Anomalous Monism

4.1 The Rationality Arguments

Central to Davidson’s thinking about the basis for mental anomalism is the idea that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription. And key to that idea is the principle of charity, its role in mental ascription, and a related doctrine of the indeterminacy of translation (Davidson 1970, 223; see §4.1.1 below). Rationality is claimed by Davidson to be constitutive of the mental in the sense that something only counts as being a mind – and thus an appropriate object of psychological attributions – if it meets certain rational standards. There are weaker and stronger versions of this idea (Cherniak 1981; see supplement D.2), but Davidson’s guiding thought is that a condition of being able to understand others is that how one does act and think must predominately reflect how one should act and think (see supplement D.8). The key points of contention for our purposes concern how the basic idea of constitutiveness is put to work in understanding the basis for mental anomalism, which will be explored in the next several sections.

The principle of charity states that, in interpreting another, we “try for a theory that finds him consistent, a believer of truths, and a lover of the good (all by our own lights, it goes without saying)” (Davidson 1970, 222). We must, Davidson claims, stand ready to adjust previous such assignments based upon new evidence about the person and how it relates to the overall project of finding him and his behavior intelligible. There are two key points here that for Davidson point towards psychophysical anomalism. First, we never have all possible evidence – we must maintain an openness to better interpretations of previous behavior as new evidence becomes available. Interpretation is always ongoing. And second, ‘better’ interpretations are those made in light of the constitutive ideal of rationality. Consequently, Davidson claims,

there cannot be tight connections between the realms [of the mental and the physical] if each is to retain allegiance to its proper source of evidence. (Davidson 1970, 222)

Davidson never offers any account of what the proper source of evidence for the physical realm is and how it conflicts with mental ascription and its guiding principle of rationality. But the traditional distinction between normative and descriptive concepts is a useful start, and figures in different ways in the interpretations of mental anomalism explored below. When we look to uncover generalizations in the physically described world, what we find to follow from a certain set of physical conditions, at the most fundamental level, is a brute fact. It seems possible that these relations and facts could be different – the physical laws of nature could be different. This is contrasted with mental ascription, where the normative notion of rationality requires some mental states to follow from others, and rules out the possibility of certain other mental sequences, in all possible worlds. Mental states bear conceptual, necessary relations to each other that differentiate them in principle from physical states – this is the point that Davidson accepts from the Logical Connection Argument (§4). This line of thinking is suggestive, but it is in need of considerable tightening. We will discuss different aspects of such considerations concerning rationality offered by Davidson and key commentators in the following four subsections. For a more in-depth discussion of issues raised in this section, see supplements D.2 and D.8.

4.1.1 The Holism and Indeterminacy Arguments

Davidson’s picture of mental ascription as responsive to an ideal of rationality is closely tied to his discussions of holistic and indeterminate aspects to the interpretation of action and speech. Holism holds that mental states can explain behavior only in the context of other mental states, which themselves depend on others “without limit” (Davidson 1970, 217). Davidson links holism to the impossibility of any definitional reduction of mental states to behavior of the kind assumed by behaviorism, and states that this impossibility provides a “hint” as to why mental anomalism is true. Failure of behavioristic reduction would rule out at least one kind of psychophysical law – one relating mental states to non-intentionally described behavior. However, this would leave unexplained what the basis is for rejecting behavioristic reduction itself: why think the holistic appeal to other mental states to explain behavior is “without end”, and that the required mental caveats can’t be fully cashed out in the form of a strict law? It is at best a strong intuition that this is impossible (a “hint”); we need to know why, and holism itself doesn’t provide that (this is acknowledged by Davidson 1995b, 12, noting that all systems of measurement are holistic).

Davidson sometimes seemed to think that the thesis of the indeterminacy of translation (Quine 1960) and interpretation (Davidson 1970, 222; 1979) might provide the connection between holism and mental anomalism. The indeterminacy thesis holds that even assuming the principle of charity, which rules out the possibility of predominant irrationality and non-rationality (see supplement D.8), there are still empirically adequate but non-equivalent complete frameworks for assigning linguistic meanings and mental states to a person on the basis of his behavior, and that there is no fact of the matter that determines that one but not other such frameworks is correct. This thesis might be thought to entail mental anomalism: if all the physical facts are consistent with different psychological/semantic ascriptions to a person, then no one assignment could be exceptionlessly predicted or explained – just as mental anomalism maintains.

There are two problems with this argument. First, the existence of multiple acceptable interpretation schemes can be accommodated by multiple psychophysical laws ‘M₂ → P₁’, ‘M₃ → P₁’ etc., each capturing one scheme. More importantly, Davidson himself argues that the least controversial examples of indeterminacy, involving divergent schemes of reference, amounts to mere notational invariance – as he puts it, meaning is what is invariant between empirically adequate translation schemes (Davidson 1977, 225; 1999a, 81). It therefore does not appear that indeterminacy in and of itself is capable of supporting an across-the-board rejection of strict psychophysical laws. And Davidson ultimately acknowledges this, in stating that mental anomalism would hold even if indeterminacy didn’t (Davidson 1970, 222).

