Feminist Ethics

Feminist Ethics aims “to understand, criticize, and correct” how gender operates within our moral beliefs and practices (Lindemann 2005, 11) and our methodological approaches to ethical theory. More specifically, feminist ethicists aim to understand, criticize, and correct: (1) the binary view of gender, (2) the privilege historically available to men, and/or (3) the ways that views about gender maintain oppressive social orders or practices that harm others, especially girls and women who historically have been subordinated, along gendered dimensions including sexuality and gender-identity. Since oppression often involves ignoring the perspectives of the marginalized, different approaches to feminist ethics have in common a commitment to better understand the experiences of persons oppressed in gendered ways. That commitment results in a tendency, in feminist ethics, to take into account empirical information and material actualities.

Not all feminist ethicists correct all of (1) through (3). Some have assumed or upheld the gender binary (Wollstonecraft 1792; Firestone 1970). They criticize and aim to correct the privileging of men as the more morally worthy half of the binary, or argue against the maintenance of a social order that oppresses others in gendered ways. More recently, feminist ethicists have commonly criticized the gender binary itself, arguing that upholding a fixed conception of the world as constituted only by “biological” men and women contributes to the maintenance of oppressive and gendered social orders, especially when doing so marginalizes those who do not conform to gender binaries (Butler 1990; Bettcher 2014; Dea 2016a; Briggs and George 2023). Feminist ethicists who are attentive to the intersections of multiple aspects of identity including race, class, and disability, in addition to gender, criticize and correct assumptions that men simpliciter are historically privileged, as if privilege distributes equally among all men regardless of how they are socially situated. They instead focus more on criticizing and correcting oppressive practices that harm and marginalize others who live at these intersections in order to account for the distinctive experiences of individuals whose experiences are not those of members of culturally dominant groups (Crenshaw 1991; Khader 2013; Cull 2024). Whatever the focus of feminist ethicists, a widely shared characteristic of their works is at least some overt attention to power, privilege, or limited access to social goods. In a broad sense, then, feminist ethics is fundamentally political (Tong 1993, 160; Hay 2020). This is not necessarily a feature of feminist ethics that distinguishes it from “mainstream” ethics, however, since feminist analyses of ethical theory as arising from material and nonideal contexts suggest that all ethics is political whether its being so is recognized by the theorist or not.

Since feminist ethics is not merely a branch of ethics, but is instead “a way of doing ethics” (Lindemann 2005, 4), philosophers engaged in the above tasks can be concerned with any branch of ethics, including meta-ethics, normative theory, and practical or applied ethics. The point of feminist ethics is, ideally, to change ethics for the better by improving ethical theorizing and offering better approaches to issues including those involving gender. Feminist ethics is not limited to gendered issues because the insights of feminist ethics are often applicable to analyses of moral experiences that share features with gendered issues or that reflect the intersection of gender with other bases of oppression. Feminist philosophical endeavors include bringing investigations motivated by feminist ethics to bear on ethical issues, broadly conceived.

Feminist ethics is often expressed in morally plural ways, including pragmatism (Hamington and Bardwell-Jones 2012), transnationalism (Jagger 2013; Herr 2014; Mclaren 2017; Khader 2018b), nonideal theory (Mills 2005; Schwartzman 2006; Tessman 2009b; Norlock 2016), and disability theory (Wendell 1996; Garland-Thomson 2011; Tremain 2015). Feminist ethics also includes critiques of the work of canonical theorists as well as extensions of their views by deontologists, utilitarians, contractarians, and virtue ethicists, who hold some universal principles or absolute requirements to be basic to their views.

• 1. Feminist Ethics: Historical Background
  • 1.1 Seventeenth- and Eighteenth-Century Forerunners of Feminist Ethics
  • 1.2 Nineteenth-Century Influences and Issues
  • 1.3 Twentieth-Century Influences and Issues
• 2. Themes in feminist ethics
  • 2.1 Gender binarism, essentialism, and transfeminism
  • 2.2 Ethic of care and relational ethics
  • 2.3 Intersectionality
  • 2.4 Feminist criticisms and expansions of traditional moral theories
  • 2.5 Oppression, sexism, and misogyny
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Feminist Ethics: Historical Background

Feminist ethics as an academic area of study in the field of philosophy dates to the 1970s, when philosophical journals started more frequently publishing articles specifically concerned with feminism and sexism (Korsmeyer 1973; Rosenthal 1973; Jaggar 1974), and after curricular programs of Women’s Studies began to be established in some universities (Young 1977; Tuana 2011). Readers interested in themes evident in the fifty years of feminist ethics in philosophy will find this discussion in section (2) below, “Themes in Feminist Ethics.”

Prior to 1970, “there was no recognized body of feminist philosophy” (Card 2008, 90). Of course, throughout history, philosophers have attempted to understand the roles that gender may play in moral life. Yet such philosophers presumably were addressing male readers, and their accounts of women’s moral capacities did not usually aim to disrupt the subordination of women. Rarely in the history of philosophy will one find philosophical works that notice gender in order to criticize and correct men’s historical privileges or to disrupt the social orders and practices that subordinate groups on gendered dimensions. An understanding that sex matters to one’s ethical theorizing in some way is necessary to, but not sufficient for, feminist ethics.

Some philosophers and writers, however, constitute forerunners to feminist ethics. Representative authors writing in the seventeenth, eighteenth, and nineteenth centuries discussed below explicitly address what they perceive to be moral wrongs resulting from either oppression on the basis of sex, or metaethical errors on the part of public intellectuals in believing ideal forms of moral reasoning to be within the capacities of men and not women. In the early-to-mid-twentieth century, at the same time that feminism became a more popularly used term in Europe and the Americas, more theorists argued influentially for ending unjust discrimination on the basis of sex. Some authors concertedly argued that philosophers and theorists erred in their understanding of what seemed to be gendered differences in ethical and moral reasoning.

1.1 Seventeenth- and Eighteenth-Century Forerunners of Feminist Ethics

In the seventeenth century, some public intellectuals published treatises arguing that women were as rational as men and should be afforded the education that would allow them to develop their moral character. They argued that since females are rational, their unequal access to learning was immoral and unjustifiable. They explored meta-ethical questions about the preconditions for morality, including what sorts of agents can be moral and whether morality is equally possible for different sexes. For example, in 1694, Mary Astell’s first edition of A Serious Proposal to the Ladies for the Advancement of their True and Greatest Interest was published, advocating for access to education. It was controversial enough that Astell issued a sequel three years later, A Serious Proposal, Part II, that challenged “those deep background philosophical and theological assumptions which deny women the capacity for improvement of the mind” (Springborg, “Introduction,” in Astell 2002, 21). At the time, some apparently attributed the first Serious Proposal not to Astell, but to Damaris Cudworth Masham, a one-time companion of John Locke, since such criticisms of the injustice of women’s lot and the background assumptions maintaining their subordinate situation were familiar to Masham (Springborg, “Introduction,” in Astell 2002, 17). Although Masham sharply disagreed with aspects of Astell’s work, she too would later come to be credited with “explicitly feminist claims,” including objections to “the inferior education accorded women” (Frankel 1989, 84), especially when such obstacles were due to “the ignorance of men” (Masham 1705, 169, quoted in Frankel 1989, 85). Masham also deplored “the double standard of morality imposed on women and men, especially … the claim that women’s ‘virtue’ consists primarily in chastity” (Frankel 1989, 85).

A century later, Mary Wollstonecraft, in her Vindication of the Rights of Women ([1792] 1988), renewed attention to girls’ lack of access to education. Criticizing the philosophical assumptions underpinning practices that denied girls adequate education, Wollstonecraft articulated an Enlightenment ideal of the social and moral rights of women as the equal of men. Wollstonecraft also broadened her critique of social structures to encompass ethical theory, especially in resistance to the arguments of influential men that women’s virtues are different from men’s and appropriate to perceived feminine duties. Wollstonecraft asserted: “I here throw down my gauntlet, and deny the existence of sexual virtues,” adding that “women, I allow, may have different duties to fulfil; but they are human duties, and the principles that should regulate the discharge of them … must be the same” (51). The revolutions of the Enlightenment age motivated some men as well as women to reconsider inequities in education at a time when notions of universal human rights were gaining prominence. As Joan Landes observes, Marie-Jean-Antoine-Nicolas de Caritat, Marquis de Condorcet was an extraordinary advocate for the rights of women in France during this period who argued in 1790 for “the admission of women to the rights of citizenship” and “woman’s equal humanity on the grounds of reason and justice” (Landes 2016). Like many theorists of their time and places, including Catherine Macaulay (Tomaselli 2016), Olympe de Gouges, and Madame de Staël (Landes 2016), Wollstonecraft and Condorcet granted that there were material differences between the sexes, but advanced moral arguments against ethical double-standards on the basis of universal humanism. Yet the notion of universal humanism tended to prioritize virtues traditionally seen as masculine. Wollstonecraft, for example, argued against perceptions that women lacked men’s capacities for morality, but praised rationality and “masculinity” as preconditions for morality (Tong 1993, 44).

