Anomalous Monism

First published Tue Nov 8, 2005; substantive revision Fri May 16, 2025

Anomalous Monism is a theory about the scientific status of psychology, the physical status of mental events, and the relation between these issues developed by Donald Davidson. It claims that psychology cannot be a science like basic physics, in that it cannot in principle yield exceptionless laws for predicting or explaining human thoughts and actions (mental anomalism). It also holds that thoughts and actions must be physical (monism, or token-identity), contradicting the paradigmatic dualist view of Descartes that mental and physical states are entirely different things. Thus, according to Anomalous Monism, psychology cannot be reduced to physics, but must nonetheless share a physical ontology.

While neither of these claims, on its own, is novel, their relation, according to Anomalous Monism, is. It is precisely because there can be no such strict laws governing mental events that those events must be identical to physical events. Most previous identity theories of mind had held that claims concerning the identity of particular mental and physical events (tokens) depended upon the discovery of lawlike relations between mental and physical properties (types). Empirical evidence for psychophysical laws was thus held to be required for particular token-identity claims. Token-identity claims thus depended upon type-identity (see Johnston, 1985, 408–409). Davidson’s monism is dramatically different – it requires no empirical evidence and depends on there being no lawlike relations between mental and physical properties. It in effect justifies the token-identity of mental and physical events through arguing for the impossibility of type-identities between mental and physical properties. (For detailed discussion of how Davidson’s position relates to David Lewis’s argument for type identity (Lewis 1966), see supplement A.2.1. For discussion of philosophical positions related to Davidson’s version of monism, see supplement A.)

The appeal of Anomalous Monism is owed to these striking and novel features, a fairly straightforward argumentative structure, and its attempt to bring together an intuitively acceptable metaphysics (monism) with a sophisticated understanding of the relation between psychological and physical explanatory schemes (anomalism). Its explicit assumptions are each intended, on their own, to be acceptable to positions opposing monism, but, when taken together, to show that monism is in fact required. Anomalous Monism thus maintains the autonomy of the common sense view of persons as agents acting for reasons while nonetheless acknowledging that persons are part of the physical world.

1. The Argument for Anomalous Monism

The basic structure of the argument for Anomalous Monism is as follows. We start with the plausible assumption that some mental events, such as believing that it is raining, are caused by certain physical events, in this case the rain. Similarly, it is assumed that some physical events, such as one’s arm rising, are caused by certain mental events, such as deciding to scratch one’s head. Davidson calls this the Principle of Causal Interaction; we shall call it the interaction principle:

The Interaction Principle: Some mental events causally interact with some physical events

Davidson presents this assumption as obvious and not in need of justification, but we shall see that motivations for it can be found in parts of his writings (§2.2). To this interaction principle is added the requirement that all singular causal interactions are covered by strict laws – laws that state conditions under which an effect will occur, without any exceptions. (for caveats and details, see §3.1). Davidson calls this the Principle of the Nomological Character of Causality; we shall call it the cause-law principle:

The Cause-Law Principle: Events related as cause and effect are covered by strict laws

This cause-law principle was also initially assumed without argument by Davidson, though we shall see below (§3.2) how he later came to try to justify it. Now, the assumptions so far seem to point directly to the existence of strict psychophysical laws – if some particular mental event m1 is caused by some particular physical event p1, then, given the cause-law principle, it seems to follow that there must be a strict law of the form ‘P1M1’. That is, whenever events of kind P1 occur, events of kind M1 must follow. However, Davidson then claims that there can be no such laws. He calls this the Principle of the Anomalism of the Mental, and it holds that mental predicates are not suitable for inclusion in strict laws of any kind; we shall call it the anomalism principle:

The Anomalism Principle: There are no strict laws on the basis of which mental events can predict, explain, or be predicted or explained by other events

Davidson offered loose ruminations concerning rationality and rationalizing explanations, which purportedly constitute the very nature of mental predicates, in support of the anomalism principle (§4). All of this will be discussed in detail below.

One point to note here is that Davidson generally prefers to talk about mental and physical predicates – linguistic terms – as opposed to properties, which are typically thought to be a distinct class of metaphysical entities that invite many questions concerning their existence and nature. But Davidson sometimes talks in terms of properties and concepts, and allows for a loose equivalency between these (see Davidson 1993, fn. 3) except when talking directly about the metaphysics of causation, which he insists is a relation between particular events (see below and §3.1). In the discussion to follow, we shall follow Davidson’s allowance for this loose equivalency, and often speak of mental and physical properties, because this is how much of the secondary literature on Anomalous Monism proceeds. When it is important, the distinction between predicates and properties will be noted.

With the interaction principle, the cause-law principle, and the anomalism principle now in place, we can see that there is a tension in need of resolution. From the interaction and cause-law principles it follows that there must be strict laws covering the interaction between mental and physical events. But the anomalism principle entails that there are no strict psychophysical laws. How can all three principles be held simultaneously?

To resolve the tension, Davidson noted that while the cause-law principle requires that there be strict covering laws, it doesn’t specify the vocabulary in which those laws must be formulated. If particular physical event p1 causes particular mental event m1, and there must be some strict law covering this interaction, but there is no strict law of the form ‘P1M1’, then there must be some other law, ‘?1 → ?2’, which covers the causal relation between p1 and m1. That is, m1 and p1 must instantiate properties suitable for inclusion in strict laws; but since we know from the anomalism principle that M1 is not a property of this kind, m1 must instantiate some other property. Davidson’s ingenious deduction at this point was that this property must be physical, since only the physical sciences hold out the promise of a closed system of strict laws (Davidson 1970, 223–24; on the notion of a closed system, see §5.1 and supplement C.1). Therefore, every causally interacting mental event must be token-identical to some physical event – hence, monism (§5.1):

Monism: Every causally interacting mental event is token-identical to some physical event

In arguing in this way, Davidson relies upon a key distinction between explanation and causation. While explanation is, intuitively, an intensional notion – one sensitive to how events are described – causation is extensional, obtaining between pairs of events independently of how they are described. For example, a bridge’s collapse is explained by the explosion of a bomb. That explosion, let us suppose, was the most newsworthy event of the day. While the most newsworthy event of the day caused the bridge’s collapse, citing the most newsworthy event of the day does not provide an explanation of that collapse. Telling someone that it was the most newsworthy event of the day that explained the bridge’s collapse wouldn’t provide an explanation – it wouldn’t make the bridge’s collapse intelligible to the audience – though it would pick out its actual cause. How the cause is described is relevant to whether an explanation occurs. Causes and effects can be accurately picked out using a variety of expressions, many of which are not explanatory. As we shall see, the distinction between causation and explanation is crucial to Anomalous Monism (§§6.1–6.3; see also related discussion of the intensionality of deterministic relations in supplement B.3.1).

Finally, to alleviate certain concerns about the adequacy of the form of physicalism he was endorsing, Davidson endorsed a dependency relation of supervenience of the mental on the physical, and claimed that it was consistent with Anomalous Monism (Davidson 1970, 214; 1993; 1995a, 266; for further discussion of supervenience, see §5.1, §5.3 and supplement E.3):

Supervenience of the Mental on the Physical: if two events share all of their physical properties, they will share all of their mental properties

In what follows (2–5), each step of this argument will be analyzed and discussed separately, but always with an eye to the overall argument. In 6, a central objection to Anomalous Monism – that it appears unable to account for the causal/explanatory power of mental events and properties – will be explained and discussed. (For discussion of the relationship between Anomalous Monism and two other pillars of Davidson’s philosophy – his rejection of conceptual relativism and commitment to semantic externalism – see supplements B.1 and B.2.)

2. Premise I: The Interaction Principle

The interaction principle states that some mental events causally interact with some physical events. In this section we will look briefly at a number of issues related to this principle: how mental and physical events are demarcated, the nature of events themselves, the scope of the interaction principle, the relationship between mental events and causation, and the use of the interaction principle in establishing one component of mental anomalism – psychological anomalism, according to which there can be no strict, purely psychological laws. Psychological anomalism is to be distinguished from psychophysical anomalism, which holds that there can be no strict psychophysical laws. This latter thesis will be explored in detail in our discussion of the anomalism principle (§4).

2.1 Mental and Physical Events

Davidson restricts the class of mental events with which Anomalous Monism is concerned to that of the propositional attitudes – states and events picked out using psychological verbs (attitudes) such as ‘believes’, ‘desires’, ‘intends’ and others that have propositional contents such as ‘it is raining outside’ (as in ‘John believes that it is raining outside’). Anomalous Monism thus does not address the status of mental events such as pains, tickles and the like – ‘conscious’ or sentient mental events. It is concerned exclusively with sapient mental events – thoughts with propositional content that, according to many philosophers, appear to lack any distinctive ‘feel’.

This way of distinguishing sapient and sentient events can be questioned. We do, after all, have conscious thoughts with propositional contents running through our heads, and consciously thinking that it is raining outside does prima facie seem to be a different sort of experience than consciously thinking that one will be playing squash this evening. While it isn’t obvious that the one thought feels differently than the other, this is nonetheless a problem for the traditional distinction that Davidson is assuming. Further, it brings out a difficulty in Davidson’s picture of the mental generally. On the one hand, he is suspicious about the idea of mental states that lack conceptual content (Davidson 1974a), which is how philosophers have traditionally thought of conscious mental phenomena (for further discussion of this issue, see supplement B.1 and §4.1.3). On the other hand, conscious mental events such as pain are commonly thought to occur in non-rational animals, a position with which Davidson shows some sympathy (Davidson 1985a). Davidson tends to take a radically third-person picture of propositional attitudes, as being what is attributed to others in explanation of their behavior, and this leads him to not pay attention to the first-person experience of conscious propositional thought (for related discussion of this issue, see Moran 1994).

Davidson does express some skepticism about the possibility of formulating a clear and general definition of the class of mental phenomena (Davidson 1970, 211). But for current purposes the class of propositional attitudes will have to suffice as a criterion for the mental phenomena Davidson is focused on, putting to one side the issue of conscious propositional attitudes. One key reason for so limiting the reach of Anomalous Monism, as we shall see (§4.1), is that it is the rational status of the relevant mental events that Davidson usually cites as responsible for mental anomalism. Mental events and states without propositional content – such as pains and tickles – intuitively appear to fall outside of the domain of considerations concerning rationality, and thus outside of the purview of Davidson’s argument, since they lack the logical structure that propositional content has to figure into justifications (for example, John wants to go to law school because he believes that going to law school is required in order to obtain a license to practice law, and he wants to practice law).

Davidson is even less helpful about offering a criterion for the ‘physical’ (Davidson 1970, 211). One half-hearted attempt comes in the statement that

[p]hysical theory promises to provide a comprehensive closed system guaranteed to yield a standardized, unique description of every physical event couched in a vocabulary amenable to law. (Davidson 1970, 224)

This is at best a promissory note about some future language of ‘physics’ – the ‘true’ physics – and it incorporates a requirement of the causal closure of the physical domain that creates problems for certain aspects of Anomalous Monism (see supplement C.1). It is probably best to take a ‘physical’ description simply to be one that occurs in the language of a future science that is similar to what we call ‘physics’ today but with none of its inadequacies. One important component of such descriptions is their capacity to figure in strict laws of nature (see §3.1). Davidson claims that this is non-negotiable for physical terms; indeed, he tends to think of it as definitional for them (Davidson 1970, 221–22); however, see Davidson 1970, 211. For complications that this assumption poses for both monism and mental anomalism within Davidson’s framework, see supplement C.1). However, he sees it is an open question for mental terms, and will be arguing (§4) for a negative answer.

