to impermissivism, even though some objective Bayesians tend to be sympathetic to impermissivism. For elaboration on the point just made, see supplement E.

5. Issues about Diachronic Norms

The Principle of Conditionalization has been challenged with several putative counterexamples. This section will examine some of the most influential ones. We will see that, to save that principle, some Bayesians have tried to refine it into one or another version. A number of versions have been systematically compared in papers such as those of Meacham (2015, 2016), Pettigrew (2020b), and Rescorla (2021), while the emphasis below will be centered on the proposed counterexamples.

5.2 New Theory

The logical learning approach to the problem of old evidence invites another worry. It seems to fail to address a variant of the Mercury Case, due to Earman (1992: sec. 5.5):

The student’s formation of a new, initial credence in the new theory seems to pose a relatively little threat to the Principle of Conditionalization, which is most naturally construed as a norm that governs, not credence formation, but credence change. So the more serious problem lies in the student’s change of her credence in the old theory. If this credence drop really results from conditionalization on what was just learned, \(E_\textrm{logical}\), then the credence in \(E_\textrm{logical}\) must be boosted to 1 from somewhere below 1, which unfortunately never happens. So it seems that the student’s credence drop violates the Principle of Conditionalization and rightly so, which is known as the problem of new theory. The following presents two reply strategies for Bayesians.

One reply strategy is to qualify the Conditionalization Principle and make it weaker in order to avoid counterexamples. The following is one way to implement this strategy (see supplement F for another one):

Note how this version is immune from the Physics Student Case: what is learned, \(E_\textrm{logical}\), is something entirely new to the student, so the student simply did not have in mind a plan for responding to \(E_\textrm{logical}\)—so the if-clause is not satisfied. The Bayesians who adopt this version, such as van Fraassen (1989: ch. 7), often add that one is not required to have a plan for responding to any particular piece of new evidence.

The plan version is independently motivated. Note that this version puts a normative constraint on the plan that one has at each time when one has a plan, whereas the standard version constrains the act of credence change across different times. So the plan version is different from the standard, act version. But it turns out to be the former, rather then the latter, that is supported by the major existing arguments for the Principle of Conditionalization. See, for example, the Dutch Book argument by Lewis (1999), the expected accuracy argument by Greaves & Wallace (2006), and the accuracy dominance argument by Briggs & Pettigrew (2020).

While the plan version of the Conditionalization Principle is weak enough to avoid the Physics Student counterexample, it might be worried that it is too weak. There are actually two worries here. The first worry is that the plan version is too weak because it leaves open an important question: Even if one’s plan for credence change is always a plan to conditionalize on new evidence, should one actually follow such a plan whenever new evidence is acquired? For discussions of this issue, see Levi (1980: ch. 4), van Fraassen (1989: ch. 7), and Titelbaum (2013a: parts III and IV). (Terminological note: instead of ‘plan’, Levi uses ‘confirmational commitment’ and van Fraassen uses ‘rule’.) The second worry is that the plan version is too weak because it only avoids the problem of new theory, without giving a positive account as to why the student’s credence in the old theory ought to drop.

A positive account is promised by the next strategy for solving the problem of new theory. It operates with a series of ideas. The first idea is that, typically, a person only considers possibilities that are not jointly exhaustive, and she only has credences conditional on the set C of the considered possibilities—lacking an unconditional credence in C (Shimony 1970; Salmon 1990). This deviates from the standard Bayesian view in allowing two things: credence gaps (section 3.1), and primitive conditional credences (section 3.4). The second idea is that the set C of the considered possibilities might shrink or expand in time. It might shrink because some of those possibilities are ruled out by new evidence, or it might expand because a new possibility—a new theory—is taken into consideration. The third and last idea is a diachronic norm (sketched by Shimony 1970 and Salmon 1990, developed in detail by Wenmackers & Romeijn 2016):

Here, a credence ratio has to be understood in such a way that it can exist without any unconditional credence. To see how this is possible, suppose for simplicity that an agent starts with two old theories as the only possibilities under consideration, \(\mathsf{old}_1\) and \(\mathsf{old}_2\), with a credence ratio \(1:2\) but without any unconditional credence. This can be understood to mean that, while the agent lacks an unconditional credence in the set \(\{\mathsf{old}_1 , \mathsf{old}_2\}\), she still has a conditional credence \(\frac{1}{1+2}\) in \(\mathsf{old}_1\) given that set. Now, suppose that this agent then thinks of a new theory: \(\mathsf{new}\). Then, by the diachronic norm stated above, the credence ratio among \(\mathsf{old}_1\), \(\mathsf{old}_2\), \(\mathsf{new}\) should now be \(1:2:x\). Notice the change of this agent’s conditional credence in \(\mathsf{old}_1\) given the varying set of the considered possibilities: it drops from \(\frac{1}{1+2}\) down to \(\frac{1}{1+2+x}\), provided that \(x>0\). Wenmackers & Romeijn (2016) argues that this is why there appears to be a drop in the student’s credence in the old theory—it is actually a drop in a conditional credence given the varying set of the considered possibilities.