1.2 Nineteenth-Century Influences and Issues

In Europe and North America, nineteenth-century moral arguments coalesced around material issues that would later be appreciated by feminist ethicists as importantly intersecting. A remarkably diverse array of activist women and public intellectuals advanced recognizably feminist arguments for women’s moral leadership and greater freedoms as moral imperatives. The resistance of enslaved women and the political activism of their descendants, the anti-slavery organizations of women in Europe and North America, the attention to inequity in women’s access to income, property, sexual freedom, full citizenship, and enfranchisement, and the rise of Marxist and Socialist theories contributed to women’s participation in arguments for the reductions of militarism, unfettered capitalism, domestic violence and the related abuse of drugs and alcohol, among other concerns.

Offering the first occurrence of the term feminisme (Offen 1988), the nineteenth century is characterized by a plurality of approaches to protofeminist ethics, that is, ethical theorizing that anticipated and created the groundwork for modern feminist concepts. These include some theories consistent with the universal humanism of Wollstonecraft and Condorcet and others emphasizing the differences between the sexes in order to argue for the superiority of feminine morality. The most well-known of the former in philosophy are John Stuart Mill’s The Subjection of Women (1869 [1987]), which he credits Harriet Taylor Mill with co-authoring, and Harriet Taylor Mill’s essay, “The Enfranchisement of Women” (H. T. Mill 1851 [1998]). Like their Enlightenment forerunners, Mill and Taylor argue that women ought to have equal rights and equal access to political and social opportunities. As a utilitarian philosopher, Mill further emphasizes the benefits to society and to the human species of improving women’s lives and social situations. Mill expresses skepticism about claims that women are morally superior to men, as well as claims that women have “greater liability to moral bias,” emotionality, and poor judgment in ethical decision-making (1869 [1987], 518 and 519). Mill and Taylor tend to overemphasize the roles of women who are wives. Mill’s works especially emphasize the benefits to family and domestic life as reasons to support the liberation of women from subjugation. Mill and Taylor also posit some differences between men and women that are controversial today. Despite these views, both argue for the benefits of women’s liberation to scholarly and political spheres. For example, they describe differences in achievement and behavior to be the result mainly of women’s social situations and education, making their view consistent with the arguments of both the Enlightenment scholars noted above, and some, but not all, of the nineteenth- and twentieth-century authors discussed below.

Attitudes about the reasons for the moral goodness of such achievements differed. Some early utopian and Socialist movements in Europe that influenced women’s rights activists in America and would later influence British thinkers, including John Stuart Mill, lauded feminine virtues and women’s importance, but did so in ways that would reinforce views of women as “superior” because of innate qualities of gentleness, love, spirituality, and sentimentality (Moses 1982). In contrast, other Socialist movements expressed radical views of the equality of men and women not by attributing distinctive or greater moral virtues to women, but by challenging systems of privilege due to sex, race, and class (Taylor 1993). Although Mill and Taylor would later argue that “sexual inequality is an impediment to the cultivation of moral virtue,” some American activists such as Catherine Beecher forwarded a “separate-but-equal” vision of men and women as psychologically and essentially different, a view “according to which female virtue is ultimately better than male virtue” (Tong 1993, 36 and 37). In the pivotal year of 1848, Frederick Douglass insisted that “all that distinguishes man as an intelligent and accountable being, is equally true of woman” (quoted in Davis 1981, 51). In the same year, the Declaration of Sentiments was signed at a women’s rights convention in Seneca Falls, New York, and socialist and anarchist revolutions took place in Europe. The revolutionaries included public thinkers who advocated communal property and sexual equality, and who criticized the involvement of state and church in marriage. Their arguments about practical and feminist ethics influenced Emma Goldman and other turn-of-the-century thinkers.

Philosophical thinkers of different backgrounds generated a plurality of approaches to the project of understanding, criticizing, and correcting how gender operates within our moral beliefs and practices. Some authors offered critiques of unethical domination in the private sphere (see also the related discussion of historical context in the entry on Feminist Political Philosophy). For example, Frances Cobbe draws on Kantian ethics to defend both women’s rights and animal rights, linking domestic violence and the mistreatment of animals (Cobbe 1864; Scott 2025). The attachment of other protofeminist thinkers to the positive values of the domestic sphere shaped their ethical recommendations. Some white and middle-class activists argued for the end of slavery and, later, against the subordination of emancipated women of color precisely on the grounds that they wished to extend the privileges that white and middle-class women enjoyed in the domestic and private sphere, maintaining the social order while valorizing domestic feminine goodness. As Clare Midgley says, “Women’s role was discussed in terms of family life. Emancipation would mark the end of the sexual exploitation of women and of the disruption of family life, and the creation of a society in which the black woman was able to occupy her proper station as a Daughter, a Wife, and a Mother” (Midgley 1993, 351).

In contrast, some former slaves including Anna Julia Cooper and Ida B. Wells-Barnett, and descendants of slaves including Mary Church Terrell, grounded their work for women’s rights and arguments for women’s moral and sociopolitical equality in rather different priorities, asserting more interest in equal protection of the laws, economic liberation, political representation, and in Wells-Barnett’s case, self-defense and the exertion of the right to bear arms, as necessary to the very survival and liberation of Black Americans (Giddings 2007). In making these arguments, Black women laid the foundations for intersectional approaches. In posing the question “Ain’t I a Woman?” at an 1851 Women’s Rights Convention in Ohio, Sojourner Truth articulated the exclusion at the heart of the (white) women’s movement. Decades later, Cooper would argue that Black women are “confronted by a both a woman question and a race problem and is as yet an unknown or an unacknowledged factor in both” (1892 [2000: 134]). Cooper rightly criticized white feminists for racist (and female-supremacist) statements when they were offered as reasons to work for white women’s voting rights rather than Black men’s and advanced a view of virtues and truth as having masculine and feminine sides. A century before care ethics would become a strain of academic feminist ethics, Cooper urged that both masculine reason and feminine sympathy “are needed to be worked into the training of children, in order that our boys may supplement their virility by tenderness and sensibility, and our girls may round out their gentleness by strength and self-reliance” (Cooper [1892] 2000, 60; see also the entry on Anna Julia Cooper). Her timeless concern for the U.S. was that a nation or a people “will degenerate into mere emotionalism on the one hand, or bullyism on the other, if dominated by either exclusively” (61). Hers is a normative argument for appreciating the contributions that both traditionally feminine and masculine values could offer to a well-balanced ethics.

Explicitly arguing that standpoints matter to knowledge claims and moral theorizing, Cooper insisted that historical knowledge necessary to a nation’s self-understanding depends on the representation of Black Americans’ voices, and especially the “Black Woman of America” (Cooper [1892] 2000, 2; Gines 2015). Manifesting Cooper’s call for representations, Wells-Barnett determinedly included accounts of girls and women killed by lynching along with the narratives of murdered men and boys, and challenged the “racial-sexual apologies for lynching to trample the twin myths of white (female) sexual purity and black (male) sexual savagery” (James 1997, 80). Wells-Barnett’s investigative journalism led her to the blunt suggestion that some of the sexual relationships giving rise to cover stories of rape as justifications for lynching were consensual relationships between white women and Black men, while rapes of Black women and girls, “which began in slavery days, still continues without reproof from church, state or press” (quoted in Sterling 1979, 81).

1.3 Twentieth-Century Influences and Issues

Like Wells-Barnett, anarchist and socialist writers, some from working-class backgrounds, advanced frank arguments for differently understanding women’s capacities and desires as sexual beings with their own moral agency. Leaders included Emma Goldman, whose anarchism was developed as a response to Marx and Marxism (Fiala 2018). Goldman argued for broader understandings of love, sexuality, and family, because she believed that traditional social codes of morality resulted in the corruption of women’s sexual self-understanding (112). Like Wells-Barnett, Goldman coupled arguments against feminine sexual purity with attention to the sexual exploitation of, and trafficking in, women who did not enjoy the state’s protection (Goldman 2012). Some suffragists’ “emphasis on female morality repulsed Goldman. Yet, while she ridiculed the claim that women were morally superior to men … she also emphasized that women should be allowed and encouraged to express freely their ‘true’ femininity” (Marso 2007, 76).