When Davidson first argued for Anomalous Monism he subscribed to a causal criterion of event-individuation, according to which two events are identical if they share all the same causes and effects (Davidson 1969). He much later came to reject that criterion in favor of one according to which events are identical if and only if they occupy the same spatiotemporal region (Davidson 1985b). The difference between these views will not, however, be reflected in our discussion. It does not appear to affect either the derivation or the essential nature of Anomalous Monism. For our purposes, Davidson’s central claims are that what makes an event mental (or physical) is that it has a mental (or physical) description, and the extensionalist thesis that events are concrete entities that can be described in many different ways (‘the flipping of the light switch’, ‘the illuminating of the room’ and ‘the alerting of the burglar that someone is home’ can all pick out the same one event in different terms). (For controversies concerning extensionalism, see §5.2 and supplement B.1.)

The interaction principle states that at least some mental events cause and are caused by physical events (Davidson 1970, 208). This leaves open the possibility of mental events that do not causally interact with physical events. However, given Davidson’s early views about event-individuation (the causal criterion) it is unclear that this possibility can be realized. His later views on event-individuation appear to leave this possibility open, but his general claims about the causal individuation of mental contents and attitudes (see §4.2 and §6.3 below) also stand in some tension with this possibility. In any case, Davidson goes on to say that he in fact believes that all mental events causally interact with physical events (Davidson 1970, 208), but he restricts his argument only to those that actually do. Given the pressures just noted in favor of the inclusive reading of the interaction principle, we shall assume that it applies to all mental events in what follows.

The interaction claim itself should be understood in terms that bring out the all-important extensional understanding of causation for Davidson, as follows: events that have a mental description cause and are caused by events that have a physical description. This formulation brings out his view that events are causally related no matter how they are described, and also leaves open the possibility, which Davidson will subsequently argue for, that mental events in particular must have some non-mental description. At this stage that possibility is left as an open question, but it is important to notice that for it to be an open question we need to at least allow for a distinction between events and the ways in which they are picked out in language.

2.2 Mental Causation

Though this will be focused on separately below (§6), since it raised a fundamental objection to Anomalous Monism, it is also important to recognize that we are beginning with the assumption that mental events cause and are caused by physical events. Many critics of Anomalous Monism have claimed that it is difficult to see how the position avoids epiphenomenalism – the view that mental events are causally/explanatorily impotent – and that Anomalous Monism is therefore unacceptable as an account of the place of the mental in the physical world. Briefly for now, that concern arises because Anomalous Monism appears to assume the casual closure of the physical domain: every physical event must have a physical explanation. This raises the question of why or how mental events can cause physical events, since they seem redundant in light of the required physical causes (see supplement C.1 for complications concerning the status and role of causal closure in the argument for monism). However, since Anomalous Monism is in part based upon the interaction principle, Davidson can claim that if Anomalous Monism is true, then mental events are already known to have a kind of causal efficacy. As we shall see, this point is not by itself sufficient to ward off all epiphenomenalist concerns about Anomalous Monism. But it does serve to remind us of the full framework within which challenges to Anomalous Monism must be assessed, and in particular brings out the reliance of that framework on specific assumptions about causality (see Sections §4.2, §6, and Yalowitz 1998a).

What needs to be noted at this point is that Davidson argued early on for the claim that mental events have causal efficacy, through noting a problem for non-causal accounts of action explanation (Davidson 1963). Mental events and states explain action by making it intelligible – rational – in light of the agent’s beliefs and purposes. The challenge that Davidson raised for non-causal theories of action explanation was to account for the fact that, for any action performed, there may well be a large number of mental events and states true of the agent, and capable of rationalizing the action, but that don’t thereby explain that action. The agent acted because of some specific beliefs and purposes, but other beliefs and purposes of his could just as easily rationalize that action, and thus be cited in its explanation. Was the agent moving his hand as he did because he wanted to swat the fly, relieve a cramp, or wave in greeting? He may well have wanted to achieve all three of these aims, but still only in fact performed the action because of one of these reasons. How do we understand ‘because’ so as to rule out the pretenders? Davidson’s claim was that it is only if we understand ‘because’ as ‘was caused by’ that we can justifiably pick out the genuine explanans – thereby imputing causal potency to mental events. (Given Davidson’s key distinction between causation and explanation, it is worth noting that some, but not all, explanations require a causal foundation. There are forms of explanation that do not require causal backing at all. Logical explanations are one clear example: the relations between the assumptions and the conclusion they justify and therefore explain in a logical proof do not entail a causal relationship between them. Action explanations, however, are different: rationalization, while an explanatory notion, is only necessary but not sufficient for action explanation. For a rationalization to provide an explanation of an action, something more is needed according to Davidson’s argument. His claim is that a causal relation must hold between the reasons and the action they justify in order for that action to be explained by them.)

What exactly does this argument show? It is intended to tell against non-causal theories of action, which deny that reasons explain actions by causing them. There have been sophisticated attempts, on the behalf of non-causal theories of action explanation, to respond to this challenge (von Wright 1971; Wilson 1985; Ginet 1995; for a good overview, see Stoutland 1976; and see related discussion in §6.3.) However, assuming the argument is successful, while it does establish mental efficacy of a kind, it does not by itself establish the interaction principle. Establishing that reasons explain actions by causing them, and that therefore reasons causally interact with actions, does not establish that reasons causally interact with physical events. Dualists who reject the identity of mental and physical events will surely object.

This distinction between action and mere behavior/bodily movement is key to many of the issues raised by Anomalous Monism. According to Davidson, action is (identical to) intentionally described behavior – the movement of a hand through space in a certain way may be an action of waving or swatting or some other action. But it need not be: it may simply be mere bodily behavior – as happens as the result of a muscle twitch or a strong gust of wind, when something happens to the agent rather than being done by her. The behavior must be caused by and rationalized by an agent’s beliefs and desires in order to be an action. However, while this is necessary for action, it is not, according to Davidson, sufficient. The behavior must be caused in the right way by the beliefs and desires that rationalize it. And Davidson is skeptical about the possibility of cashing out what it means to be caused in the right way (Davidson 1973b, 78–9), for reasons relating to mental anomalism (Davidson 1973b, 80; see supplement D.1 for explicit discussion). The key point for now is that because Davidson rejects the possibility of analyzing action in terms of behavior caused in a particular way by reasons, the point made by the ‘because’ argument cannot be used to establish that mental events cause physical events. It does not follow from the fact that reasons must cause actions in order to explain them that reasons must cause behavior or (the interaction principle) that reasons do cause behavior. It does not entail that actions are physical behavior.

This point is important when one considers the wider framework to which the interaction principle contributes. Davidson is attempting to derive monism from it and other principles that are themselves neutral about the metaphysics of mind. His monism (and, as we shall see in §4, his anomalism principle) extends to all intentionally described phenomena: not just propositional attitudes, but actions as well. He therefore cannot assume that action is (identical with) behavior on pain of circularity. Once monism has been established, Davidson will be in a position to deploy the ‘because’ point in order to argue for the claim that mental events are causally efficacious with respect to physical events. How this relates to the wave of epiphenomenalist criticism about Anomalous Monism will be explored in detail below (§6, and see supplement E.1). To summarize, the interaction principle is an unargued assumption in the Davidsonian framework, one that does not assume monism, and the ‘because’ argument, while important for ruling out non-causal theories of action, does not itself establish the interaction principle.

2.3 Psychological Anomalism

Davidson uses the interaction principle to establish directly one part of mental anomalism – psychological anomalism, which denies the possibility of strict, purely psychological laws of the form ‘M1 & M2M3’ (Davidson 1970, 224; 1974b, 243). Since this argument depends only on the interaction principle, and not on further considerations that figure into the argument for psychophysical anomalism (§4), it will be explained here. The argument for psychological anomalism is that if physical events causally impact on mental events, then the mental domain is ‘open’, and any laws in which mental predicates figure will have to take this into account (for related discussion, see the supplement C.1). More generally, physical conditions will always play some role in any plausible psychological generalizations, because physical intervention (e.g., bodily injury) is always a possibility and can prevent the occurrence of the consequent ‘M3’. Thus, the only potentially true and strict laws in which psychological predicates can figure are variants of the psychophysical form ‘P1 & M1 & M2M3’. Psychophysical anomalism, the other component of mental anomalism and the one that denies the possibility of such strict laws, is thus the view that Davidson focuses on establishing.

3. Premise II: The Cause-Law Principle

The cause-law principle states that events related as cause and effect are covered by strict laws. In the earliest formulations of Anomalous Monism, Davidson assumed but did not argue for this principle. His later arguments in support of it will be considered below (§3.2), along with objections to the principle (§3.3). But we need to consider the nature of the requirement contained in this principe, and how it relates to the framework out of which Anomalous Monism is deduced.

3.1 Strict Laws

The nature of the strict laws required by the cause-law principle is as follows. For any causal relationship between particular events e1 and e2, there must be a strict law – one without exceptions – covering those events. Those laws must use a particular vocabulary for describing those particular events as being of a certain type. There therefore must be a law of the form ‘(C1 & D1) → D2’, where ‘C1’ states a set of standing conditions, and ‘D1’ is a description of e1 that is sufficient, given C1, for the occurrence of an event of the kind ‘D2’, which is a description of e2. Traditionally, a strict law has been thought of as one where the condition and event-types specified in the antecedent of the law are such as to guarantee that the condition or event-types specified in the consequent occur – the latter must occur if the former in fact obtain. But indeterministic or probabilistic versions of strict laws are possible as well (Davidson 1970, 219). The point that distinguishes strict laws is not so much the guaranteeing of the effect by satisfaction of the antecedent. Instead, it is the inclusion, in the antecedent, of all conditions and events that can be stated that could possibly prevent the occurrence of the effect. A strict indeterministic law would be one that specified everything required in order for some effect to occur. If the effect does not occur when those conditions obtain, there is nothing else that could be cited in explanation of this failure (other than the brute fact of an indeterministic universe). For reasons of simplicity, we will assume determinism in this discussion, though what is said about strict laws could be carried over without remainder to strict indeterministic laws.

The cause-law principle is aimed, in the first instance, at laws of succession, which cover singular causal relationships between events at distinct times. However, as will become clearer below, mental anomalism also takes in bridge laws that would correlate simultaneous instantiations of mental and physical predicates as well – such as ‘P1M1’, ‘M1P1’, or ‘P1M1’. Indeed, mental anomalism rejects the possibility of any strict law in which mental predicates figure (where those predicates figure essentially, and are not redundant) – including (as we have seen (§2.3)) laws formulated with purely mental predicates (‘(M1 & M2) → M3’), as well as laws with mental predicates in either the antecedent or consequent, such as ‘(M1 & M2) → P1’ and ‘(P1 & P2) → M1’ and mixed variants of these (see §4 and supplement D.1).