The above account invites a worry from the perspective of rational choice theory. According to the standard construal of Bayesian decision theory, the kind of doxastic state that ought to enter decision-making is unconditional credence rather than conditional credence. So Earman (1992: sec. 7.3) is led to think that what we really need is an epistemology for unconditional credence, which the above account fails to provide. A possible reply is anticipated by some Bayesian decision theorists, such as Savage (1972: sec. 5.5) and Harsanyi (1985). They argue that, when making a decision, we often only have conditional credences—conditional on a simplifying assumption that makes the decision problem in question manageable. For other Bayesian decision theorists who follow Savage and Harsanyi, see the references in Joyce (1999: sec. 2.6, 4.2, 5.5 and 7.1). For more on rational choice theory, see the entry on decision theory and the entry on normative theories of rational choice: expected utility.

5.4 Memory Loss

Conditionalization in the standard version preserves certainties, which fails to accommodate cases of memory loss (Talbott 1991):

There are even putative counterexamples that appear to be worse—with an agent who faces only the danger of memory loss rather than actual memory loss. Here is one such example (Arntzenius 2003):

That credence drop violates the Principle of Conditionalization, and all that happens without any actual loss of memory.

It may be replied that conditionalization can be plausibly generalized to accommodate the above case. Here is an attempt made by Titelbaum (2013a: ch. 6), who develops an idea that can be traced back to Levi (1980: sec. 4.3):

This norm allows the set of one’s certainties to expand or shrink, while incorporating the core idea of conditionalization: preservation of credence ratios. To see how this norm accommodates the Shangri-La Case, assume for simplicity that the traveler starts at the initial time with a set of certainties, which expands upon seeing the coin toss result at a later time, but shrinks back to the original set of certainties upon reaching Shangri-La at the final time. Note that there is no change in one’s certainties across the initial time and the final time. So, by the above norm, one’s credences at the final time (upon reaching Shangri-La) should be identical to those at the initial time (the start of the trip). In particular, one’s final credence in traveling the path by the Mountains should be the same as the initial credence, which is 0.5. For more on the attempts to save conditionalization from cases of actual or potential memory loss, see Meacham (2010), Moss (2012), and Titelbaum (2013a: ch. 6 and 7).

The Principle of Generalized Conditionalization, as stated above, might be thought to be an incomplete diachronic norm because it leaves open the question of how one’s certainties ought to change. Early attempts at a positive answer are due to Harper (1976, 1978) and Levi (1980: ch. 1–4). Their ideas are developed independently of the issue of memory loss, but are motivated by the scenarios in which an agent finds a need to revise or even retract what she used to take to be her evidence. Although Harper’s and Levi’s approaches are not identical, they share the common idea that one’s certainties ought to change under the constraint of certain diachronic axioms, now known as the AGM axioms in the belief revision literature.^[9] For some reasons against the Harper-Levi approach to norms of certainty change, see Titelbaum (2013a: sec. 7.4.1).

5.5 Self-Locating Credences

One’s self-locating credences are, for example, credences about who one is, where one is, and what time it is. Such credences pose some challenges to conditionalization. Let me mention two below.

To begin with, consider the following case, adapted from Titelbaum (2013a: ch. 12):

The problem is that it is not immediately clear what exactly is the proposition E that the writer should conditionalize on. The right E appears to be the proposition expressed by the writer’s utterance: “Now, I still have two more sections to go”. And the expressed proposition must be one of the following two candidates, depending on when the utterance is actually made (assuming the standard account of indexicals, due to Kaplan 1989):

\((A)\)

The writer still has two more sections to go on Wednesday evening.

\((B)\)

The writer still has two more sections to go on early Thursday Morning.