Although early twentieth-century protofeminists differed in their beliefs as to whether men and women were morally different in character, they generally shared a belief in Progressive ideals of moral and social improvement if only humankind brought fair and rational thinking to bear on ethical issues. Progressive-era pragmatists, including Wells-Barnett, Charlotte Perkins-Gilman, Jane Addams, and Alice Paul, “saw the social environment as malleable, capable of improvement through human action and philosophic thought” (Whipps and Lake 2016). The beginning of the century was characterized by remarkably optimistic thinking even on the part of more radical theorists who appreciated the deep harms of oppressive social organizations. Most of the Progressive activists and suffragists of this era never described themselves with the new term, “feminist,” but as the immediate forerunners of feminism, they are described as feminists today.

Although belief in the possibilities for change seems widely shared, Progressive-era feminists did not always share common ground regarding women’s moral natures or how to achieve moral progress as a nation. For example, both Goldman and pro-suffrage Charlotte Perkins-Gilman argued for individual self-transformation and self-understanding as keys to women’s better moral characters (Goldman 2012), while maintaining that a person’s efforts were best supported by a less individualistic and more communitarian social and political framework (Gilman 1966). While Goldman included greater access to birth control and reproductive choice among the morally urgent routes to women’s individual self-discovery, Gilman and many feminists argued for women’s access to contraception in ways that reflected increasingly popular policies of eugenics in North and South America and Europe (Gilman 1932). Eugenics-friendly white women’s contributions of feminist ethical arguments to disrupt oppressive pronatalism or to avert the measurable costs of parenthood in sexist societies often took the form of deepening other forms of marginalization, including those based on race, disability, and class (Lamp and Cleigh 2011).

In the U.S., the centrality of sex and gender issues in public ethics during the Progressive Era moved one magazine to write in 1914 that “The time has come to define feminism; it is no longer possible to ignore it” (Cott 1987, 13). Unfortunately, this sentiment would decline with the start of World War I and the consequent demise of optimistic beliefs in the powers of human rationality to bring about moral progress. Yet throughout the 1920s, 1930s, and 1940s, as economic difficulties, military conflicts, and wealth disparity fluctuated internationally, women’s groups and feminist activists in many countries would advance, with some success, feminist and moral arguments for workplace, professional, electoral, and educational access, for the liberalization of contraception, marriage, and divorce laws, and against militarism. Some of their gains in greater access to voting, education, and prosperity may have contributed to the wide audience that was receptive to Simone de Beauvoir’s publications in Europe and, after translations were available, in North America.

Beauvoir first self-identified as a feminist in 1972 (Schwarzer 1984, 32), and consistently refused the label of a philosopher despite having taught courses in philosophy (Card 2003a, 9; see also the entry on Simone de Beauvoir). Yet beginning in the 1950s, both her Ethics of Ambiguity (1947 [1976]) and The Second Sex (1949 [2010]) were widely read and quickly appreciated as important to feminist ethics (Card 2003a, 1). As works of existentialist morality, they emphasized that we are not all simply subjects and individual choosers but also objects shaped by the forces of oppression (Andrew 2003, 37). Like the protofeminists described above, Beauvoir focused on the embodied experiences and social situations of women. In these pivotal works, she advanced the case that embodiment and social situatedness are not only relevant to human existence, but are the stuff of human existence, so crucial that philosophy ought not ignore them (Andrew 2003, 34). In The Second Sex, she argued that some men in philosophy managed the bad-faith project of both ignoring their own sex-situatedness and yet describing women as the Other and men as the Self. Because men in philosophy take themselves to be paradigmatically human and characterize the nature of womankind as different from men, Beauvoir said that men socially construct woman as the Other. Famously, Beauvoir said, “one is not born, but rather becomes, woman,” that is, one may be born a human female, but “the figure that the human female takes on in society,” that of a “woman,” results from “the mediation of another [that] can constitute an individual as an Other” (Beauvoir 1949 [2010], 329). The embodied human female may be a subject of her own experiences and perceptions, but “being a woman would mean being an object, the Other” (83), that is, the objectified recipient of the speculations and perceptions of men. A woman’s position is therefore so deeply ambiguous—one of navigating “a human condition as defined in its relation with the Other” (196)—that if one is to philosophize about women, “it is indispensable to understand the economic and social structure” in which women aim to be authentic or ethical, necessitating “an existential point of view, taking into account her total situation” (84). In other words, philosophers speculating about women ought to take into account the obstacles to women’s opportunities for subjecthood and choice that are created by those who constructed an oppressive situation for women to navigate.

Beauvoir’s positions—that woman has been defined by men and in men’s terms, that ethical theory must attend to women’s social situation and their capacity to be moral decision-makers, and that women’s oppression impedes their knowing themselves and changing their situation—reflect the concerns of many forerunners of feminist ethics. Beauvoir’s work profoundly shaped the emergence of feminist ethics as a subfield of philosophy at a time when philosophers more generally had moved away from the eighteenth- and nineteenth-century tendencies to describe women as lacking morally worthy rational capacities. Instead, by the middle of the twentieth century, some influential philosophers in Europe and the Americas had moved toward approaches that often led to describing both gender and ethics as irrelevant to philosophical discourse (Garry 2017).

Feminist ethics did not begin to be established as an academic subject until the 1960s. But attention to gender-related forms of oppression continued to be published by important scholars. In the 20th century, Black women scholars developed a range of conceptual frameworks for naming what Claudia Jones, in the 1940s, described as the “super exploitation” of Black women, referring to the ways that Black women were oppressed by race and gender in ways that were not merely additive (1949 [1995]). In the 1960s, Pauli Murray coined the term “Jane Crow” to describe the legal standing of Black women as she fought for the inclusion of sex as a recognized category of discrimination in Civil Rights legislation (Murray and Eastwood 1965), while Frances Beal described this location as one of “double jeopardy” (1969 [2008]). In the 1970s and 1980s, Black feminists proposed frameworks that aimed to track multiple forms of oppression. Deborah King proposed modifying Beal’s framework as “multiple jeopardy” (1988). The Combahee River Collective coined the term “identity politics” as a mode of organizing around the structural oppressions of multiply oppressed social groups (Combahee 1982), while Audre Lorde (1984) and Angela Davis (1981) developed new approaches to theorizing from multiply oppressed standpoints (see Identity Politics). These frameworks departed from analyses of race and gender in both white feminist and black radical contexts, which have tended to treat race and gender as analogous, but not intersecting, forms of oppression (Beauvoir 1949 [2010]; Fanon [1952]; Mills 1998). In her landmark Black Feminist Thought (1990), Patricia Hill Collins proposed a “matrix of domination” which posited race, gender, and class as “interlocking systems of oppression.” In 1989, Kimberlé Crenshaw conceptualized Black women as located at the “intersection” of race and gender discrimination. Intersectional critiques and methodologies have also been developed within Chicana, Latina, women of color, and decolonial feminisms (Anzaldua 2021, Lugones 2003, Ortega 2016, Alcoff 2017, Mohanty 1988; Mohanty 2003; Matsuda 1991, Khader 2018b).

The establishment of feminist ethics in academic and philosophical programs did not immediately include high attention to intersectionality on the part of scholars in the 1960s and 1970s, however. Instead, issues of gender essentialism revived in the course of analyzing patriarchy and oppression.

Some feminists criticized male supremacy without thereby preferring female supremacy (Frye 1983; Card 1986; Hoagland 1988). They argued that although the categories of “men” and “women” are physiologically distinct, the potential of feminism to liberate both men and women from oppressive gendered social arrangements suggests that men and women do not have different moralities or separate realities, and that we do not need to articulate separate capacities for ethics (Jaggar 1974; Davion 1998).

Other feminist ethicists offer radically different views. Mary Daly, for example, noted that women were traditionally defined throughout intellectual history as being subversive of rationality, impartiality, and morality as traditionally conceived. She argued that women ought to embrace, as essential to women’s natures and good, some of the very qualities that she said men have ascribed to women as essential to women’s natures and bad; for example, she suggested valuing women’s capacities for childbearing and birth (as opposed to capacities to engage in war and killing) and women’s emotionality (versus rationality) (Daly 1979).

Radical feminists and lesbian feminists who disagreed with Daly as to whether women’s moral natures are innately better than men’s agreed with Daly in arguing either for essentialism (Griffin 1978; cf. Spelman 1988 and Witt 1995) or for women’s separation from men (Card 1988; Hoagland 1988). Some of them argued that separatism allows a setting in which to create alternative ethics, rather than merely responding to the male-dominated ethical theories traditionally discussed in the academy. They also argued that separatism better fosters women’s increased connection to each other and denies men the access to women that men might expect (Daly 1979; Frye 1983; Hoagland 1988).