The denial of strict laws of these forms is consistent with allowing hedged versions of them which are qualified by a ceteris paribus clause. ‘All things being equal’ or ‘under normal conditions’, such psychological and psychophysical generalizations can, according to Davidson, be justifiably asserted (Davidson 1993, 9; Campbell 2020, 34–35 misses this, claiming that Davidson’s mental anomalism rules out providing causal explanations for general psychological phenomena (“belief that one is pregnant causes cessation of smoking”, Campbell 2020, 33). Such generalizations – surely only ceteris paribus and not strict – are entirely consistent with Davidson’s mental anomalism). As will be discussed below (§4), denying the strict version of these generalizations amounts to denying that the qualifying clause ‘ceteris paribus’ can be fully explicated. That is, ‘ceteris paribus, ((M1 & M2) → P1)’ cannot be transformed into something like ‘(P2 & P3 & M1 & M2 & M3) → P1’ (for a related discussion of this particular issue, see the debate between Schiffer 1991 and Fodor 1991).

(Davidson organizes his discussion of this transformation process, and Anomalous Monism more generally, around a distinction between ‘homonomic’ and ‘heteronomic’ generalizations (Davidson 1970, 219). That distinction is extremely problematic for the purposes of establishing Anomalous Monism, and is set aside here in favor of the related (but by no means identical) distinction between strict and ceteris paribus generalizations. For discussion of the former distinction, see supplement C.2.)

3.2 Justifying the Cause-Law Principle

Davidson argues directly for the cause-law principle – that singular causal relations require strict covering laws – on the basis of claimed conceptual interconnections between the concepts of physical object, events, changes, and law (Davidson 1995a). As he says, “our concept of a physical object is the concept of an object whose changes are governed by laws” (Davidson 1995a, 274). He also appeals to ways in which the concept of change has itself changed over time in support of the principle. Finally, Davidson’s views on dispositions also appears in his thinking concerning that principle. All three sets of considerations face the same problem: they appear to fail to motivate the need for strict laws because they are consistent with only a requirement of ceteris paribus laws for causation. We will discuss them in turn.

Davidson’s first line of argument is as follows: instances of causation involve changes in objects from being one way to being another: the match goes from lacking to having a flame because it is struck on red phosphorus. According to Davidson’s extensionalism about causation (§1), such changes occur independently of how we describe objects in language. He then asks what counts as a genuine change in an object, as opposed to merely describing the object in a way that sounds like a change has occurred when it really hasn’t. We can and have invented ways of describing the world that don’t succeed in capturing the reality of causal goings-on – think of outdated concepts in science such as phlogiston, or the humoral theory of disease dating back to the ancient Greeks. So we need to know which predicates pick out genuine changes as opposed to mere changes in name or description only. Davidson’s idea is that only predicates that figure into laws pick out genuine changes. There are no genuine laws of nature involving phlogiston or humors. Scientific experimentation and investigation has shown this to be the case. They therefore cannot be used to accurately describe the causal goings-on in the world. As Davidson says, “it is just the predicates which are projectible, the predicates that enter into valid inductions, that determine what counts as a change” (Davidson 1995a, 272). Valid inductions from the applications of genuine predicates to particular observations (such as all observed ravens being black) lead to the formulation of true laws of nature (such as all ravens are black). (For more detailed discussion of this argument, see the supplement C.3).

The conclusion Davidson draws from this is that genuine changes resulting from instances of causation are described by predicates suitable for inclusion within valid inductions underlying genuine laws. But how does this relate to the cause-law principle? That principle insists that where there is causal interaction there must be strict laws. But nothing in what has been argued concerning the need for the concept of law to distinguish genuine from non-genuine changes rules out the use of ceteris paribus laws, at least not without further argument that Davidson doesn’t supply. So it is unclear why Davidson would think that it is the notion of a strict law in particular that this line of argument supports.

Davidson’s second argument is that the notion of a change has itself evolved over time. For instance, Newtonian mechanics defines a change differently than Aristotelian physics, so that continuous motion counts as a change, and thus requires an explanation, according to the latter but not the former. Thus, the very notion of ‘change’ is theory dependent, and therefore (Davidson holds) presupposes the notion of ‘law’, in the sense that something counts as a change, and thus as having a cause, only against a background of theoretical principles.

This second point does not appear to deliver the result Davidson is after – establishing that each causal interaction must be covered by a particular strict law. The claim that something is a change, and thus has a cause, only if certain theoretical assumptions are in place is consistent with the claim that those assumptions (for instance, that uniform rectilinear motion does not count as a change) cannot play the explanatory role for specific causal interactions that strict laws are supposed to play. They are simply of too general a nature – they don’t enable predictions or explanations of any particular events. And in any case, once again there appears to be nothing in Davidson’s considerations here that forces the requirement that the covering laws be strict as opposed to ceteris paribus. (As we have already seen (§3.1), Davidson himself has insisted upon the legitimacy and ubiquity of ceteris paribus laws in scientific explanation.)

A third line of argument that Davidson offers (see also §4.2) appears to suggest that dispositional predicates – those defined in terms of the effects they tend to bring about – are not suitable for inclusion in strict laws (generalizations in which they figure are always qualified by a ceteris paribus clause), but there must be strict laws at the bottom, so to speak, of the dispositional vocabulary. Davidson’s discussion of this issue refers back to an older debate about the status of dispositional terms – specifically, whether they are ‘place-holders’ for predicates that are non-dispositional (‘intrinsic’ or ‘manifest’) (see Goodman 1983, 41ff). Whatever one’s view about that issue, it again does not appear that Davidson has provided adequate argument for establishing that strict laws (as opposed to ceteris paribus laws) are required for our dispositional vocabulary to operate as it does. So Davidson does not appear to have provided the cause-law principle with a compelling rationale (for skepticism about the principle, see Anscombe 1971, Cartwright 1983, McDowell 1985, Hornsby 1985 and 1993, and §3.3 below). This is not to say that it is false, or even that it is implausible to assume it in his argument for Anomalous Monism. Many find the principle highly intuitive, and it is worthwhile to explore its relation to the other central claims in Davidson’s framework even if it lacks a convincing foundation. In fact, many of the of key objections to the cause-law principle themselves prove to be unconvincing or problematic. Some of these will be explored briefly in the next section.

3.3 Objections to the Cause-Law Principle

The cause-law principle has come in for a lot of criticism since it received its canonical formulation in Hume’s regularity theory of causation, and it is worth briefly reviewing some of the central objections relevant to Davidson’s own discussions.

Hume’s theory of causation holds that a particular event a caused a particular event b only if whenever A-type events occur, B-type events follow (Hume 1748, section 7; Hume also requires that observers of A-type events come to expect that B-type events will follow, which introduces a psychological component that will be left aside here, since it is irrelevant to the cause-law principle). The regularity between A-type and B-type events captures the cause-law principle’s requirement of strict covering laws for causal relations between particular events. One objection to Hume’s theory is that it does not accurately reflect how we typically think about causation. For example, we confidently believe that the striking of a particular match caused a particular flame while knowing that in fact not all matches that are struck are followed by flames. This point is entirely general – we commonly identify particular cases of causation without believing in the associated generalization between events of those types (indeed, while knowing that such a generalization is false) (see Anscombe 1971). So Hume’s theory appears to be mistaken. However, Davidson’s extensionalism about causality provides a straightforward response to this objection. His view is that while we may not believe in the associated universal generalization, this is consistent with there being some universal generalization, stated in a different vocabulary than that used to initally describe the particular events, which ‘covers’ the particular case. So the cause-law principle is consistent with Hume’s theory once Davidson’s extensionalist point is recognized.

While this response does appear to meet the objection, it raises the following concern, which is behind a related objection to the cause-law principle: no one in fact seems to know any true predictive ‘strict’ laws. Now, while it is certainly consistent with this point that there are or even must be such laws, it becomes more pressing to know why we should think this if we cannot even offer any examples. It is well and good for Davidson to point to the possibility of strict covering laws that transcend our current knowledge, but we need to know why we should believe in such things. Science seems to have done quite well for itself without any apparent use of them. Here Davidson would reply that the cause-law principle is required in order to make sense of the notion of a change in a substance, which is contained in the very idea of causation, as discussed in §3.2. That is, there is a conceptual argument for the requirement of strict laws that doesn’t depend on how science actually proceeds. However, as noted in that discussion, Davidson’s conceptual argument is not entirely convincing.

Another objection to the cause-law principle comes from the state of contemporary physics. According to quantum mechanics, it is not simply difficult or impossible for us to state such laws for quantum phenomena. Rather, quantum theory appears to entail that determinism fails to obtain at the level of microparticles. What the theory and the behavior of such particles tells us is that causation, at least at the level of micro phenomena, is indeterministic. And this indeterminism is claimed to be inconsistent with the requirement of strict laws. This objection to the cause-law principle, then, is that philosophy should never dictate to science on empirical matters. Observation of the world tells us that strict laws are impossible in this domain even while causation is present, in direct contradiction of the cause-law principle.

Now, it is true that, as traditionally construed, strict laws are supposed to guarantee the consequent condition on the basis of the antecedent condition. But they do not need to provide such a guarantee to be strict. As discussed in §3.1, what strict laws require is that the antecedent include all conditions and events that could possibly prevent the occurrence of the consequent. If the consequent does not occur when all these conditions have been accounted for, there is nothing else to be cited in explanation of the non-occurrence other than the sheer brute fact of an indeterministic universe. So indeterministic causation is entirely consistent with the cause-law principle (Davidson 1970, 219). The deterministic/indeterministic and strict/non-strict law distinctions do not map neatly onto each other. An indeterministic law can be universal, exceptionless and true. This point does not appear to be recognized by central proponents of the indeterministic objection to strict laws (see Cartwright 1983).

A final objection to the cause-law principle which is more internal to the wider framework of Anomalous Monism has been put forth in McDowell 1985. McDowell sees a tension between Davidson’s commitment to the cause-law principle and his rejection of ‘the dualism of scheme and content’ (Davidson 1974a). Briefly, the dualism Davidson rejects is the traditional empiricist idea that human thought and experience are the result of our conceptual and cognitive capacities (scheme) being applied to a something entirely non-conceptual – the world, or raw sensory data (content). That idea is fundamental to traditional empiricists like Locke and Hume, which is why Davidson refers to it as a dogma of empiricism. McDowell thinks that this dogma is presupposed in the Humean claim that singular causal relations require strict covering laws that Davidson accepts. McDowell’s interesting idea appears to be that Hume requires laws in order to distinguish between cases of mere temporal succession between two events (event b coming after event a) and genuine casual relations (event b coming about as a result of event a). According to Hume, nothing in our experience of a and b on their own can tell us that a caused b. All we experience is event a occuring, and then event b occuring. It is only if there is a regularity between A-type and B-type events that we can say that this event a caused this event b. Without that regularity, all we can say is that event a merely temporally preceded event b, but that isn’t sufficient for causation. McDowell seems to think of Hume’s picture as committed to singular event relations like mere temporal succession being akin to raw sensory data, and strict laws playing the role of the human conceptualization that is required in order to think of two temporally related events as causally related. McDowell thus thinks that the cause-law principle is inextricably tied to the empiricist dogma that Davidson has rejected. McDowell also doesn’t think that the principle is required, as Davidson thinks, in order to establish monism (for discussion of McDowell’s views on materialism, see the supplement A.3,) And without the need of it to justify materialism, McDowell sees the principle as lacking any independent motivation in Davidson’s framework. For discussion of this issue and others related to scheme-content dualism and Anomalous Monism, see supplement B.1.