But, with the lost sense of time, it also seems that the writer should conditionalize on a less informative body of evidence: the disjunction \(A \vee B\). So exactly what should she conditionalize on? \(A\), \(B\), or \(A \vee B\)? See Titelbaum (2016) for a survey of some proposed solutions to this problem.

While the previous problem concerns only the inputs that should be passed to the conditionalization process, conditionalization itself is challenged when self-locating credences meet the danger of memory loss. Consider the following case, made popular in epistemology by Elga (2000):

What should her answer be when she is awakened on Monday and asked how confident she is in the coin’s landing heads? Lewis (2001) employs the Principle of Conditionalization to argue that the answer is \(1/2\). His reasoning proceeds as follows: Sleeping Beauty, upon her awakening, acquires no new evidence or acquires only a piece of new evidence that she is already certain of, so by conditionalization her credence in the coin’s landing heads ought to remain the same as it was before the sleep: \(1/2\).

But Elga (2000) argues that the answer is \(1/3\) rather than \(1/2\). If so, that will seem to be a counterexample to the Principle of Conditionalization. Here is a sketch of his argument. Imagine that we are Sleeping Beauty and reason as follows. We just woke up, and there are only three possibilities on the table, regarding how the coin landed and what day it is today:

\((A)\)

Heads and it’s Monday.

\((B)\)

Tails and it’s Monday.

\((C)\)

Tails and it’s Tuesday.

If we are told that it’s Monday (\(A \vee B\)), we will judge that the coin’s landing heads (\(A\)) is as probable as its landing tails (\(B\)). So

If we are told that it lands tails (\(B \vee C\)), we will judge that today being Monday (\(B\)) and today being Tuesday (\(C\)) are equally probable. So

The only way to meet the above conditions is to distribute the unconditional credences evenly:

Hence the credence in landing heads, \(A\), is equal to \(1/3\), or so Elga concludes. This result seems to challenge the Principle of Conditionalization, which recommends the answer \(1/2\) as explained above. For more on the Sleeping Beauty problem, see the survey by Titelbaum (2013b).

5.6 Bayesianism without Kinematics

Confronted with the existing problems for the Principle of Conditionalization, some Bayesians turn away from any diachronic norm and develop another variety of Bayesianism: time-slice Bayesianism. On this view, what credences you should (or may) have at any particular time depend solely on the total evidence you have at that same time—independently of your earlier credences. To specify this dependency relation is to specify exclusively synchronic norms—and to forget about diachronic norms. Strictly speaking, there is still a diachronic norm, but it is derived rather than fundamental: when the time flows from \(t\) to \(t'\), your credences ought to change in a certain way—they ought to change to the credences that you ought to have with respect to your total evidence at the latter time \(t'\)—and the earlier time \(t\) is to be ignored. Any diachronic norm, if correct, is at most an epiphenomenon that arises when correct synchronic norms are applied repeatedly across different times, according to time-slice Bayesianism. (This view is stated above in terms of one’s total evidence, but that can be replaced by one’s total reasons or information.)

A particular version of this view is held by J. Williamson (2010: ch. 4), who is so firmly an objective Bayesian that he argues that the Principle of Conditionalization should be rejected if it is in conflict with repeated applications of certain synchronic norms, such as Probabilism and the Principle of Maximum Entropy (which generalizes the Principle of Indifference; see supplement D). Time-slice Bayesianism as a general position is developed and defended by Hedden (2015a, 2015b).

6. The Problem of Idealization

A worry about Bayesian epistemology is that the two core Bayesian norms are so demanding that they can be followed only by highly idealized agents—being logically omniscient, with precise credences that always fit together perfectly. This is the problem of idealization, which was presented in the tutorial section 1.9. This section surveys three reply strategies for Bayesians, which might complement each other. As will become clear below, the work on this problem is quite interdisciplinary, with contributions from epistemologists as well as scientists and other philosophers.

6.1 De-idealization and Understanding

One reply to the problem of idealization is to look at how idealized models are used and valued in science, and to argue that certain values of idealization can be carried over to epistemology. When a scientist studies a complex system, she might not really need an accurate description of it but might rather want to pursue the following:

1. some simplified, idealized models of the whole (such as a block sliding on a frictionless, perfectly flat plane in vacuum);
2. gradual de-idealizations of the above (such as adding more and more realistic considerations about friction);
3. an articulated reason why de-idealizations should be done this way rather than another to improve upon the simpler models.