In deep disagreement, philosophers such as Alison Jaggar argued against separatism as being in any way productive of a different and morally better world. Jaggar maintained that “what we must do instead is to create a new androgynous culture which incorporates the best elements of both …, which values both personal relationships and efficiency, both emotion and rationality. This result cannot be achieved through sexual separation” (Jaggar 1974, 288).

2. Themes in feminist ethics

In the fifty years that feminist ethics has been a subject of philosophical scholarship in (initially) Western and (increasingly) international discourse, theorists have considered metaethical, theoretical, and practical questions. Concern about feminist methods of articulating ethical theories can be found in the scholarship of intersectionality, Black feminist thought and women of color feminism, transnational feminism, queer theory, disability studies, and twenty-first century criticisms of feminist ethics. Questions about the shortcomings of traditional ethical theories, about which virtues constitute morally good character in contexts of oppression, and about which kinds of ethical theories will ameliorate gendered oppressions and evils generate further critical scholarship.

2.1 Gender binarism, essentialism, and transfeminism

Gender binarism, which is the view that there are only two genders—male and female—and that everyone is only one of them (Dea 2016a, 108), was assumed by most feminist ethicists publishing in philosophy in the 1970s and 1980s in the course of arguing the moral wrongness of women’s oppression (Jaggar 1974; Daly 1979).

Influential arguments supporting androgyny, gender bending, and gender-blending that were prevalent in the 1990s (Butler 1990; Butler 1993), and gender-eliminativist, humanist, and transfeminist approaches to feminist ethics and social philosophy that are prevalent in the twenty-first century (Bettcher 2007; LaBrada 2016; Mikkola 2016; Ayala and Vasilyeva 2015; Haslanger 2012), moved more feminist ethicists to attend to problems of exclusion in assuming gender binarism.

One criticism of gender binarism is that its assumption marginalizes nonconforming individuals. In efforts described as promoting coalition between trans activists and non-trans feminists, some feminists argue that we ought to examine the gender privilege inherent in presuming a binary that reflects one’s own experience better than the experiences of others (Dea 2016a; Bettcher 2014). Yet such “beyond-the-binary” approaches, in turn, have been cautioned against as well-intentioned but, at times, invalidating trans identities, “by invalidating the self-identities of trans people who do not regard their genitals as wrong” or “by representing all trans people as problematically positioned with regard to the binary” (Bettcher 2013; see also Briggs and George 2023). Some argue that recognition of dominant gender norms and their interconnection with racist and sexist oppression may better defray the harms of normalizing a gender binary (Bettcher 2013; Bell 2024).

Arguments for androgynous approaches to ethics or for gender abolition include perspectives that gender abolition ameliorates the harmful effects of hierarchical gender constructions (Haslanger 2012). Arguments against gender abolition suggest that gender abolition comes with new costs of its own, including the failure to do justice to the gender identifications of trans people (Cull 2019, Jenkins 2016, Kapusta 2016), when self-labeling as a particular gender may be a morally valuable form of agency (Camp and Flores 2024). Gender-norm authenticity may be liberating and morally important to individuals (Bell 2024).

2.2 Ethic of care and relational ethics

The salience of gendered caregiving roles for ethical reasoning has been a major focus of feminist ethics. The ethic of care has its roots in projects that aim to correct for the exclusion of women from traditional theorizations of moral reasoning. Psychologist Carol Gilligan’s landmark work, In a Different Voice: Psychological Theory and Women’s Development (1982), disputes accounts of moral development that do not take into account girls’ moral experiences (18–19), or that describe women as stuck at an interpersonal stage short of full moral development as in the theories of Lawrence Kohlberg (30). Gilligan argues that Kohlberg wrongly prioritizes a “morality of rights” and independence from others as better than, rather than merely different from, a “morality of responsibility” and intimate relationships with others (19).

Instead, Gilligan’s research suggests that for boys and men, “separation and individuation are critically tied to gender identity” (Gilligan 1982, 8). Some feminist ethicists argue that the development of masculinity typically involves valuing autonomy, rights, disconnection from others, and independence, while seeing other persons and intimate relationships as dangers or obstacles to pursuing those values; they refer to this perspective as the “perspective of justice” (Held 1995; Blum 1988). Women, in Gilligan’s studies, were as likely to express the perspective of justice as they were to express a perspective that valued intimacy, responsibility, relationships, and caring for others, while seeing autonomy as “the illusory and dangerous quest” (Gilligan 1982, 48), in tension with the values of attachment. This perspective is known as the perspective of “care” (Friedman 1991; Driver 2005). In more recent work, Gilligan has modified the idea that the perspective of care is a distinctively feminine one, arguing instead that it is a distinctively “human voice,” which challenges what she calls a “patriarchal voice” (2023).

Philosophers who apply Gilligan’s empirical results to ethical theory differ about the role that a care perspective should play in normative recommendations, as well as about whether care ethics constitutes its own moral framework, or should be used to augment traditional moral theories. Nel Noddings’s influential work, Caring: A Feminine Approach to Ethics and Moral Education (1984), argues for the moral preferability of a care perspective as both feminine and, as she later says explicitly, feminist (Noddings 2013, xxiv), orienting moral agents to focus on the needs of those one cares for in relational contexts rather than on abstract, universal principles. Noddings’s normative theory endorses the moral value of partiality that justifies prioritizing interpersonal relationships over more distant connections. Different applications of the perspective of care endorse care as social and political rather than limited to interpersonal relationships, and suggest that an ethic of care provides a route to realizing better societies as well as better treatment of distant others (Held 1993; Held 2006; Tronto 1993). Some urge societal shifts to prioritize children’s vulnerabilities and the perspectives of mothers as necessary correctives to moral and political neglect of policies that would ensure the well-being of vulnerable people in relationships requiring care (Held 1993; Ruddick 1989; Kittay 1999). This concern is further elaborated in Eva Feder Kittay’s attention to caregivers as “secondarily” or “derivatively dependent” (1999), which has been developed in engagements with vulnerability (Engster 2019; Fineman and Grear 2016; Mackenzie 2014), need (Miller 2013; Bourgault 2020) and precarity (Hamington and Flower 2021; Miller 2020). Scholars have emphasized caring as a normative framework distinguished by a recognition that we are necessarily interdependent beings with responsibilities to one another that follow from the fact of our vulnerability (Engster 2005; Fineman 2005; Kittay 2011). This is often combined with a recognition that emotions play an important role in moral reasoning (Slote 2007; Herring 2020; Pulcini 2016), and that care describes not only the responsibilities we have to one another, but how we ought to fulfill these responsibilities (Engster 2005).

In normative theory and applied ethics, care-work and caring in workplace relationships have come to receive more attention in twenty-first century philosophy than previously, as appreciation for the ethical demands of relational support-provision and client-centered or helping professions come to be influenced by variations on the ethic of care (Kittay 1999; Feder and Kittay 2002; Tronto 2005; Lanoix 2010; Reiheld 2015). Sociological work on care chains (Hochschild 2003 and 2015; Yeates 2004) and care drains (Gheaus 2013, Hochschild 2003) has increasingly informed care ethics (Robinson 2013; Nguyen, Zavoretti, and Tronto 2017; Bourgault and Robinson 2020), leading to greater emphasis on the ways in which care is organized and distributed through unjust local and global systems of exploitation (Fraser 2016; Bhandary 2017 and 2019). Particularly since the 2020 outbreak of the Covid-19 pandemic, care ethics has emphasized the structures of caring and domestic labor (Dodds 2022, Htun 2022), paying particular attention to care chains and structural practices of outsourcing this labor (Bhandary 2017; Khader 2024; Pascoe and Stripling 2024). Care ethics has also been important for recognizing forms of moral injury (Miller et al 2022; Akram 2021; Cahill et al 2023) and moral harm (Dodds 2022, Pascoe and Stripling 2020; Dalmiya 2024; Fine and Tronto 2020) generated in a global pandemic.

Some feminist ethicists critique the emphasis on care, worrying that it valorizes a conception of femininity burdened by caring (Card 1996). The complex history of femininity and caregiving practices were shaped in contexts of oppression that may permit “moral damage” to women’s agency (Tessman 2005). Approaches that fail to attend to to wider social institutions and systematic political injustice run the risk of lacking a feminist vision for changing systematic and institutional forms of oppression (Hoagland 1990; Bell 1993). Further worries about the ethic of care include whether unidirectional caring enables the exploitation of caregivers (Houston 1990; Card 1990; Davion 1993), and whether such caring excludes moral responsibilities to strangers and individuals we may affect without meeting interpersonally (Card 1990), thereby risking an insular ethic that ignores political and material realities (Hoagland 1990). Disability theorists have also argued that caring overemphasizes the agency of the caregiver at the expense of the receiver of care, and propose an “attendant services” model instead, which emphasizes that assistance is directed by the disabled person (Herring 2020, 172). Another concern is whether we risk generalizing care as a priority of all women, disregarding pluralism and variations of experience (Moody-Adams 1991). Finally, preoccupation with women’s kinder and gentler feelings may prevent or distract from attention to women’s capacities for harm and injustice, especially the injustices borne of racial and class privilege (Spelman 1991).