4. Premise III: The Anomalism Principle

The anomalism principle states that there are no strict laws on the basis of which mental events can predict, explain, or be predicted or explained by other events. In this section we look at different interpretations of the argument for this principle. Davidson’s own formulations, while suggestive, are notoriously vague and often appeal to very different sorts of considerations, including aspects of language and interpretation, questions about psychological explanation, and the nature of causality and dispositions. We shall be looking at specific interpretations of the argument for the principle offered by commentators, as well as the problems they face in providing a compelling rationale for both the anomalism principle and Anomalous Monism.

While differing in important ways, the various formulations of the argument for mental anomalism, as well as the objections to them, exhibit a discernible pattern: Davidson, as well as his commentators, highlight some feature of mental properties that is claimed to (1) sharply individuate them from physical properties and (2) create a conceptual tension with physical properties that precludes the possibility of strict lawful relations between these properties. According to the objections, however, the highlighted feature of mental properties either does not serve to distinguish them from physical properties or does not actually evidence any conceptual tension with physical properties that rules out lawlike relations. We will consider each interpretation, and its problems, in turn. In a later section (§5.3) we will look at another objection related to the anomalism principle – that it is inconsistent with Davidson’s invocation of the doctrine that mental properties stand in a relation of supervenience to physical properties. For discussion of the relation between the anomalism principle and Davidson’s views about scheme-content dualism and semantic externalism, see supplements B.1 and B.2.

Mental anomalism, as initially formulated by Davidson, holds that there can be no strict laws on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained (Davidson 1970, 208). It thus seemed restricted to ruling out strict laws of succession with mental predicates occurring in the consequent – laws such as ‘P1M1’, ‘(M1 & P1) → M2’, or ‘M1M2’. This denies that the occurrence of particular mental events such as coming to believe or intend something, or intentionally acting in some way, can be explained by appeal to strict covering laws. But as becomes clear, Davidson’s considered position rejects the possibility of any strict laws in which mental predicates figure – and this includes, in particular, simultaneous-instantiation bridge laws of the form ‘P1M1’, which form the basis of type-identity theories of mind, as well as any strict laws with mental antecedents. (See supplement D.1 for discussion of how mental anomalism also rules out analytic solutions to the question of how mental states must cause behavior in the right way in order to count as action.) We have already seen how strict purely psychological laws are ruled out by the interaction principle (§2.3). The focus now is therefore on how Davidson rules out strict psychophysical laws.

It is useful to view Davidson’s attacks against psychophysical laws in light of an argument, in vogue in the 1950s and 1960s, against the claim that reasons are causes of the actions they explain. This argument was referred to as the “Logical Connection Argument” (see Stoutland 1970). According to this argument, reasons cannot be held to explain actions by causing them because (1) causes and effects must be logically distinct from each other (one of Hume’s requirements on causality) but (2) reasons and the actions they explain bear a quasi-logical connection to each other, by virtue of the rationalizing relation between them. That relationship is quasi-logical because not just any reason can explain any action – only those reasons which actually rationalize (make intelligible) an action can explain it. Davidson’s own influential response to this argument was to distinguish between causal relations, which obtain between events no matter how they are described (the extensionalist thesis; see §2.1), and logical relations, which obtain between particular descriptions of events. The Logical Connection Argument fails to recognize this simple distinction between causal relations themselves and how they are described, and so fails to rule out the idea that reasons are causes of the actions they explain. This distinction enabled Davidson to merge two key ideas in his theory of action – that reasons explain by causing, and that they explain by rationalizing (Davidson 1963, 13–17). As we shall see below, however, Davidson accepts the very basic point at the heart of the Logical Connection Argument, and it deeply informs his thinking about mental anomalism – that the rationalizing relationship bears a certain key property (quasi-logical status) that is at odds with the relationship between physically described, causally related events. (Campbell 2020, 34–35, in arguing that Davidson’s response to the Logical Connection Argument is inadequate, fails to register Davidson’s extensionalism about causation. For related discussion of Campbell, see supplement D.8.)

Because of space limitations, the next several sections will provide overviews of the different sorts of arguments that either Davidson or commentators have presented in support of mental anomalism. Each section will conclude with a link to a supplement section containing much more detailed discussion of that section’s content for readers who are interested in deeper understanding.

4.1 The Rationality Arguments

Central to Davidson’s thinking about the basis for mental anomalism is the idea that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription. And key to that idea is the principle of charity, its role in mental ascription, and a related doctrine of the indeterminacy of translation (Davidson 1970, 223; see §4.1.1 below). Rationality is claimed by Davidson to be constitutive of the mental in the sense that something only counts as being a mind – and thus an appropriate object of psychological attributions – if it meets certain rational standards. There are weaker and stronger versions of this idea (Cherniak 1981; see supplement D.2), but Davidson’s guiding thought is that a condition of being able to understand others is that how one does act and think must predominately reflect how one should act and think (see supplement D.8). The key points of contention for our purposes concern how the basic idea of constitutiveness is put to work in understanding the basis for mental anomalism, which will be explored in the next several sections.

The principle of charity states that, in interpreting another, we “try for a theory that finds him consistent, a believer of truths, and a lover of the good (all by our own lights, it goes without saying)” (Davidson 1970, 222). We must, Davidson claims, stand ready to adjust previous such assignments based upon new evidence about the person and how it relates to the overall project of finding him and his behavior intelligible. There are two key points here that for Davidson point towards psychophysical anomalism. First, we never have all possible evidence – we must maintain an openness to better interpretations of previous behavior as new evidence becomes available. Interpretation is always ongoing. And second, ‘better’ interpretations are those made in light of the constitutive ideal of rationality. Consequently, Davidson claims,

there cannot be tight connections between the realms [of the mental and the physical] if each is to retain allegiance to its proper source of evidence. (Davidson 1970, 222)

Davidson never offers any account of what the proper source of evidence for the physical realm is and how it conflicts with mental ascription and its guiding principle of rationality. But the traditional distinction between normative and descriptive concepts is a useful start, and figures in different ways in the interpretations of mental anomalism explored below. When we look to uncover generalizations in the physically described world, what we find to follow from a certain set of physical conditions, at the most fundamental level, is a brute fact. It seems possible that these relations and facts could be different – the physical laws of nature could be different. This is contrasted with mental ascription, where the normative notion of rationality requires some mental states to follow from others, and rules out the possibility of certain other mental sequences, in all possible worlds. Mental states bear conceptual, necessary relations to each other that differentiate them in principle from physical states – this is the point that Davidson accepts from the Logical Connection Argument (§4). This line of thinking is suggestive, but it is in need of considerable tightening. We will discuss different aspects of such considerations concerning rationality offered by Davidson and key commentators in the following four subsections. For a more in-depth discussion of issues raised in this section, see supplements D.2 and D.8.

4.1.1 The Holism and Indeterminacy Arguments

Davidson’s picture of mental ascription as responsive to an ideal of rationality is closely tied to his discussions of holistic and indeterminate aspects to the interpretation of action and speech. Holism holds that mental states can explain behavior only in the context of other mental states, which themselves depend on others “without limit” (Davidson 1970, 217). Davidson links holism to the impossibility of any definitional reduction of mental states to behavior of the kind assumed by behaviorism, and states that this impossibility provides a “hint” as to why mental anomalism is true. Failure of behavioristic reduction would rule out at least one kind of psychophysical law – one relating mental states to non-intentionally described behavior. However, this would leave unexplained what the basis is for rejecting behavioristic reduction itself: why think the holistic appeal to other mental states to explain behavior is “without end”, and that the required mental caveats can’t be fully cashed out in the form of a strict law? It is at best a strong intuition that this is impossible (a “hint”); we need to know why, and holism itself doesn’t provide that (this is acknowledged by Davidson 1995b, 12, noting that all systems of measurement are holistic).

Davidson sometimes seemed to think that the thesis of the indeterminacy of translation (Quine 1960) and interpretation (Davidson 1970, 222; 1979) might provide the connection between holism and mental anomalism. The indeterminacy thesis holds that even assuming the principle of charity, which rules out the possibility of predominant irrationality and non-rationality (see supplement D.8), there are still empirically adequate but non-equivalent complete frameworks for assigning linguistic meanings and mental states to a person on the basis of his behavior, and that there is no fact of the matter that determines that one but not other such frameworks is correct. This thesis might be thought to entail mental anomalism: if all the physical facts are consistent with different psychological/semantic ascriptions to a person, then no one assignment could be exceptionlessly predicted or explained – just as mental anomalism maintains.

There are two problems with this argument. First, the existence of multiple acceptable interpretation schemes can be accommodated by multiple psychophysical laws ‘M2 P1’, ‘M3P1’ etc., each capturing one scheme. More importantly, Davidson himself argues that the least controversial examples of indeterminacy, involving divergent schemes of reference, amounts to mere notational invariance – as he puts it, meaning is what is invariant between empirically adequate translation schemes (Davidson 1977, 225; 1999a, 81). It therefore does not appear that indeterminacy in and of itself is capable of supporting an across-the-board rejection of strict psychophysical laws. And Davidson ultimately acknowledges this, in stating that mental anomalism would hold even if indeterminacy didn’t (Davidson 1970, 222).

For a more in-depth discussion of holism, indeterminacy, and mental anomalism, see supplement D.3.

4.1.2 Normative and Descriptive Principles

Jaegwon Kim (Kim 1985) develops the distinction between normative and descriptive concepts and principles by arguing that if psychophysical laws of the form ‘P1M1’ and ‘P2M2’ are assumed as possible, they would lead to undermining Davidson’s key idea that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription. Kim understands that idea to entail that there are necessary, strict normative psychological laws of the form ‘M1M2’ (more explicitly: ‘(M1 & M3) → M2’). For example, if a person believes p and believes that p entails q, then that person both should believe that q, and also wouldn’t be attributed the first two beliefs without attributing the third. Psychophysical laws would, according to Kim, license substitutions that would lead to a contingent, strict descriptive physical law of the form ‘P1P2’ entailing and so explaining the psychological law ‘M1M2’. But since our conception of physical laws is that they are only contingently true, this would result in the strict normative psychological law being only contingently true because of the contingent nature of what explains it. And this would undermine Davidson’s idea that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription, which depends on such strict normative psychological laws being necessarily true. In order to preserve Davidson’s ideas about rationality, then, strict psychophysical laws must be rejected.

Kim’s argument depends upon two assumptions that appear to be inconsistent with the wider framework within which Davidson develops mental anomalism (for other problems see supplement D.4). First, Kim assumes that the psychological laws that govern mental ascription are strict laws. But this directly conflicts with Davidson’s view (§4) that the only laws in which mental predicates can figure are ceteris paribus and not strict laws. That defines mental anomalism. Kim would respond that mental anomalism applies only to descriptive, predictive psychological and psychophysical laws – not to the normative psychological laws that drive Kim’s argument (Kim 1985, 381, 383). But this raises the second problem: Kim’s normative law isn’t fully normative – it has descriptive entailments. As Kim himself says, one wouldn’t attribute a belief that p and a belief that p entails q to a person unless one also attributed the belief that q. While Kim is rightly reflecting a key part of Davidson’s view here that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription – that how we do think and act predominately is how we should think and act – this spoils the sharp distinction between normative and descriptive laws that Kim’s argument depends on. The psychological law driving Kim’s argument is both descriptive and predictive, and therefore, as Kim himself says, ruled out by mental anomalism.

For a more in-depth discussion of Kim’s argument, which also explores the possibility of using ceteris paribus psychological laws within his reductio strategy, see supplement D.4.