Parts 1 and 2 do not have to be ladders that will be kicked away once we reach a more realistic model. Instead, the three parts, 1–3, might work together to help the scientist achieve a deeper understanding of the complex system under study—a kind of understanding that an accurate description (alone) does not provide. The above is one of the alleged values of idealized models in scientific modeling; for more, see section 4.2 of the entry on understanding and the survey by Elliott-Graves and Weisberg (2014: sec. 3). Some Bayesians have argued that certain values of idealization are applicable not just in science but also in epistemology (Howson 2000: 173–177; Titelbaum 2013a: ch. 2–5; Schupbach 2018). For more on the values of building more or less idealized models not just in epistemology but generally in philosophy, see T. Williamson (2017).

The above reply to the problem of idealization has been reinforced by a sustained project of de-idealization in Bayesian epistemology. The following gives you the flavor of how this project may be pursued. Let’s start with the usual complaint that Probabilism implies:

The worry is that a person can meet this demand only by luck or with an unrealistic ability—the ability to demarcate all logical truths from the other propositions. But some Bayesians argue that the standard version of Probabilism can be suitably de-idealized to obtain a weak version that does not imply Strong Normalization. For example, the extensibility version of Probabilism (discussed in section 3.1) permits one to have credence gaps and, thus, have no credence in any logical truth (de Finetti 1970 [1974]; Jeffrey 1983; Zynda 1996). Indeed, the extensibility version of Probabilism only implies:

Some Bayesians have tried to de-idealize Probabilism further, to set it free from the commitment that any credence ought to be as sharp as an individual real number, precise to every digit. For example, Walley (1991: ch. 2 and 3) develops a version of Probabilism according to which a credence is permitted to be unsharp in this way. A credence can be bounded by one or another interval of real numbers without being equal to any particular real number or any particular interval—even the tightest bound on a credence can be an incomplete description of that credence. This interval-bound approach gives rise to a Dutch Book argument for an even weaker version of Probabilism, which only implies:

See supplement A for some non-technical details. For more details and related controversies, see the survey by Mahtani (2019) and the entry on imprecise probabilities.

The above are just some of the possible steps that might be taken in the Bayesian project of de-idealization. There are more: Can Bayesians provide norms for agents who can lose memories and forget what they used to take as certain? See Meacham (2010), Moss (2012), and Titelbaum (2013a: ch. 6 and 7) for positive accounts; also see section 5.4 for discussion. Can Bayesians develop norms for agents who are somewhat incoherent and incapable of being perfectly coherent? See Staffel (2019) for a positive account. Can Bayesians provide norms even for agents who are so cognitively underpowered that they only have all-or-nothing beliefs without a numerical credence? See Lin (2013) for a positive account. Can Bayesians develop norms that explain how one may be rationally uncertain whether one is rational? See Dorst (2020) for a positive account. Can Bayesians develop a diachronic norm for cognitively bounded agents? See Huttegger (2017a, 2017b) for a positive account.

While the project of de-idealization can be pursued gradually and incrementally as illustrated above, Bayesians disagree about how far this project should be pursued. Some Bayesians want to push it further: they think that Very Weak Normalization is still too strong to be plausible, so Probabilism needs to be abandoned altogether and replaced by a norm that permits credences less than 1 in logical truths. For example, Garber (1983) tries to do that for certain logical truths; Hacking (1967) and Talbott (2016), for all logical truths. On the other hand, Bayesians of the more traditional variety retain a more or less de-idealized version of Probabilism, and try to defend it by clarifying its normative content, to which I now turn.

6.2 Striving for Ideals

Probabilism is often thought to have a counterexample to this effect: it implies that we should meet a very high standard, but it is not the case that we should, because we cannot. In reply, some Bayesians hold that this is actually not a counterexample, and that the apparent counterexample can be explained away once an appropriate reading of ‘ought’ is in place and clearly distinguished from another reading.

To see that there are two readings of ‘ought’, think about the following scenario. Suppose that this is true:

The truth of this particular norm might sound like a counterexample to the general norm below:

But perhaps there can be a context in which (i) and (ii) are both true and hence the former is not a counterexample to the latter. An example is the context in which we know for sure that we are able to launch a war that ends all existing wars. Indeed, the occurrences of ‘ought’ in those two sentences seem to have very different readings. Sentence (ii) can be understood to express a norm which portrays what the state of the world ought to be like—what the world would be like if things were ideal. Such a norm is often called an ought-to-be norm or evaluative norm, pointing to one or another ideal. On the other hand, sentence (i) can be understood as a norm which specifies what an agent ought to do in a less-than-ideal situation that she turns out to be in—possibly with the goal to improve the existing situation and bring it closer to the ideal specified by an ought-to-be norm, or at least to prevent the situation from getting worse. This kind of norm is often called an ought-to-do norm, a deliberative norm, or a prescriptive norm. So, although the truth of (i) can sound like a counterexample to (ii), the tension between the two seems to disappear with appropriate readings of ‘ought’.