The above criticisms tend to proceed from a view that it is problematic that an ethic of care is predicated on seeing femininity as valuable. However, it remains controversial whether femininity is an inauthentic or burdened response to oppression, or whether femininity is a distinctive contribution of moral and valuing agents to a feminist project that rejects or corrects some of the errors and excesses of legacies of masculinity (Irigaray 1985; Harding 1987; Tong 1993; Bartky 1990). For example, Patricia Hill Collins argues that an ‘ethic of caring’ is needed to undo ‘Eurocentric masculinist’ epistemologies by centering Black women’s concrete experiences, emotions, and knowledge claims (1990, p. 765). Similarly, others note that care ethics shares features with forms of relational and communitarian ethics from non-Western traditions, including Africana ethics (Harding 1987; Metz 2013) and Confucianism (Metz and Miller 2016). In the 21st century, a broader category of relational ethics, which includes care ethics, has emerged, which takes moral questions to be located in the relations between entities. Relational approaches have developed conceptions of relational autonomy (Mackenzie and Stoljar 2000), relational virtue (Luo 2007), and relational social contract theory (Bhandary 2019). Relational approaches have been criticized for assuming idealized conditions of relationality (Khader 2020) by, for example, claiming that relational autonomy assumes “basic equal powers” of exercising agency (Westlund 2018) that may not hold in a non-ideal world. Some Black feminists have advocated for a framework of the “politics of care,” arguing that “care does more than require a posture of mutual respect, responsibility, and obligation between individuals” and propose instead non-ideal theories of care rooted in liberation struggles which present “new possibilities for living together” (Woodley 2021, 891–2).

Relational approaches have been particularly important in the development of feminist bioethics (Jennings 2016; Sherwin and Stockdale 2017; Stoljar and Mackenzie 2022) (see also the entry on Feminist Bioethics), gender-affirming and trans youth care (Marvin 2019), and animal ethics (Gruen 2015). Relational analyses of pregnancy (Rollo 2022, Miller 2015; Tong 1999; Nelson and Carse 1996) and abortion (Porter 1994; Browne 2016; Herring 2019) have emphasized the complexities of the mother-fetus dyad, situation pregnancy, abortion, and reproductive choice in a web of relations, and emphasized the intersubjective nature of pregnancy (Cahill 2015). In doing so, relational ethics conceptualize pregnancy as “a normal event in the lives of normal human beings” (Feldman 1998, 265) which should inform our understanding of what it is to be human, rather than an exceptional circumstance that can be theorized primarily by way of thought experiments.

Relational approaches have also reshaped feminist approaches to the ethics of sex and sexual violation, offering an alternative to autonomy-based theories (Cahill 2012; see section 2.4.1). Relational analyses of rape and assault (Herring 2009; Miller 2009) have broadened analyses of the wrong of rape, situating rape in the context of genocidal war (Miller 2009, Card 2003b, Enloe 2023), and developing nuanced accounts of how sexual violation impacts both relational practices of self-making (Brison 2002; Alcoff 2018) and capacities for intersubjectivity (Cahill 2001). Feminists have emphasized the importance of relational thinking in refining and thinking beyond conceptions of sexual consent, by recognizing non-ideal forms of consent that reflect relational agency (Kukla 2021) and practices of care (Isreal 2024; Anderson 2022).

2.3 Intersectionality

Some philosophers resolve the possible tension between conceptions of women, femininity, and feminism by bringing intersectional approaches to the question as to whose womanhood or femininity is being discussed. The insights of philosophers of Black Feminism, intersectionality, queer theory, critical race theory, disability studies, and transfeminism, among others, contribute to a view that there is no universal definition of the category of woman that neatly applies to all women. Some of these philosophers suggest that the distinctive moral and valuing experiences of women and individuals of all genders may be unjustly ignored or denied by a conception of women or femininity that turns out to be white, ableist, cisgender, bourgeois, and Western (Crenshaw 1991; Collins 1990; Wendell 1996; hooks 1992; Tremain 2000; Serano 2007; McKinnon 2014). Black feminists have long explored the ways that the conception of the “human” on which modern conceptions of gender are constructed are themselves Western, bourgeois, and colonial (Spillers 1987; Wynter 2003). The resulting conceptions of gender tend to take the social positions of privileged people as generic: as Joy James argues, “the masculinity and femininity in play here are not racially unmarked (if only for the reason that gender is never racially unmarked)” (2013, 752).

Minimally, intersectionality is “the predominant way of conceptualizing the relation between systems of oppression which construct our multiple identities and our social locations in hierarchies of power and privilege,” offering a remedy to histories of exclusions in feminist theory (Carastathis 2014, 304). Crenshaw’s critique names a persistent problem not only in legal frameworks but in feminist ethics: a tendency to propose categories like gender as unified and stand-alone, as a natural or legal kind. This leads to predictable patterns of exclusion, like the traditional overlooking of Black women’s experiences. For example, when Black men, but not any women, were permitted to work on a General Motors factory floor, and white women, but not any Black persons, were permitted to work in the General Motors secretarial pool, then Black women were discriminated against as Black women. That is, they were not permitted to have any job at General Motors due to living at an intersection of categories of identity that are treated separately in the law (Crenshaw 1989). Intersectionality centers the lives and testimony of those whose experiences with living at intersections of oppressions have been ignored or denied in traditional philosophical and political theories and offers these experiences as challenges to the doctrine that discrimination occurs only along one axis of identity (Crenshaw 1989; Crenshaw 1991; hooks 1984; Dotson 2014; Lorde 1990; Lugones 1987; Lugones 2014). In doing so, it aligns with and expands on the insights of standpoint epistemology (see the entry on Feminist Social Epistemology).

Intersectionality can be understood as both an “overarching knowledge project” (Collins 2015) and as an analytic method with important implications for feminist ethics. Intersectional analyses are generally united by (1) “matrix thinking” that critiques “single-axis” modes of analysis (Collins 1990; James 2013; May 2015); (2) “bottom-up” analyses grounded in lived experience, rather than “top-down” universals (MacKinnon 2013; Khader 2018b; Alcoff 2017); and (3) systemic analysis of social inequalities and patterns of oppression (Collins and Bilge 2020; Haslanger 2020; Dembroff 2024). Intersectional analyses hold that multiple identities or forms of oppression hold simultaneously and inseparably, such that multiple identities (e.g. one’s gender, race, class) are not merely additive or intensifying, but integrated into the lived experiences of concrete subjects (Crenshaw 1989; MacKinnon 2013; Carastathis 2013; Haslanger 2020; Martin 2024). This means that individuals at intersections of traditionally oppressed identity categories are not “necessarily worse off than the individual facing a single oppression,” as if each dimension on which one can be oppressed is easily separable in categories traditionally conceived in isolation (Khader 2013, 75). Instead, intersectional analysis involves working in coalition to identify both obvious and non-obvious forms of domination (Matsuda 1991, 1189), and recognizes multiple systems of oppression as operating simultaneously and inseparably. No single-axis mode of analysis can capture the complex nature of oppressive systems and their impacts on lived experience across cultural and social contexts (Carastathis 2013; Alcoff 2020). Thus, “intersectional theorists argue that the oppressions facing multiply oppressed women co-constitute one another and situate those women such that attempts to advance the interests of ‘all women’ may fail to advance theirs” (Khader 2013, 75). This proffers a challenge to feminist ethics to engage in multidimensional, bottom-up, and culturally and historically specific modes of analysis, and it cautions against ethical and epistemic frameworks that are universalist in key but premised on essentialist, exclusionary, or ethnocentric conceptions of women or gender (Alcoff 2020; Spelman 1988). For example, Black feminists have consistently argued that white feminist frameworks that focus on the right to abortion fail to attend to the broader matrix of reproductive injustices that have characterized women of colors’ lives, from forced maternity during enslavement to eugenics, forced sterilization, the criminalization of maternity, and family separation and child removal (Roberts 2017; Ross 2017).