As noted briefly above, principles of rationality are not strict on Davidson’s view. This point comes out particularly clearly in Davidson’s views concerning rational principles governing practical, and not merely, deductive, reasoning (Davidson 1985c). These views inform a very different reading of Davidson’s argument for psychophysical anomalism developed by John McDowell, to which we now turn.

4.1.3 Uncodifiability and Broad Rationality as An Ideal

John McDowell, like Kim, also emphasizes the normative notion of rationality and the difference between the merely brute, contingent relations among physical states and the necessary, conceptual relations between mental states (McDowell 1985, 389). But he appeals to a broader conception of rationality in Davidson’s framework in order to argue that there can’t be strict psychological laws of any kind. This broader conception goes beyond Kim’s focus on merely deductive relations between mental states, to take in principles of practical and theoretical reasoning, such as the principle of continence, which requires one to act on the basis of all available considerations, and the principle of total evidence, which requires one to believe the hypothesis supported by all of one’s evidence (see Davidson 1985c). According to McDowell, those inclined to think that deductive relations can be captured in physical terms (see Loar 1981) will find mental anomalism much more difficult to deny when taking into account this broader conception of rationality.

McDowell’s key idea is that our grasp of rationality can be mistaken about what ideal rationality actually requires in these more complex areas, evidenced by sometimes struggling to understand others (McDowell 1985, 392). And if our grasp of rationality at any particular time falls short of capturing what rationality actually requires, then we cannot formulate true strict laws stating what we ought to think or do. This is what McDowell means by saying that rationality is an ideal, and it entails that rationality is uncodifiable. McDowell claims that uncodifiability in this specific sense – concerning what we ought to think or do – is what underlies mental anomalism. Like Kim, McDowell emphasizes rationality as a normative ideal in contrast to merely contingent descriptive physical laws. Unlike Kim, it is partly because no detailed and fully explicated statement of a rational principle could be claimed to be true that there can be no psychophysical laws.

While McDowell’s argument appears to be influenced by Davidson’s remarks concerning the open-ended nature of interpretation (Davidson 1970, 223; see §4.1), Davidson himself makes no mention of shifting standards of rationality. Davidson’s picture is that revised interpretations result from a stable and statable set of rational standards taking into account new evidence. McDowell’s argument thus goes well beyond Davidson’s own views about rationality, even insisting (due to the gap between ideal rationality and our conception of it) that some rational norms may be empirically discoverable and not a priori (McDowell 1985, 394). This idea appears to be inconsistent with Davidson’s guiding idea that rationality is constitutive, which entails that constitutive rational norms are those that must be attributed to someone as a priori commitments if she is to be ascribed any mental content at all (Davidson 1985c; see supplement D.8). Davidson defends an internalist view of rational norms – they must be reflected in the agent’s actual psychology, in the beliefs, values, and desires that actually motivate the agent to do and think as he does. This idea is central to Davidson’s key claim that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription: what we ought to do and, in particular, think, is predominately what we in fact do and think. McDowell, on the other hand, is articulating an externalist view of rational norms (McDowell 1995), which sees them as binding on the agent – as what he ought to do and think – despite not necessarily being reflected in the agent’s actual psychology. This explains the gap McDowell insists on, but it clearly derives from a very different picture of rationality than Davidson’s.

Finally, it is very unclear how McDowell moves from the idea that rational principles are uncodifiable to the rejection of strict descriptive psychophysical laws (McDowell 1985, 389). Uncodifiability, as McDowell understands it, is a claim about what we ought to do or think. Strict psychophysical laws would state how we will think or act if certain mental and physical conditions obtain. How we in fact do act and think isn’t strictly decided by how we ought to, whether or not this is uncodifiable – we are sometimes irrational and also cognitively limited (see supplement D.8). Uncodifiability in McDowell’s sense thus appears to make no direct contact with the question concerning strict descriptive psychophysical laws.

McDowell is right to emphasize the broader conception of rationality in Davidson’s framework, but ultimately his highly idealized view of it does not appear to provide a secure foundation for mental anomalism given that framework. And McDowell’s emphasis on rationality as a normative ideal leaves him open to some of the same problems that Kim’s account faced (§4.1.2). For a more in-depth discussion of McDowell’s argument, see supplement D.5.

4.1.4 The Context/Complexity Argument

William Child (1993; see also McDowell 1979) argues that mere reflection on the sorts of psychological generalizations that we rely on to understand each other supports mental anomalism. We think of such generalizations as rules of thumb that hold only for the most part, and depend upon detailed contextual supplementation surrounding a particular case in order to yield understanding and explanation. He suggests that the contextual supplementation required is both enormously complex and also not appropriate for inclusion within strict lawful statements. Unlike McDowell’s claims about limitations on our grasp of rationality discussed above (§4.1.3), these considerations, according to Child, explicitly suggest that principles of rationality, in particular those governing practical reasoning not considered by Kim (§4.1.2), are ceteris paribus and not strict.

There are two problems with this argument. First, appeal to complexity does not appear to distinguish such generalizations from physical laws. Reflection on supplemental factors required in order to guarantee that when a match is struck it will produce a flame points towards an enormously complex but nonetheless strict law. There does not appear to be a significantly robust asymmetry between psychological and physical generalizations concerning such required complexity to underwrite mental anomalism but allow for strict physical laws. Second, and related, Child does not provide an explanation for why such factors can be included within a strict physical law but cannot be included within a strict psychological law. It appears to be proposed as merely a brute fact. For a more in-depth discussion of Child’s argument, see supplement D.6.

4.2 The Causal Definition Argument

Although Davidson’s discussions of mental anomalism are primarily connected to issues with rationality, he does offer a line of argument connecting the causal nature of mental states and psychological explanations with mental anomalism. Davidson has emphasized that reasons explain actions by causing them (1963; see §2.2). He also emphasizes that both the contents of mental states (Davidson 1987a, 44) and their psychological verbs (belief vs. desire etc. – Davidson 1987b, 41)) are causally defined. He then argues that causal explanations and causally defined concepts are anomic (Davidson 1987b, 42; see also Davidson 1991, 162 and Davidson 1995b, 4–5). They are anomic because causally defined concepts and causal explanations work by selecting, from the totality of factors that together produce some effect, the one or ones that answer to particular explanatory interests. In the case of mental explanation, that interest is rationalization. Explanation in physics, however, is not interest-relative in this way because it treats all the different factors that together produce the effect as “the” cause (Davidson 1987b, 45).

Davidson repeats these sorts of claims about the anomic nature of causally defined concepts and causal explanations throughout his later writings, but never provides an argument in support of them. And he never brings them into direct contact with his views about rationality as the basis for mental anomalism. It’s possible that Davidson is confusing two different issues: if mental concepts are causally defined, then perhaps they’re anomic; but this leaves open whether we need them to explain behavior, or instead should eliminate them in favor of nomic physical concepts. Rationality may be an answer to this second question: if we want to understand why the agent did or thought what she did, as opposed to have a full sufficient explanation of why her body moved as it did, we need a selective explanation, and rationality is the interest served by such selection (Davidson 1991, 63; see Yalowitz 1998a). Rationality, on this line of thinking, does not account for mental anomalism; but it does speak to the question of mental realism (see further §6.2). For a more in-depth discussion of these issues, see supplement D.7.

5. Monism

So far we have looked at Davidson’s three premises in support of Anomalous Monism – the interaction, cause-law and anomalism principles. In this section, we examine the conclusion that Davidson draws on the basis of these principles – the token-identity theory of mental events, according to which every causally interacting mental event is token-identical to some physical event. We will look at the derivation and nature of this theory, some questions about its adequacy, as well as the additional thesis that mental properties supervene on physical properties. As we shall see, both the token-identity and supervenience claims turn out to be controversial, in their motivation as well as in their consistency with mental anomalism. One key point to keep in mind at this point is that monism is supposed to be derived from the principles and other assumptions that, taken individually, should be acceptable to positions opposing monism.

To begin with, it is worth pointing out that Davidson is concerned only with the ontological status of events, and not substances. Events are changes in substances – things – from being one way (e.g. the candle is white) to being another way (e.g. the candle is yellow). That is, events are changes in the properties of things. Davidson, therefore, is interested in the status of mental and physical properties, such as believing x, desiring y, or being yellow, and not in the things that have these properties. Descartes, however, argued for the claim that mind and body are distinct things. While Descartes’s position has implications for accounts of mental events, the issues concerning event identity and substance identity are distinct (see Latham 2001). Davidson clearly takes himself to be establishing something that is inconsistent with Cartesian dualism about mental and physical things, however, and it is useful briefly to look at how Anomalous Monism bears upon substance dualism.

According to Descartes, mind and body are distinct substances in part because they do not share essential properties in common. In particular, minds cannot occupy a spatial location, while bodies necessarily do. Since mental events thus constitute changes occurring in a nonspatially-located entity, they also do not occupy a spatial region. Bodily events, on the other hand, do occupy spatial locations by virtue of being changes in material substances, which themselves are spatially located. On Descartes’s view, then, particular mental and physical events cannot be token-identical, since they fail to share a crucial property in common without which identity is unintelligible. While Anomalous Monism is not officially concerned with the ontological status of substances, it thus appears to have consequences that are inconsistent with Descartes’s substance dualism – though it doesn’t by itself establish substance monism, it does rule out the Cartesian thought that mental and physical events fail to be identical, and so conflicts with one of the bases for Cartesian substance dualism.

5.1 Token Identity

The structure of Davidson’s derivation of the token-identity of causally interacting mental events with physical events appears to be straightforward: causally interacting mental events (the interaction principle) must instantiate some strict law property (the cause-law principle) but mental properties are not suitable for inclusion in strict laws (the anomalism principle). So mental events must instantiate some other property, which is suitable for such inclusion. Given Davidson’s invocation of the causal closure of the physical domain, according to which every physical event has a physical explanation, he moves rather quickly to the conclusion that this other property must be physical, since closure entails that physical properties have a privileged status, which suggests that they hold out the promise of strict laws. (Davidson also has a tendency simply to identify as ‘physical’ those properties that figure in strict laws (Davidson 1970, 224; 1995a, 266), but this would of course simply beg the question of mental anomalism by definitionally ruling out mental properties from inclusion in strict laws.) Consequently, causally interacting mental events must be token-identical with physical events, ruling out Cartesian as well as other forms of dualism.

There are serious problems with the assumption of causal closure of the physical in Davidson’s framework (for detailed discussion, see supplement C.1). It is difficult, however, to see how Davidson can move from the claim that mental events must instantiate non-mental, strict law properties to the claim that these properties must be physical without assuming closure. Why assume that only ‘physical’ properties are nomic? This raises interesting issues about the nomic status of other special sciences – the relevant ones here being biology and chemistry – but there do not appear to be explicit, conclusive resources in Davidson’s own thinking for addressing this. Yalowitz 1998a has, however, provided an interpretation of Anomalous Monism stressing Davidson’s views on causality and the nomic status of dispositions (see §4.2) in which causal closure is derived from the cause-law principle, token-identity and the anomalism of causally defined properties. On this interpretation, the strict law properties that mental events must instantiate turn out to be physical because only physical properties are non-causally individuated – all special science properties are causally individuated, and all such properties are anomic.