Similarly, suppose that an ordinary human has some incoherent credences, and that it is not the case that she ought to remove the incoherence right away because she has not detected the incoherence. The norm just stated can be thought of as an ought-to-do norm and, hence, need not be taken as a counterexample to Probabilism construed as an ought-to-be norm:

The ought-to-be reading of ‘ought’ has been employed implicitly or explicitly to defend Bayesian norms—not just by Bayesian philosophers (Zynda 1996; Christensen 2004: ch. 6; Titelbaum 2013a: ch. 3 and 4; Wedgwood 2014; Eder forthcoming), but also by Bayesian psychologists (Baron 2012). The distinction between the ought-to-be and the ought-to-do oughts is most often defended in the broader context of normative studies, such as in deontic logic (Castañeda 1970; Horty 2001: sec. 3.3 and 3.4) and in metaethics (Broome 1999; Wedgwood 2006; Schroeder 2011).

The ought-to-be construal of Probabilism still leaves us a prescriptive issue: How should a person go about detecting and fixing the incoherence of one’s credences, noting that it is absurd to strive for coherence at all costs? This is an issue about ought-to-do/prescriptive norms, addressed by a prescriptive research program in an area of psychology called judgment and decision making. For a survey of that area, see Baron (2004, 2012) and Elqayam & Evans (2013). In fact, many psychologists even think that, for better or worse, this prescriptive program has become the “new paradigm” in the psychology of reasoning; for references, see Elqayam & Over (2013).

The prescriptive issue mentioned above raises some other questions. There is an empirical, computational question: What is the extent to which a human brain can approximate the Bayesian ideal of synchronic and diachronic coherence? See Griffiths, Kemp, & Tenenbaum (2008) for a survey of some recent results. And there are philosophical questions: Why is it epistemically better for a human’s credences to be less incoherent? Speaking of being less incoherent, how can we develop a measure of degrees of incoherence? See de Bona & Staffel (2018) and Staffel (2019) for proposals.

6.3 Applications Empowered by Idealization

There is a third approach to the problem of idealization: to some Bayesians, some aspects of the Bayesian idealization are to be utilized rather than removed, because it is those aspects of idealization that empower certain important applications of Bayesian epistemology in science. Here is the idea. Consider a human scientist confronted with an empirical problem. When some hypotheses have been stated for consideration and some data have been collected, there remains an inferential task—the task of inferring from the data to one of the hypotheses. This inferential task can be done by human scientists alone, but it has been done increasingly often this way: by developing a computer program (in Bayesian statistics) to simulate an idealized Bayesian agent as if that agent were hired to perform the inferential task. The purpose of this inferential task would be undermined if what is simulated by the computer were a cognitively underpowered agent who mimics the limited capacities of human agents. Howson (1992: sec. 6) suggests that this inferential task is what Bayesian epistemology and Bayesian statistics were mainly designed for at the early stages of their development. See Fienberg (2006) for the historical development of Bayesian statistics.

So, on the above view, idealization is essential to the existing applications of Bayesian epistemology in science. If so, the real issue is whether the kind of scientific inquiry empowered by Bayesian idealization serves the purpose of the inferential task better than do the non-Bayesian rivals, such as so-called frequentism and likelihoodism in statistics. For a critical comparison of those three schools of thought about statistical inference, see Sober (2008: ch. 1), Hacking (2016), and the entry on philosophy of statistics. For an introduction to both Bayesian statistics and frequentist statistics written for philosophers, see Howson & Urbach (2006: ch. 5–8).

7. Closing: The Expanding Territory of Bayesianism

Bayesian epistemology, despite the problems presented above, has been expanding its scope of application. In addition to the more standard, older areas of application listed in section 1.3, the newer ones can be found in the entry on epistemic self-doubt, sections 5.1 and 5.4 of the entry on disagreement, Adler (2006 [2017]: sec. 6.3), and sections 3.6 and 4 of the entry on social epistemology.