Critics of intersectionality raise concerns about the clarity of its terms and approach (Nash 2008; Davis 2000; Collins 2015), worrying that cultural uptake and institutional legitimation of intersectionality has limited its rigor and scope, while coming to dominate fields like Black feminism (Nash 2018). Some critics argue that intersectionality remains limited by its emphasis on identity and marginalized subject positions (Nash 2008; Puar 2012). Others worry that it fragments or undermines the coherence of group-based identities like woman (Zack 2005; Bailey 2009), which have been recognized by feminists as important for providing “a standpoint outside liberal individualism” from which collective, institutional, and structural forms of domination can be made apparent (Young 2017). By fragmenting “woman” into discrete categories like “Black woman”, “working class woman”, “lesbian third-world woman” and so on, the worry is that intersectionality overemphasizes the distinctive social locations of discrete subjects, and in doing so, ultimately reinforces individualism (Zack 2005; Young 2017).

Some feminists have argued that intersectional analyses might involve abandoning identity-based categories like woman in favor of analyses that focus on shared experiences of oppression (Martin 2024), while others insist that categories like gender remain salient as long as we recognize them as being necessarily mediated by other dimensions of identity, like race, sexuality, nationality, class, and so on, such that the categories like gender change “not merely in degree but in kind” (Alcoff 2020). This debate tracks broader methodological questions about whether feminist ethics ought to aim towards the deconstruction of gender (Butler 1990; Haslanger 2012; Martin 2024) or develop more complex, contextual, and decolonial analytic strategies for conceptualizing concrete conceptions of gender as mediated by other identities on the ground (Alcoff 2017 and 2020; Lugones 2007).

Intersectionality theorists have, for decades, emphasized the coalitional nature of such group-based identities (Combahee; Lorde 1984; Lugones 1987; Crenshaw 1989; Matsuda 1991; Reagon 2000; Bailey 2009; Carastathis 2014; Sheth 2014; Ruíz and Dotson 2017), arguing that coalitions are always constructed as much out of difference as of similarity (Castarathis 2013). Relatedly, many feminists have observed that just as some men in the history of philosophy have falsely universalized from their own experience to describe the experiences of all humans, some feminists have presumed false universal categories of women or feminists that elide differences between women or presume to speak for all women (Grimshaw 1996; Herr 2014; Tremain 2015). Queer, trans, intersectional, transnational, decolonial, and other women of color feminisms have consistently challenged the notion that feminism can locate solidarity in commonality (Khader 2024) or in an essentialist (and exclusionary) conception of what it is to “be a woman” (Hay 2020). Transnational, decolonial, and indigenous feminists have traced the ways that gender itself is a colonial project, a structure imposed upon indigenous societies in ways that complicate contemporary conceptions that gender or patriarchal oppression are universal, or normative claims that mistake Western or liberal conceptions of freedom or justice as universal (Lugones 2007; Oyewumi 1997; Nzegwu 2005). In doing so, they name patterns of cultural and colonial racism within feminist ethics, which have tended to use the lens of “feminist inquiry” to find patriarchal oppression wherever they seek it (Oyewumi 1997; Nzegwu 1999), and to emphasize the role of non-Western “cultures” in perpetuating the oppression of women, often by way of justifying universal or Western cultural norms (Narayan 1997; Alcoff 2023; Khader 2024).

By conceptualizing identity as coalitional, intersectionality recasts shared experiences and identities in ethical terms, posing questions about solidarity, inclusion, belonging, relationality, duty, and care in the context of contentious and diverse coalitions (Reagon 2000; May 2015; Ruiz and Dotson 2017). However, there remains debate about whether intersectional analyses focus primarily on marginalized identities (Nash 2008) or provide analytic resources for locating all kinds of subject positions, tracking the ways that dominant identities like whiteness and masculinity operate as invisible defaults (Carbado 2013). Other scholars emphasize the analysis of how interlocking systems of oppression interact or overlap, asking how such systems are to be distinguished or recognized as causally related, rather than focusing on questions of identity (Davis, 2000; Fraser and Jaeggi 2018; Haslanger 2020 and 2024; Dembroff 2024).

2.4 Feminist criticisms and expansions of traditional moral theories

If there is a commonality between most of the above feminist ethicists, it is their interest in provoking reconsideration of ethical theories that failed either to notice or to care when the perspective of the philosopher so criticized was taken for either a generic truth about moral theory or a gender-specific and false description of human nature. Feminist critiques of traditional ethical theories include works in deontology, consequentialism, social contract theory, and virtue ethics. Some feminist ethicists sympathetically extend canonical work to concerns that male theorists did not address, while other feminist ethicists resoundingly reject traditional ethical theories because the theories rely on a conception of moral agency or moral value with which they disagree.

2.4.1 Deontology, rights, and duties

Deontological approaches to feminist ethics have long grappled with the tension between the promise of deontological moral theories for granting equal rights to women and the challenges posed by Kant’s sexism and racism (Kleingeld 1993; Huseyinzadegan 2018; Varden 2020a; Varden 2020b). Feminists have highlighted both Kant’s explicit exclusion of women from moral and political equality (Lanoix 2007; Pascoe 2022) as well as the implicit ways that his construction of rational agents reflects gendered assumptions developed in his writings on history and anthropology (Okin 1989; Mendus 2000; Schott 1997; Schroder 1997; Marwah 2013; Sabourin 2021; Huseyinzadegan and Pascoe 2023). At the same time, feminist Kantians have consistently recognized the value of Kant’s analysis of sex, marriage, love, self-respect, embodied rights, and domestic labor for contemporary feminist ethics (O’Neill 1989; Herman 1993 and 2021; Nussbaum 1995; Papadaki 2007; Hay 2013; Varden 2020a and 2020b; Basevich 2022; Pascoe 2019 and 2023; Shorter-Bourhanou 2023). (See feminist perspectives on objectification.)

Kantian and more broadly deontological moral theories are valuable resources for feminist ethics because of their recognition of autonomy and duties of respect and equality. They propose a rights-based approach to equality, which feminists have recognized as valuable both for claiming equal rights for women, and for drawing on feminist and intersectional insights for expanding the range of rights necessary for robust equality, especially in contexts of political liberalism. Feminist ethicists have long argued that we should acknowledge women’s equal capacities for moral agency and extend human rights to them (Astell 1694; Wollstonecraft 1792; Gordon 1997; Mill 1869 [1987]; Nussbaum 1999; Baehr 2004; Stone-Mediatore 2004; Hay 2013). They have argued for rights in the issues of enfranchisement (Truth [1867] 1995), reproduction (Steinbock 1994), abortion (Thomson 1971; Pascoe 2019), bodily integrity (Varden 2012), women’s and non-heterosexual people’s sexuality (Goldman 2012; Cuomo 2007; Varden 2020b), sexual harassment (Superson 1993), pornography (Easton 1995), violence against women (Dauer and Gomez 2006), rape (MacKinnon 2006), and more. Feminist ethicists have pointed out that rights-based theories like Kant’s may be particularly well-suited to addressing forms of oppression that can occur within families and communities, such as those faced by women, those who are LGBTQIA+, and those with disabilities ( Varden 2020b; Varden 2024), while others have emphasized the value of Kantian conceptions of self-respect for motivating both individual and group resistance against systemic oppressions (Hay 2013; Mills 2018). And, while recognizing limits to the universality of women’s experiences, feminist philosophers have argued for global human rights as a remedy for gendered oppression and dehumanization (Cudd 2005; Meyers 2016; Ross 2017).

Feminist criticisms of duty-centered frameworks, or, deontology, include those articulated by authors of the ethic of care, who argue against an ethic of duty, especially Kantian ethics, on several grounds. First, they claim that it proceeds from absolutist and universal principles which are unduly prioritized over consideration of the material contexts informing embodied experiences, particularities, and relationships. Second, they claim that it inaccurately separates capacities for rationality from capacities for emotion, and that it wrongly describes the latter as morally uninformative or worthless most likely because of their traditional association with women or femininity (Noddings 1984; Held 1993; Slote 2007). Moreover, an ethic of duty is likely to overly idealize moral agents’ capacities for rationality and choice (Tronto 1995; Tessman 2015). Some feminist ethicists embrace forms of obligation yet reject Kantian deontology when it denies the possibility of moral dilemmas (Tessman 2015). Feminists who argue that duties are socially constructed, rather than a priori, ground the nature of obligations in the normative practices of the nonideal world (Walker 1998; Walker 2003).