Davidson’s token-identity theory is dramatically different than most previous identity theories of mind, in both its a priori status as well as its stance towards the role of laws in justifying monism. His theory is claimed to be known a priori to be true because it is based upon three premises – the interaction, cause-law, and anomalism principles – each of which is claimed to be known a priori to be true. Most previous theories had argued that claims concerning the identity of particular mental and physical events depended upon the discovery of particular lawlike relations between mental and physical properties. These theories thus held that empirical evidence supporting such laws was required for particular identity claims (see discussion of Lewis's version of such a theory in supplement A.2.1). According to Anomalous Monism, however, it is precisely because there can be no such strict laws (the anomalism principle) that causally interacting mental events must be identical to some physical event. The token-identity thesis thus requires no empirical evidence and depends on there being no such lawlike relations. It in effect justifies the token-identity of mental and physical events through arguing for the impossibility of type-identities between mental and physical properties (Davidson 1970, 209, 212–13; see Johnston 1985).

An important point to recognize in Davidson’s version of token-identity is that he is not simply deriving the conclusion that mental events bear some property that we would intuitively acknowledge as ‘physical’ (such as spatial location). As pointed out in §2.1, the relevant ‘physical’ properties would more likely have to resemble the sorts of properties currently invoked in physics, our most mature science and the one closest to issuing in strict laws. This point has generated numerous objections to Davidson’s token-identity theory, but it also has been overlooked by some objectors (see below). Davidson’s central claim is that what makes a mental event identical to a physical event is that the mental event has a physical description. In Davidson’s original formulation, monism entailed that every mental event can be uniquely singled out using only physical concepts (1970, 215). It is this position that became the target of some Davidson’s critics (§5.2). However, Davidson eventually came to explicitly deny that his monism commits him to the possibility of providing descriptions of mental events or actions in physical terms suitable for strict laws (Davidson 1999d, 639; 1999b, 653–4). He noted that strict laws will say something to the effect that “whenever there is a certain distribution of forces and matter in a field of a certain size at time t, it will be followed by a certain distribution of forces and matter in a field of a certain size at time t′ ” (Davidson 1999d, 639). And he claimed that both the antecedents and consequents of such laws, when covering particular mental events and actions, will cover much larger regions of space than merely the agent or her action. Why? Because while singular causal statements are singular, and therefore select from a complete set of causal factors those that are salient or in line with our particular explanatory interests, strict laws don’t themselves select – “that’s what makes them strict” (Davidson 1999d, 640; see Yalowitz 1998a for an extended discussion of this issue and its bearing on the argument for both mental anomalism as well as monism). Davidson soft-pedals how this view bears on the uniqueness claim in the official statement of Anomalous Monism, parsing away that claim in favor of the blander idea that “some physical description applies to each mental event” (Davidson 1999b, 654). As subtle as it seems, this appears to be a fundamental shift in Davidson’s thinking about monism, though it goes unexplored in his later work and has failed to attract the attention of his critics. Perhaps it could be understood in such a way as to still rule out Cartesian dualism, but it is potentially so weak as to deem as “materialist” the claim that a thought that 2 + 2 = 4 occurs in the Milky Way – which is “some” physical description that applies to a mental event (for related discussion see supplement A.3.1).

In any case, Anomalous Monism thus does not inherit the problem of how to justify specific identifications between mental and physical events, because the claim that there is a physical description for each mental event is established purely a priori (for comparison with Lewis’s view, see supplement A.2.1). And the physical descriptions are not (indeed, cannot be) specifiable in precise and uniquely identifying spatial and temporal terms. As we are about to see (§5.2), each of these points is overlooked by many of Davidson’s critics. That the latter is overlooked is understandable, given its late appearance. However, the former point has always been fundamental, and critics’ failure to appreciate it is curious.

Davidson additionally claims that the relation between the mental and physical properties is not merely haphazard or coincidental. A relationship of supervenience obtains between the two (Davidson 1970, 214; 1973a, 253; 1993; 1995a, 266; for further discussion, see §5.3. Davidson never argues for supervenience. For discussion, see supplement E.3.) A working statement of this relationship is that if two events fail to share a mental property, they will fail to share at least one physical property (Davidson 1995a, 266) – or, equivalently, that if two events share all of their physical properties, they will share all of their mental properties. It is meant to articulate a kind of dependency of the mental on the physical, and correlatively a kind of explanatory primacy to the physical, but without claiming any kind of reductive relation between the mental and the physical. The working statement’s truth depends, it seems, on the thought that the distribution of physical properties somehow explains the distribution of mental properties – failure to share a mental property depends upon/is explained by failure to share at least one physical property. The supervenience relation is usually understood to issue in generalizations of the following kind: ‘P1M1’, ‘P2M1’, etc. (where antecedent and consequent occur at the same time). This allows for the empirical possibility that a number of different physical state kinds underlie the same mental state kind (for more on this, see supplement B.2). However, it also appears to suggest the existence of lawlike relations between physical and mental properties, and so to be in tension with mental anomalism. This issue will be explored in §5.3.

5.2 Objections to Token Identity

The token-identity thesis has been the subject of a number of interesting criticisms. Many of them, however, are difficult to bring fully into contact with Davidson’s own particular version of the thesis, primarily because Davidson’s version is derived a priori from the other premises in his framework. So, for instance, it has been argued that mental events cannot bear the burden of the very precise spatiotemporal location of physical events that they would need to if the former were genuinely identical to the latter (Hornsby 1981; Leder 1985). For example, it would seem arbitrary to identify the deduction of some conclusion from a chain of reasoning with some particular neural event or set of neural events occurring at a very specific time and place in the brain – especially given the micro-precision of the neural framework. Compare attempting to provide a physical description for the action of paying back a debt – how does one determine its spatial and temporal parameters with the precision demanded by the language of physics? Distinguishing between “the” identified physical event, as opposed to its close proximal causes and effects, can seem daunting if not outright nonsensical (Leder 1985; see also di Pinedo 2006). Further, it has been argued that the only possible empirical evidence for specific token-identity claims could be type-identities between either those or other mental and physical properties, because evidence needs to be drawn from variant cases in order to sort out merely coincident from actually identical events, and appeal to variant cases depends upon type-identities (Leder 1985).

Such criticisms become difficult to evaluate given Davidson’s a priori procedure for establishing the token-identity thesis. He can respond that we already know, a priori, that any particular mental event must instantiate some physical property if it causally interacts with any mental or physical event, given the cause-law and anomalism principles. Questions about how this physical property, whatever it is, relates to properties currently invoked in neuroscience come later and are necessarily secondary to this monistic conclusion. And there is no guarantee (indeed, it is quite unlikely) that neuroscientific properties currently in vogue are candidates for strict-law properties. As we have just seen (§5.1), Davidson eventually came to explicitly associate the physical properties that cover mental events with broad descriptions covering large space-time regions. Further, it would confuse epistemology with metaphysics to insist that, because we can only establish which physical property some mental token event instantiates by leaning on some type-correlations between other mental and physical properties, token-identity claims therefore presuppose type-identity. How we discover the particular physical properties is one thing; whether there can be psychophysical laws is quite another, and not settled by the method of discovery.

We also need to keep in mind that Davidson embraces the possibility of substantive mental-physical property correlations (ceteris paribus psychophysical laws), which directly address these epistemological issues. More generally, Davidson’s token-identity claim is that the predicates that come to form the vocabulary of the as-yet unknown strict-law science will be capable of being used to describe mental events. While we cannot judge this claim by appealing to features of current neuroscience, it also seems that it should be possible to adjudicate conceivability concerns. And, putting aside Davidson’s later views, while we are not currently in the business of assigning fine-grained spatiotemporal parameters to mental events, it does not seem obvious that we couldn’t come to accept such assignments on the basis of theoretical considerations without thereby committing ourselves to the existence of type-identities. However, Davidson’s official position, early and late, has always been that we do not need to be capable of making such assignments in order to assert token-identity – there must simply be such true assignments, and this is something we know on the basis of a purely a priori argument. (Davidson 1999b; for further discussion of this issue, see supplement A.3); for a different criticism of token-identity, see supplement A.4). For a criticism based upon Davidson’s own treatment of causal explanation, see Horgan and Tye 1985. For discussion of the criticism that Davidson’s monism is too weak to warrant the label ‘materialism’, see supplement A.3.1).

5.3 Is Supervenience Consistent with Mental Anomalism?

We have seen that Davidson supplements his monism with a claim of supervenience. There are many different conceptions of the supervenience relation (see Kim 1993b), and Davidson ultimately came to identify his own version with what is called “weak” supervenience, (Davidson 1993, fn. 4). Weak supervenience correlates specific mental and physical properties within the actual world, but allows for the possibility that if the past or the laws of nature were different than they in fact are (i.e. in other possible worlds), the very same physical properties might correlate with very different, or even no, mental properties. (It should be noted that Davidson never brought his views on supervenience into contact with his later views, noted above in §5.1, about the broad nature of the physical properties that mental events must instantiate according to Anomalous Monism. It is not at all clear whether or how these views can be combined. In the following discussion of supervenience, this complication will be ignored, and it will be assumed that the physical properties in question are not of this broad nature, since this is how Davidson’s own discussions of supervenience seem to proceed, and certainly what his critics presuppose.)

The puzzling aspect of Davidson’s doctrine of supervenience that arises within the framework of Anomalous Monism is that it appears to entail that there will exist strict laws – supervenience laws (see below) – on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained that were supposed to be ruled out by the anomalism principle. Davidson sometimes claims (Davidson 1995a, 266) that supervenience is actually entailed by Anomalous Monism, in which case it would then appear to follow that Anomalous Monism itself is an inconsistent theory – entailing both that there cannot be any strict psychophysical laws (the anomalism principle) and that there must be such laws (supervenience). But generally his position appears to be that Anomalous Monism is simply consistent with supervenience (Davidson 1993, 7). If supervenience and Anomalous Monism are indeed inconsistent with each other, and the former is rejected, the question of the plausibility of a materialist position with no discernible relation between mental and physical properties arises (see supplement E.3).

Why does supervenience appear to generate strict laws? When Davidson first stated the supervenience claim, he articulated it in the following terms: “there cannot be two events alike in all physical respects but differing in some mental respects” (Davidson 1970, 214)). This formulation appears to entail strict psychophysical laws of the form ‘P1M1’. Davidson later came to focus on the inversion of this formulation: “if two events fail to share a mental property, they will fail to share at least one physical property” (Davidson 1995a, 266). The advantage of this reformulation is that it brings out the fact that the requisite physical differences need not be the same in each case of mental difference (see Davidson 1973a, 253–4). As Davidson says,

although supervenience entails that any change in a mental property p of a particular event e will be accompanied by a change in the physical properties of e, it does not entail that a change in p in other events will be accompanied by an identical change in the physical properties of those other events. Only the latter entailment would conflict with [Anomalous Monism]. (Davidson 1993, 7)

There seem to be two problems here, however. First, the inverted reformulation actually entails the original thesis – that if two events share all physical properties they will share all mental properties – and so once again appears to generate strict psychophysical laws of the form ‘P1M1’. Second, even if the accompanied physical changes can be different, that simply generates more strict psychophysical laws – ‘ P1M1’, ‘P2M1’, and so on. So it is hard to see why Davidson thinks that the second formulation is consistent with the anomalism principle.