In their more recent works, Bayesians have also started to contribute to some epistemological issues that have traditionally been among the most central concerns for many non-Bayesians, especially for those immersed in the epistemology of all-or-nothing beliefs. I wish to close by giving four groups of examples.

1. Skeptical Challenges: Central to traditional epistemology is the issue of how to address certain skeptical challenges. The Cartesian skeptic thinks that we are not justified in believing that we are not a brain in a vat. Huemer (2016) and Shogenji (2018) have each developed a Bayesian argument against this variety of skepticism. There is also the Pyrrhonian skeptic, who holds the view that no belief can be justified due to the regress problem of justification: once a belief is justified with a reason, that reason is in need of justification, too, which kickstarts a regress. An attempt to reply to this skeptic quickly leads to a difficult choice among three positions: first, foundationalism (roughly, that the regress can be stopped); second, coherentism (roughly, that it is permissible for the regress of justifications to be circular); and third, infinitism (roughly, that it is permissible for the regress of justifications to extend ad infinitum). To that issue Bayesians have made some contributions. For example, White (2006) develops a Bayesian argument against an influential version of foundationalism, followed by a reply from Weatherson (2007); for more, see section 3.2 of the entry on formal epistemology. Klein & Warfield (1994) develop a probabilistic argument against coherentism, which initiates a debate joined by many Bayesians; for more, see section 7 of the entry on coherentist theories of epistemic justification. Peijnenburg (2007) defends infinitism by developing a Bayesian version of it. For more on the Cartesian and Pyrrhonian skeptical views, see the entry on skepticism.
2. Theories of Knowledge and Justified Beliefs: While traditional epistemologists praise knowledge and have extensively studied what turns a belief into knowledge, Moss (2013, 2018) develops a Bayesian counterpart: she argues that a credence can also be knowledge-like, a property that can be studied by Bayesians. Traditional epistemology also features a number of competing accounts of justified belief, and the possibilities of their Bayesian counterparts have been explored by Dunn (2015) and Tang (2016). For more on the prospects of such Bayesian counterparts, see Hájek and Lin (2017).
3. The Scientific Realism/Anti-Realism Debate: One of the most classic debates in philosophy of science is that between scientific realism and anti-realism. The scientific realist contends that science pursues theories are true literally or at least approximately, while the anti-realist denies that. An early contribution to this debate is van Fraassen’s (1989: part II) Bayesian argument against inference to the best explanation (IBE), which is often used by scientific realists to defend their view. Some Bayesians have joined the debate and try to save IBE instead; see sections 3.1 and 4 of the entry on abduction. Another influential defense of scientific realism proceeds with the so-called no-miracle argument. (This argument runs roughly as follows: scientific realism is correct because it is the only philosophical view that does not render the success of science a miracle.) Howson (2000: ch. 3) and Magnus & Callender (2004) maintain that the no-miracle argument commits a fallacy that can be made salient from a Bayesian perspective. In reply, Sprenger & Hartmann (2019: ch. 5) contend that Bayesian epistemology makes possible a better version of the no-miracle argument for scientific realism. An anti-realist view is instrumentalism, which says that science only need to pursue theories that are useful for making observable predictions. Vassend (forthcoming) argues that conditionalization can be generalized in a way that caters to both the scientific realist and the instrumentalist—regardless of whether evidence should be utilized in science to help us pursue truth or usefulness.
4. Frequentist Concerns: Frequentists about statistical inference design inference procedures for the purposes of, say, testing a working hypothesis, identifying the truth among a set of competing hypotheses, or producing accurate estimates of certain quantities. And they want to design procedures that infer reliably—with a low objective, physical chance of making errors. Those concerns have been incorporated into Bayesian statistics, leading to the Bayesian counterparts of some frequentist accounts. In fact, those results have already appeared in standard textbooks on Bayesian statistics, such as the influential one by Gelman et al. (2014: sec. 4.4 and ch. 6). The line between frequentist and Bayesian statistics is blurring.

So, as can be seen from the many examples in I–IV, Bayesians have been assimilating ideas and concerns from the epistemological tradition of all-or-nothing beliefs. In fact, there have also been attempts to develop a joint epistemology—an epistemology for agents who have both credences and all-or-nothing beliefs at the same time; for details, see section 4.2 of the entry on formal representations of belief.

It is debatable which, if any, of the above topics can be adequately addressed in Bayesian epistemology. But Bayesians have been expanding their territory and their momentum will surely continue.