Feminist ethicists have also explored the value of Kantian and deontological ethical frameworks for theorizing relational ethics, care, and care labor (O’Neill 1989; Herman 1992; Korsgaard 1996; Bramer 2010; Miller 2005; Varden 2020a and 2020b). Some feminists explore the resources in Kant’s political philosophy, particularly his theorization of household relationships including marriage and parenthood, for grounding a justice-oriented account of caregiving relationships (Herman 1993; Schapiro 1996; Varden 2020b). In explicitly developing a justice-oriented account of household relations and domestic labor, Kant provides critical resources to contemporary feminist ethics, but feminists disagree about whether his arguments should be understood as primarily normative (Varden 2020b) or as sketching non-ideal raced and gendered patterns of domination (Basevich 2022; Pascoe 2022; Madrid 2025).

Transnational feminists, scholars of intersectionality, and postcolonial feminists argue that feminist advocates of global human rights routinely impose their own cultural expectations and regional practices upon the women who are purportedly the objects of their concern (Mohanty 1997; Narayan 1997; Narayan 2002; Silvey 2009; Khader 2018a; Khader 2018b). Critical analyses of some feminist deontologists’ concerns include arguments that universal morals, rights, and duties are not the best bulwark against relativist condonation of any and all possible treatments of women and subordinated people (Khader 2018a) and suggest that advocacy of human rights is perhaps well-intentioned but “entangled with imperialist precommitments in the contemporary West” (Khader 2018b, 19).

Relatedly, some feminist philosophers have criticized absolutism in ethical theory generally, that is, the prioritization of rigorous applications of principles to ethical situations regardless of the particularities of context or the motivations of the individuals affected, in part because absolutism, like universalism, takes the absolutists’ priorities to be rational for all (Noddings 1984; Baier 1994). Feminist ethicists who have endorsed visions of universal human rights as liberating for all women have been criticized by other feminists as engaging in absolutism in ways that may prescribe solutions for women in different locations and social situations rather than attending to the perspectives of the women described as needing such rights (Khader 2018a; Herr 2014).

2.4.2 Consequentialism and utilitarianism

Since John Stuart Mill and Harriet Taylor Mill argued both for utilitarianism and against the subjection of women, one could say that there have been feminists as long as there have been utilitarians. In The Subjection of Women ([1869] 1987), Mill argues that the desirable outcome of human moral progress generally is hindered by women’s legal and social subordination. He adds that not only each woman’s, but each man’s personal moral character is directly harmed by the injustice of unequal social arrangements (Okin 2005b). Mill expresses special concern that “the object of being attractive to men had … become the polar star of feminine education and formation of character,” an immoral “influence over the minds of women” (Mill [1869] 1987, 28–29), as well as an immoral influence on the understandings of the boys and girls that such women raise. Consistent with the utilitarian principle that everyone counts equally and no single person’s preferences count more than another’s, Mill argues that men and women are fundamentally equal in their capacities for higher and lower pleasures and, arguably, in their responsibilities and interests (Mendus 1994). Harriet Taylor likewise argues in The Enfranchisement of Women for the moral improvement of humankind generally and “the elevation of character [and] intellect” that would permit each woman and man to be both morally better and happier, which are overlapping and important considerations to Taylor (1998, 65).

Contemporary feminist ethicists who address utilitarianism either critique Mill’s work in particular (Annas 1977; Mendus 1994; Morales 2005), or defend a feminist version of consequentialism (Driver 2005; Gardner 2012), or apply consequentialist aims to feminist issues (Tulloch 2005; Dea 2016b). Some consequentialist feminists provide reasons for thinking that utilitarianism can accommodate feminist aims because it is responsive to empirical information, can accommodate the value of relationships in good lives, and is appreciative of distinctive vulnerabilities (Driver 2005).

Critics of utilitarianism include those who specifically resist the expectation of utilitarian impartiality, insofar as impartiality in decision-making ignores emotional connections or personal relationships with particular beings. Feminists have advanced criticisms of impartiality from the points of view of care ethics (Noddings 1984; Held 2006; Ruddick 1989), ecofeminist or environmental ethics (Adams 1990; Donovan 1990; George 1994; Warren 2000), and analytical social ethics (Baier 1994; Friedman 1994). Impartiality may yield implausible requirements to value the well-being of all equally regardless of one’s commitments, material circumstances in a nonideal world, or obligations of caring (Walker 1998; Walker 2003). Impartiality as a desirable quality of moral agents may overly idealize moral agency (Tessman 2015) or tacitly presume a biased perspective in favor of adult, racially privileged, masculine agents in a formal or public sphere whose decisions are unencumbered by relationships of unequal power (Kittay 1999).

Some feminists criticize consequentialism for failing to capture the qualitatively problematic nature of oppressions that are not reducible to harms (Frye 1983; Card 1996; Young 2009). For example, Card argues that even if certain behavior does not produce more harm than good, its symbolism could violate one’s dignity. Her example is the case of women being barred from Harvard’s Lamont Law library even when helpful male classmates provided them photocopies of course readings (2002, 104–105). Card also objects on Rawlsian grounds that the wrongness of slavery was not the balance of benefits and harms, contra consequentialism, but the fact that trade-offs could never justify slavery (2002, 57).

Anti-imperialist and non-Western feminists argue that Mill’s views in particular purport to be universal but include “Western European biases and instrumental reasoning” that establish “problematic rhetorical models for women’s rights arguments” (Botting and Kronewitter 2012). For example, Eileen Botting and Sean Kronewitter argue that The Subjection of Women contains several examples of primitivist and Orientalist rhetorical moves, such as associating “the barbarism of patriarchal marriage with Eastern cultures and religions” (2012, 471). They also object that Mill offers instrumental arguments for women’s rights, such as favoring the reduction of men’s selfishness and the increase in men’s intellectual stimulation in marriage, as well as doubling mental resources for the higher service of humanity (2012, 470), suggesting that women’s liberation is secondary to greater purposes.

2.4.3 Moral contractarianism

Some feminist ethicists argue for forms of contractarian ethics, that is, the view “that moral norms derive their normative force from the idea of contract or mutual agreement” (Cudd and Eftekhari 2018). Contractarian ethics permit moral agents to critically assess the value of any relationship, especially family relationships that may be oppressive on gendered dimensions (Okin 1989; Hampton 1993; Sample 2002; Radzik 2005). Other feminist contractarians appreciate Hobbes’s social contract theory for its applicability to women in positions of vulnerability. For example, Jean Hampton endorses Hobbes’s view that “you are under no obligation to make yourself prey to others” (Hampton 1998, 236). Hampton combines insights of both Kant and Hobbes in her version of feminist contractarianism, “building in the Kantian assumption that all persons have intrinsic value and thus must have their interests respected” (Superson 2012; see also Richardson 2007). Contractarianism arguably corrects gross injustices and inequities traceable to gendered oppressions and the most serious evils that are socially constructed (Anderson 1999; Hartley and Watson 2010).

Some feminists argue for the usefulness of contractarian ethics to evaluate one’s adaptive preferences, that is, “preferences formed in unconscious response to oppression” (Walsh 2015, 829). For example, Mary Barbara Walsh argues that social contract theory models “the conditions of autonomous choice, independence and dialogical reflection,” and therefore “exposes preferences that fail to meet” the conditions of autonomy. Feminist contractarianism may thereby generate new understandings of social contracts grounded in appreciation of material conditions, commitments, and consent (Stark 2007; Welch 2012). Feminist contractarians whose moral theories are influenced by John Rawls’s political philosophy suggest that his methodology, which involves reasoning from behind a veil of ignorance to decide which rules persons are rational to agree to, promotes critical appraisal of preferences that one would not hold in a better world (Richardson 2007, 414). Feminist critics of Rawls have challenged his assumptions that the agents that enter into contractarian agreements are “heads of household”, thus leaving the gendered and intergenerational structure of the family intact and unchallenged (Okin 1989 and 2005a; English 1977) and treating gendered divisions of labor as outside the scope of justice (Kearns 1983; Okin 2005a). Feminist contractarians, then, propose treating gender as part of the veil of ignorance, such that one’s gender identity, and thus place in the gendered division of labor, is amongst the criteria one does not know (Okin 1989).

Feminist critics of contractarianism also raise concerns about adaptive preferences. In the actual, nonideal conditions in which individuals and groups develop, dominant perspectives and oppressive social arrangements can make persons come to prefer things that they would not otherwise prefer, such that the resultant preferences, when satisfied, are not for the agent’s own good, and may even contribute to her group’s oppression (Superson 2012). Feminists who are concerned that not all moral agents can meaningfully consent to contracts point to examples of women who are denied access to the public sphere, the market, education, and information (Held 1987; Pateman 1988). Others point out that traditionally, social contract theory has not attended to the inclusion of the needs of children, disabled community members, or their caregivers (Held 1987; Kittay 1999; Edenberg and Friedman 2013). Feminist critics of contractarianism tend to argue both for full consideration of needs born of differences between bodies and social locations, and against describing gender, embodiment, or dependency as a mere secondary characteristic irrelevant to what a body in need of care requires to flourish and thus what a “reasonable man” would choose behind a veil of ignorance (Nussbaum 2006; Pateman and Mills 2007).