Some defenders of Davidson (Child 1992, 224; see also Davidson 1973, 258) have responded to the apparent tension between supervenience and mental anomalism by emphasizing that the degree of detail that would have to go into the formulation of such laws would make them useless for prediction, since it is unlikely that the relevant initial conditions will repeat. But as we have seen (§4.1.4), this seems to be true of any candidate for a strict law – it must take into account all possible interfering conditions, and doing so becomes quite unwieldy for generating predictions. And in any case, such laws would still provide strict explanations of mental events, contrary to Davidson’s own formulation of mental anomalism. So the problem that supervenience ‘laws’ seem to pose for the anomalism principle remains.

Other defenders of Davidson (see Macdonalds 1986) have responded to this problem by arguing that the existence of strict supervenience laws is compatible with mental anomalism so long as we are not actually able to state any such laws and thus be in a position to use them to predict and explain actual mental events – which is certainly the case currently and likely for the foreseeable future. This suggestion deploys a reading of Davidson’s official statement of the anomalism principle – which denies the possibility of strict laws on the basis of which mental events can be explained or predicted – that interprets “can” in a very demanding way, so as to entail “currently”. If no one currently can state true strict supervenience laws, then on this reading no one “canexplain or predict mental events on the basis of such laws, even though they exist in the sense that the metaphysical facts entail them. Thus, such laws are claimed to be compatible with the anomalism principle. But in deploying this demanding reading of the principle, this strategy makes Anomalous Monism into a much weaker position, dependent on the cognitive limitations of human beings. It in effect becomes a contingent epistemological position rather than the necessary metaphysical doctrine it appears to be. Compare an analogous view, epistemic freedom, which holds that we can understand ourselves to choose freely so long as we do not know what the future contains, and thus what we will choose – even if that future, and thus our choice, is actually determined by past facts and the laws of nature (see Kapitan 1986 for one version of this view, and for more general discussion Nelkin 2004). “Understanding ourselves to be free”, according to this view, is consistent with not actually being free, because our choices are in fact determined (for related discussion, see supplement B.3). Similarly, on the Macdonalds’ view, mental anomalism would be consistent with the existence of actual strict psychophysical laws that entail what we do and think. It also makes token-identity an epistemic and not a metaphysical claim: it’s not that mental event tokens are actually identical to physical event tokens, but instead that we can justifiably believe in such identities so long as we are unable to exceptionlessly predict and explain mental events. Neither view seems especially convincing given what is actually in question. Each substitutes an epistemological issue for what fundamentally seems to be a metaphysical issue.

Davidson in one place offers a very different suggestion in response to the problem. He claims that the supervenient relations between mental and physical predicates that he envisages are of a ceteris paribus nature. He accepts the requirement that any satisfactory account of the relation between mental and physical properties must permit appeal to local correlations and dependencies between specific mental and physical properties (Davidson 1993, 9). But he blocks any entailment from this requirement to strict psychophysical laws, suggesting that such ‘correlations’ and ‘dependencies’ are of a ceteris paribus form.

Such a ceteris paribus conception of supervenience has not been discussed in the extensive literature on the topic (its possibility is recognized and endorsed by Kim 1995, 136; however, see Kim 1993, 24–25) and it is unclear whether it can deliver a suitably strong notion of dependency to satisfy materialist intuitions. But it does seem to be an attractive way of reconciling supervenience with mental anomalism so that Anomalous Monism remains a consistent theory.

6. The Epiphenomenalism Objections

It has been widely held that Anomalous Monism cannot avoid epiphenomenalism – the view that mental events lack causal/explanatory powers. At a first approximation, the concern derives from a tension between mental anomalism and the apparently privileged status assigned to physical properties in Davidson’s framework – in particular, that all events are physical, and all physical events have a strict explanation in terms of other physical events. It then becomes an important question what sort of causal/explanatory role mental properties can play when all events already have a physical explanation.

Some welcome this result, holding that mental events explain actions in a sui generis way not accountable for in the terms of typical scientific explanations (see von Wright 1971; Stoutland 1976; Wilson 1985; Ginet 1995; Campbell 1998 and 2005 and related discussion in supplement E.2). Many, however, see this charge as devastating to the prospects of Anomalous Monism’s attempt to occupy a position between reductionist materialism and dualism. Without a distinctive causal role for mental events to play in the explanation of action, many think that they would lack the sort of robust reality needed to compete with reductionism and dualism, each of which, in its own particular way, provides a clear causal role for mental events. On this way of thinking, only causal powers can justify mental realism. So if Anomalous Monism cannot avoid epiphenomenalism, it appears to open the door to eliminative materialism, which holds that mental vocabulary and explanations are vacuous and ought to be thrown out and replaced by neuroscience (assuming, which seems extremely doubtful, that neuroscience can itself supply strict laws – if not, then this line of thought would lead to throwing out all but ‘physical’ strict law properties and explanations).

As noted, the epiphenomenalist worry arises from two points that are absolutely fundamental to Anomalous Monism – first, that mental events are at the same time physical events, and, second, that while mental predicates cannot figure into strict causal laws, physical predicates must. Early critics moved quickly from these points to the epiphenomenalist conclusion that mental properties are causally irrelevant, because there are always strict law properties – physical properties – to causally explain the occurrence of any event. (For detailed discussion of this line of argument, see supplement E.1.) Among many other problems with this line of argument, however, there is the one immediately capitalized on by Davidson: that within the extensionalist metaphysical framework that Anomalous Monism is developed (§2.1 above), properties themselves don’t cause anything, and so can be neither causally relevant nor irrelevant. According the Davidson, only particular events – which instantiate properties – are causal relata. Properties can figure into laws and explanations, but laws and explanations concern how we describe the events that stand in causal relations. (It should be remembered, as noted in section §1, that Davidson prefers to talk about predicates, but allows for a loose equivalency between predictes, concepts, and properties except when the metaphysics of causation is at issue.)

Davidson expresses general skepticism about epiphenomenalist objections to Anomalous Monism that depend on the idea that events cause ‘by virtue’ of the properties they instantiate (Davidson 1993, 6, 13). This is closely connected to his sharp distinction between causation – a metaphysical relation between particular events independently of how they are described – and explanation – which relates events only as they are described in particular ways. But as we will now see, this doesn’t end the concerns about epiphenomenalism. (For related discussion concerning epiphenomenalism and its bearing on the relationship between Anomalous Monism and human freedom, see supplement B.3.2)

One point to note at the start of this discussion is that Davidson’s distinction between causation and explanation is closely tied to his extensionalism about causation (§1), which holds that there are events that stand in causal relations independently of the terms we use to refer to them. This extensionalism enables him to make sense of the idea that reasons cause actions in the following way: Jane waved her hand because she wanted to greet a friend, and this involves Jane’s desire to greet a friend causing her hand to wave, in the sense that there is a causal relationship between an event that instantiates the property desires to greet a friend and an event instantiating the property one’s hand waves, and those two properties stand in an explanatory relationship of rationalization. Epiphenomenalist critics often balk at this analysis, claiming that it is an artificial and unconvincing way of making sense of the commonsense idea that our reasons cause our actions to appeal to metaphysical entities like events that take part in metaphyscial processes such as instantiating properties that stand in rationalizing relations to each other. Some insist that the causal relationship must be between the mental properties in order to make sense of the way we ordinarily think about psychological explanation. But their way of making sense of the idea that reasons cause actions is equally artificial: it says that there is a causal relationship between the property desires to greet a friend and the property one’s hand waves, and that this causal relationship underlies an explanatory relationship of rationalization between them. But appealing to properties themselves, and causal relations between them, is no less artificial and unconvincing. The fact is that philosophical analyses of anything are often artificial in these sorts of ways, because they parse common sense notions (“I waved my hand because I wanted to greet her”) into theoretical philosophical language. Artificiality of analysis is therefore not a convincing objection to Davidson’s view.

6.1 Mental Properties and Explanatory Relevance

Critics of this extensionalist line of defense insisted that related questions remained about Anomalous Monism even taking into account the distinction between causation and explanation. In particular, they questioned whether mental properties could play any genuine explanatory role – whether they had explanatory relevance – given the priority assigned to physical properties in Davidson’s framework. Why think that mental properties explain anything given that the events which instantiate them always also instantiate physical properties that figure in strict causal laws? One key thought here is that genuine explanations require laws, and mental anomalism, in ruling out strict psychological and psychophysical laws, thus cannot account for any explanatory role for mental properties regarding either physical or mental effects.

In response, Davidson makes two points, the first concerning ceteris paribus covering laws and the second concerning supervenience. He notes that while Anomalous Monism rejects the possibility of strict laws in which mental predicates can figure, it allows for ceteris paribus psychological and psychophysical laws (Davidson 1993, 9–12). His point appears to be that if backing by law is sufficient for explanatory relevance, then mental properties are explanatorily relevant because ceteris paribus psychological and psychophysical are not only possible, they actually play a clear role in how commonsense psychology functions, a point that no one denies.

This first point does not get developed by Davidson in any systematic way, though it has been explored by others interested in defending nonreductive monism from epiphenomenalist concerns. Some have focused on exploiting ceteris paribus covering laws for psychophysical causal relations, claiming that this allows mental properties to be sufficient for their effects, thus providing the needed type of explanatory role (McLaughlin 1989; Fodor 1989, 1991). Others have attempted to sidestep the issue of covering laws entirely by appealing directly to the truth of psychological and psychophysical counterfactuals in grounding the explanatory role of mental properties (LePore and Loewer 1987, 1989; Horgan 1989; Campbell 2010, 2020 develops an interventionist variant of this approach based on Woodward 2003).

Davidson’s second point, in response to concerns about the explanatory relevance of mental properties, focuses on supervenience (although as we will see, the possibility of ceteris paribus laws may be relevant to his account). It is worth first noting that both Davidson and his critics often slide between the issues and language of causal relevance and explanatory relevance. Davidson sometimes talks about causal efficacy because he is responding to critics using such language. But given Davidson’s hard commitment to extensionalism about causation, and subsequent rejection of the notion of properties having causal efficacy, one must interpret some of his remarks so that they concern explanatory relevance. This comes out in Davidson’s appeals to the supervenience of mental properties on physical properties in order to ground the explanatory role of mental properties. Davidson says that

properties are causally efficacious if they make a difference to what individual events cause, and supervenience ensures that mental properties do make a difference to what mental events cause. (Davidson 1993, 15)

This is because

if two events differ in their psychological properties, they differ in their physical properties (which we assume to be causally efficacious). If supervenience holds, psychological properties make a difference to the causal relations of an event, for they matter to the physical properties, and the physical properties matter to causal relations. (Davidson 1993, 14)

Sticking for the moment with Davidson’s actual language, the point here is not simply that mental properties inherit or piggyback on the causal powers of the physical properties on which they supervene – which doesn’t by itself establish a causal role for mental properties themselves. Rather, Davidson appears to be claiming that mental properties influence the causal powers of their subvenient physical properties. And since physical properties are assumed by Davidson’s critics to be causally efficacious, this is supposed to establish the causal efficacy of mental properties. But since causation is, unlike supervenience, a temporal relation between events, and because Davidson’s official extensionalist position rejects the very idea of property causation, the notion of influence here must be understood in terms of explanatory relevance: mental properties are explanatorily relevant, on this view, to the physical properties that they supervene on because mental properties somehow explain those subvenient physical properties. And since physical properties are assumed by all parties to be explanatorily relevant because of their primacy, this is supposed to establish the explanatory relevance of mental properties in the physical world.

One problem with Davidson’s claim here is its reversal of the dependency relationship between mental and physical properties that is typically claimed in supervenience relationships. A central rationale for positing supervenience is to mark a kind of explanatory primacy to the subvenient properties (see supplement E.3). And this is reflected in the first part of Davidson’s formulation above – surely a difference in psychological properties entails (requires) a difference in physical properties because the difference in physical properties is needed in order account for the difference in psychological properties. So the sense in which psychological properties “matter” to physical properties is that changing the former amounts to a change in the latter because a change in the latter explains a change in the former. This, however, does not appear to be helpful in establishing the explanatory relevance of mental properties. It gets the cart before the horse, so to speak.

Another problem, discussed above (§5.3), is that it is difficult to see how a supervenience relation of sufficient power to make mental properties explanatory of an event’s physical properties in the way Davidson seems to suggest does not issue in strict laws. Because it is unclear how supervenience is consistent with the anomalism principle, it is also unclear how it can help block epiphenomenalist concerns. We did, however, previously note one potentially worthwhile but unexplored possibility – a ceteris paribus supervenience relation – which Davidson endorses, that may help with this.

6.2 Explanatory Exclusion, Interest-Relativity and the Dual Explananda Strategy

Kim has explored a related but different route from Anomalous Monism to mental epiphenomenalism – the problem of explanatory exclusion (Kim 1989, 44). A causal explanation of an event cites a sufficient condition for that event’s occurrence. This sufficiency seems to exclude the possibility of other independent causes or explanations of that event. So if, as Anomalous Monism entails, physics can provide a sufficient explanation of any particular event, there appears to be no room for an independent and irreducible mental explanation of an event (Davidson 1993, 15). It is because the cause instantiated some particular physical property that the effect (which happens to instantiate a mental property) came about. Any mental properties that the cause instantiates seem superfluous in explaining why the effect occurred – unless those properties are identical or related in some strict lawlike way to the physical properties, something ruled out by the anomalism principle.

Davidson responds by arguing that citing only the physical properties of the cause to provide a sufficient explanation of an action does not address the particular interests that psychological explanations of actions serve – providing the reasons of the agent in light of which she performed the action that she did. Serving these explanatory interests compensates for the fact that such explanations cannot be sharpened into strict laws or folded neatly into physical laws (Davidson 1991, 163). We only understand why the agent waved her hand – why the effect is of the mental kind ‘waving one’s hand’ (as opposed to merely ‘one’s hand going up and down’) – by citing mental properties of the causing event, such as her wanting to greet her friend. The citation of physical properties of the causing event and the associated mere bodily movement will not bring about such understanding, assuming mental anomalism, because of the lack of any reductive relationship between either the physical properties of the cause and the agent’s reasons or the physical properties of the effect and the agent’s action. And those physical properties will not explain why the agent was performing the intentional action of waving her hand. They will not make the action intelligible.

Here we see the interest-relativity of explanation and its bearing on explanatory relevance (see supplement E.1) playing an important role for Davidson. Mental properties must be cited if we want a rational explanation of mental effects. Davidson’s response to epiphenomenalist concerns, and the explanatory exclusion problem posed by Kim, can thus be described as a kind of ‘dual explananda’ theory of the explanatory role of mental properties. According to this theory, for every (causally interacting) mental event there are generally at least two distinct explananda in need of explanation: an event of a certain physical type and an event of a certain mental type. Mental properties are accorded an ineliminable and (given Anomalous Monism) irreducible explanatory role by virtue of their singular capacity to make intelligible the occurrence of other mental properties through the sui generis relation of rationalization. This reflects the point made at the end of §4.2 by the causal definition interpretation of the argument for mental anomalism: that rationality underlies, not mental anomalism, but rather mental realism. (For related discussion of the dual explananda approach, see Macdonalds 1995 and Gibbons 2006.) On this view, to the extent that we believe there are actions and thoughts to be explained at all, we must attribute an explanatory role to mental properties of their causes, since only these provide the sort of explanation – through rationalization – that makes them intelligible to us in the way that we need in order to understand them. Citation of physical properties of the causes just does not provide for such understanding. It can explain the physical properties of the effect (one of the dual explananda) but as a general rule cannot provide illumination or intelligibility of the kind needed for understanding the mental properties of the effect. If you asked someone why she raised her hand and she responded “Because activity in my brain resulted in muscle contractions leading to my hand moving as it did”, you would rightly be mystified and think your question hadn’t been answered. Her response did not make her action intelligible.

It should be noted, however, that there are cases where mental properties do appear to explain physical properties and vice-versa. To deny this would lead to an “outlet” problem, with mental properties being explanatorily insulated from physical properties – something inconsistent with the way in which we ordinarily think of mental-physical interaction, captured in Davidson’s interaction principle (§2) (for discussion of the outlet problem, see Gibbons 2006). A blow to the head can, for instance, sometimes explain the occurrence of a thought popping into one’s head. And a thought can explain the physical behavior of an object, as when my decision to quench my thirst leads to the movement of a glass of water to my lips. However, the blow to the head cannot rationalize the thought – it can’t explain its content, only the fact that an event which happens to have that content occurred. And the decision to drink cannot rationalize the movement of the glass, though it can rationalize the action of moving the glass. The dual explananda strategy is silent concerning such cases, and more work is needed to account for how such cross-level causal explanatory cases can be squared with Kim’s explanatory exclusion principle. (For a critique of Kim’s principle based on a very different conception of causal explanation, see Campbell 2020, 156–157.)

Moreover, scientific research suggests that thoughts are able to explain bodily effects like stress, and perhaps even the cessation of pain and bodily injury – as in the placebo effect (for a fascinating study of such cases summarizing decades of research and experiments, see Langer 2023). And brain injuries and diseases can explain psychiatric phenomena such as hearing voices in one’s head, or delusions such as Capgras syndrome, where one believes that one’s spouse has been replaced by an imposter. (For excellent discussion questioning whether such phenomena can be explained without any appeal to mental properties, see Campbell 2001; Campbell 2009 contains related useful discussion.) More work is needed to see whether the dual explananda strategy can account for such psychological phenomena.

Nonetheless, so long as there are occurrences of mental properties in need of the distinctive kind of explanation provided by rationalization, mental properties occupy an ineliminable explanatory role. And given Anomalous Monism, that role is irreducible. It is worth noting that this dual explananda strategy is consistent with Davidson’s commitment to the causal closure of the physical domain (Crane 1995 seems to miss this point) – every physical event can have a physical explanation, even if the mental component of some physical events can be rationally explained only through appeal to mental components of the causing event. Therefore, however causal closure ultimately enters into Anomalous Monism (see supplement C.1), it does not appear to create any further problems for Anomalous Monism’s ability to account for the ineliminable, irreducible explanatory role of mental properties.

The interest-relativity of causal explanation is thus crucial in Davidson’s grounding of the ineliminable explanatory role of mental properties within the framework of Anomalous Monism. As we have seen (§2.2, §4), Anomalous Monism contends that all mental properties, including mental event-types such as actions, are not reducible to physical-event types. Therefore, the only way to explain actions (as opposed to mere bodily movements) so as to make them intelligible – to meet that explanatory interest – is by appeal to the mental properties of the cause. These properties are the reasons – beliefs, desires, intentions – that we appeal to in everyday psychological explanations. (For discussion of whether, in light of this, reason explanations can still be maintained to be causal explanations within the framework of Anomalous Monism, see supplement E.2.)

6.3 The Causal Constitution of Reasons

A final point to consider in evaluating the epiphenomenalist objections to Anomalous Monism is the way in which causality enters into the constitution of reasons and reasons-explanations according to Davidson. Before we have established the anomalism principle, or go on to derive monism, we already know that reasons explain actions by causing them (the ‘because’ problem discussed in §2.2). And, as we have seen (§4.2), we know that propositional attitudes and mental contents are individuated, and thus defined, partially in terms of what they are caused by and cause (for attitudes, see Davidson 1987b, 41; for contents, see Davidson 1987a, 444, and extended discussion in supplement B.2). But if something cannot even be identified as a reason unless it is a cause, then the charge that mental properties are causally impotent appears to have difficulty gaining traction. And since these claims are known prior to the argument for monism, they are neutral about whatever else reasons must be in order to be causes. So reasons must be recognized as causes prior to the discovery, through Davidson’s argument for monism, that they are also physical events. This appears to secure the causal potency of reasons in a way entirely independent of the claim of token-identity.

This widely unrecognised point can be put this way: before even addressing the quesiton of whether mental events are identical, at either the type or token level, to physical events, we must first know what individuates mental events – what makes an event a mental event. Davidson argues that part of what identifies events as mental is their causal nature. Within Davidson’s framework, reasons can only play the rationalizing and explanatory role that they do by virtue of their causal nature. Davidson only then argues, partly on the basis of this, that mental events are token-identical to physical events, by appeal to the anomalism and cause-law principles. Davidson has therefore entitled himself to the claim that mental events cause and are caused by physical events before the question of how mental properties can be causally efficacious or relevant can even be raised by epiphenomenalist critics. Their concern about the causal potency of mental events is a reaction to the anomalism principle’s rejection of type-identity, and the subsequent derivation of token-identity through the cause-law principle. But this rejection and derivation assumes the causal potency of mental events, as part of what identifies an event as mental in the first place.

Practically all of Anomalous Monism’s epiphenomenalist critics do not address this rich causal background, in particular the role of causation in individuating mental properties. As we have seen, the background is not sufficient by itself to silence all epiphenomenalist concerns. But it does significantly affect how those concerns can be formulated and addressed. Anomalous Monism is clearly deeply committed, at a number of levels, to the causal explanatory relevance of the mental, and so charity suggests that we try to understood it in a way such that these commitments are respected. The dual explananda strategy discussed above (§6.2) provides one promising framework for doing this, while at the same time displaying sensitivity to the sorts of concerns driving the epiphenomenalist objections.

Related to the point that causality enters into the constitution of reasons and reasons-explanations is that, for Davidson, there can be no sharp divide between how one ought to think and act and how one in fact thinks and acts (see §4, §4.1 and supplement D.8). This constitutive conception of rationality complements the causal constitution of reasons: just as something cannot be identified as a reason unless it’s a cause, similarly a thought or action cannot generally be identified as the causal upshot of a reason unless it bears a rational relation to it. The psychological causal order must contain predominately rational patterns. On Davidson’s view, therefore, one cannot neatly cleave apart the space of reasons from the space of causes in order to raise a skeptical question about whether and how those spaces can intersect. That is how most epiphenomenalist critics of Anomalous Monism proceed, and it ignores the frameworks of causation and rationality upon which Anomalous Monism is erected.

7. Conclusion

Despite the initial appearance of simplicity in its assumptions, structure and argumentation, we have turned up several important problems and lacunae that stand in the way of any overall final assessment of the plausibility of Anomalous Monism. While the central objections it has faced have derived from epiphenomenalist concerns, the force of these objections is not clear. Arguably, the most serious difficulties for Anomalous Monism are not with its adequacy but with its justification. We still stand in need of a clear argument for how rationality leads to the anomalism principle; there are the substantial problems surrounding the status of the causal closure of the physical and its bearing on monism; and the cause-law principle’s strictness requirement is still in need of a compelling rationale. Even with these problems, Anomalous Monism continues to provide an extraordinarily rich and useful framework for exploring fundamental issues and problems in the philosophy of mind, and has earned a central and permanent place on the rather short list of genuinely important positions concerning the relation between mental and physical events and properties.

8. List of Supplements

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