2.4.4 Virtue ethics

Some feminist ethicists contend that virtue ethics, which focuses on living a good life or flourishing, offers the best approach to ensuring that ethical theory correctly represents the conditions permitting vulnerable bodies to flourish in oppressive contexts. Although virtue ethics is most notably associated with Aristotle, whose idealized and masculine agent is not generally considered paradigmatically feminist (Berges 2015, 3–4), feminists and their forerunners have engaged critically for several centuries with questions about which virtues and qualities of character would promote a good life in the context of what we now describe as women’s subordination. Philosophers who argue for feminist ethical virtues raise concerns that sexist oppression presents challenges to the exercise of virtues on the part of women and gender non-conforming people. Robin Dillon observes that feminist virtue ethics “identifies problems for character in contexts of domination and subordination and proposes ways of addressing those problems, and it identifies problems of unreflective theory and proposes power-conscious alternatives” (2017, 381). Because the history of traditional virtue ethics is freighted with past characterizations of virtues as either gendered or as universal but less accessible to women, Dillon proposes what she calls “feminist critical character ethics” as an alternative to feminist virtue ethics (2017, 380). Advocates of feminist virtue ethics and critical character ethics consider the relationships of gender to accounts of character, virtues, vices, and good lives (Baier 1994; Card 1996; Cuomo 1998; Calhoun 1999; Dillon 2017; Snow 2002; Tessman 2005; Green and Mews 2011; Berges 2015; Broad 2015; Harvey 2018).

Like the ethic of care, virtue ethics is often described as offering a theory that is not beholden to abstract and universal principles (Groenhout 2014), but instead acknowledges “that moral reasoning might be an extraordinarily complex phenomenon …, a view on which what the ethical life requires of us cannot be codified or reduced to a single principle or set of principles” (Moody-Adams 1991, 209–210). A further commonality between care and virtue that is of interest to feminists is that “virtue theory, like care ethics, rejects a simplistic dichotomy between reason and emotion, and does not begin from the assumption that all human beings are essentially equal” (Groenhout 2014, 487). Ethical theories of virtue or character tend to appreciate the importance of emotions and interpersonal relationships to a person’s moral development. Some virtue ethics also focus on what opportunities for virtue are available to agents in particular social contexts, which is useful in feminist ethics when it comes to delineating our responsibilities as relational beings and as characters who may exhibit vices resulting from oppression (Bartky 1990; Potter 2001; Bell 2009; Tessman 2009a; Slote 2011; Boryczka 2012).

Indeed, the ethic of care bears so many important similarities to virtue ethics that some authors have argued that a feminist ethic of care just is a form or a subset of virtue ethics (Groenhout 1998; Slote 1998; McLaren 2001; Halwani 2003). Others believe that at a minimum, care and virtue ethics should inform each other and are compatible with each other (Benner 1997; Sander-Staudt 2006). Here, too, however, feminist ethicists disagree. Some contend that lumping together care and virtue might render the complexity of moral experiences and available moral responses less understandable rather than more articulate (Groenhout 2014). Others suggest that this consolidation might overlook important theoretical distinctions, including the capacity for virtue ethics to be gender-neutral while the ethic of care maintains a commitment to embodied, particular, and gendered experiences (Sander-Staudt 2006).

Virtue ethics provides wider opportunities for feminist ethics to attend to virtues such as integrity and courage in oppressive contexts that the ethic of care tends not to prioritize (Davion 1993; Sander-Staudt 2006). Resistance itself may be a “burdened virtue,” which is Lisa Tessman’s term for virtues that allow moral agents, even ones damaged by oppression, to endure and resist oppression, permitting a form of nobility that falls short of eudaimonia (Tessman 2005). Tessman argues that when agents live under conditions of systemic injustice, their opportunities to flourish are blocked and their pursuits may even be hopeless. She suggests that “the burdened virtues include all those traits that make a contribution to human flourishing—if they succeed in doing so at all—only because they enable survival of or resistance to oppression …, while in other ways they detract from their bearer’s well-being, in some cases so deeply that their bearer may be said to lead a wretched life” (Tessman 2005, 95). Feminist ethicists have explored virtues that permit the sort of “conditioned flourishing” that Tessman describes (2009, 14), extending discussion of the virtues to specific applications in nonideal circumstances in which vulnerability is fundamental to the nature of a moral agent (Nussbaum 1986; Card 1996; Walker 2003). For example, feminists have argued for distinctive virtues in contexts such as whistleblowing and organizational resistance (DesAutels 2009), healthcare (Tong 1998), and ecological activism (Cuomo 1998).

Feminist criticisms of the limits of virtue ethics point to its emphasis on the personal as potentially problematic when it comes to “accounting for the possibility of social criticism and resistance on the part of the self who is constituted by the very social relationships and cultural traditions that would be the target of her resistance” (Friedman 1993). Virtue ethics may also include intrusive requirements to self-evaluate one’s every feeling or practice to an extent that an ethic of duty, for example, would not require (Conly 2001). Some care ethicists, most notably Nel Noddings (1984), argue that virtue ethics can be overly self-regarding rather than attentive to the point of view of another, and that it locates moral motivation in rational, abstract, and idealized conceptions of the good life rather than in the natural well-spring of moral motivation that is generated by encounters with particular persons.

2.5 Oppression, sexism, and misogyny

As is evident in the foregoing, feminist criticisms of gendered social orders include the extents to which they are oppressive; that is, they are defined by exertion of unjust forms of power and control over groups and their members on the purported basis of their sex or sexual orientation (Wollstonecraft 1792, Frye 1983, Young 1990, Cudd 2006, Manne 2018). Unjust bases for justifying oppressive treatment are often characterized as sexist in twentieth and twenty-first century feminist ethics, where sexism refers to overly simplistic beliefs or stereotypes about sexes that create and enforce patterns of wrongly differential treatment (Frye 1983) or refers generally to the ideological justification for a gendered social order, including a patriarchal social order (Manne 2018).

Relatedly, some feminist ethicists identify misogyny as a basic moral concern. Whereas oppression tends to refer to forms of morally wrong treatment and sexism tends to refer to unjust beliefs, misogyny has been the term for an attitude of hatred or contempt toward women (Daly 1979, Clack 1999) or a trait of hostile climates for girls and women in which oppression and sexism exist, and the expression of that hostile, patriarchal climate, for example in the form of witting or unwitting punishment of norm violations (Manne 2018), or in the form of culpable evils such as war rape (Card 2014). Misogynoir is Moya Bailey’s term for hostility directed at black women in particular, especially through cultural images and representations (Bailey 2013), and the term has been deployed in feminist moral inquiry on topics including anti-Black police brutality (Spencer 2018), settler-colonialism (Murdock 2020), and sexual injustice (Gilson 2022). Transmisogyny, coined by Julia Serano (2007), refers to the attitude or the expression of ridicule or hostility toward trans women.

The following entries on topics in feminism are relevant to the multiplicity of applications of feminist ethics:

• feminist perspectives on autonomy
• feminist perspectives on class and work
• feminist perspectives on disability
• feminist perspectives on globalization
• feminist perspectives on objectification
• feminist perspectives on power
• feminist perspectives on rape
• feminist perspectives on reproduction and the family
• feminist perspectives on science
• feminist perspectives on sex and gender
• feminist perspectives on sex markets
• feminist perspectives on the body
• feminist perspectives on the self
• feminist perspectives on trans issues

See also the entries in the Related Entries section below.

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• Tong, Rosemarie and Williams, Nancy, “Feminist Ethics”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2019 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/spr2019/entries/feminism-ethics/>. [This was the previous entry on Feminist Ethics in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy — see the version history.]
• Feminist Ethics category, edited by Shay Welch, at PhilPapers.
• Feminist Philosophy Quarterly, edited by Samantha Brennan, Carla Fehr, Alice MacLachlan, and Kathryn Norlock, ISSN 2371-2570.
• Hypatia: A Journal of Feminist Philosophy
• UPDirectory, Directory of Philosophers from Underrepresented Groups in Philosophy, a publication of the American Philosophical Association.

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Acknowledgments

This entry exists thanks to the steady work of Research Assistant Collin Chepeka and the funds of the Kenneth Mark Drain Chair in Ethics at Trent University. Thanks to Noëlle McAfee for helpful comments on a first draft, and thanks to Anita Superson for extensive comments on every section of this entry.