For a more in-depth discussion of holism, indeterminacy, and mental anomalism, see supplement D.3.

4.1.2 Normative and Descriptive Principles

Jaegwon Kim (Kim 1985) develops the distinction between normative and descriptive concepts and principles by arguing that if psychophysical laws of the form ‘P₁ ↔ M₁’ and ‘P₂ ↔ M₂’ are assumed as possible, they would lead to undermining Davidson’s key idea that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription. Kim understands that idea to entail that there are necessary, strict normative psychological laws of the form ‘M₁ → M₂’ (more explicitly: ‘(M₁ & M₃) → M₂’). For example, if a person believes p and believes that p entails q, then that person both should believe that q, and also wouldn’t be attributed the first two beliefs without attributing the third. Psychophysical laws would, according to Kim, license substitutions that would lead to a contingent, strict descriptive physical law of the form ‘P₁ → P₂’ entailing and so explaining the psychological law ‘M₁ → M₂’. But since our conception of physical laws is that they are only contingently true, this would result in the strict normative psychological law being only contingently true because of the contingent nature of what explains it. And this would undermine Davidson’s idea that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription, which depends on such strict normative psychological laws being necessarily true. In order to preserve Davidson’s ideas about rationality, then, strict psychophysical laws must be rejected.

Kim’s argument depends upon two assumptions that appear to be inconsistent with the wider framework within which Davidson develops mental anomalism (for other problems see supplement D.4). First, Kim assumes that the psychological laws that govern mental ascription are strict laws. But this directly conflicts with Davidson’s view (§4) that the only laws in which mental predicates can figure are ceteris paribus and not strict laws. That defines mental anomalism. Kim would respond that mental anomalism applies only to descriptive, predictive psychological and psychophysical laws – not to the normative psychological laws that drive Kim’s argument (Kim 1985, 381, 383). But this raises the second problem: Kim’s normative law isn’t fully normative – it has descriptive entailments. As Kim himself says, one wouldn’t attribute a belief that p and a belief that p entails q to a person unless one also attributed the belief that q. While Kim is rightly reflecting a key part of Davidson’s view here that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription – that how we do think and act predominately is how we should think and act – this spoils the sharp distinction between normative and descriptive laws that Kim’s argument depends on. The psychological law driving Kim’s argument is both descriptive and predictive, and therefore, as Kim himself says, ruled out by mental anomalism.

For a more in-depth discussion of Kim’s argument, which also explores the possibility of using ceteris paribus psychological laws within his reductio strategy, see supplement D.4.

As noted briefly above, principles of rationality are not strict on Davidson’s view. This point comes out particularly clearly in Davidson’s views concerning rational principles governing practical, and not merely, deductive, reasoning (Davidson 1985c). These views inform a very different reading of Davidson’s argument for psychophysical anomalism developed by John McDowell, to which we now turn.

4.1.3 Uncodifiability and Broad Rationality as An Ideal

John McDowell, like Kim, also emphasizes the normative notion of rationality and the difference between the merely brute, contingent relations among physical states and the necessary, conceptual relations between mental states (McDowell 1985, 389). But he appeals to a broader conception of rationality in Davidson’s framework in order to argue that there can’t be strict psychological laws of any kind. This broader conception goes beyond Kim’s focus on merely deductive relations between mental states, to take in principles of practical and theoretical reasoning, such as the principle of continence, which requires one to act on the basis of all available considerations, and the principle of total evidence, which requires one to believe the hypothesis supported by all of one’s evidence (see Davidson 1985c). According to McDowell, those inclined to think that deductive relations can be captured in physical terms (see Loar 1981) will find mental anomalism much more difficult to deny when taking into account this broader conception of rationality.

McDowell’s key idea is that our grasp of rationality can be mistaken about what ideal rationality actually requires in these more complex areas, evidenced by sometimes struggling to understand others (McDowell 1985, 392). And if our grasp of rationality at any particular time falls short of capturing what rationality actually requires, then we cannot formulate true strict laws stating what we ought to think or do. This is what McDowell means by saying that rationality is an ideal, and it entails that rationality is uncodifiable. McDowell claims that uncodifiability in this specific sense – concerning what we ought to think or do – is what underlies mental anomalism. Like Kim, McDowell emphasizes rationality as a normative ideal in contrast to merely contingent descriptive physical laws. Unlike Kim, it is partly because no detailed and fully explicated statement of a rational principle could be claimed to be true that there can be no psychophysical laws.

While McDowell’s argument appears to be influenced by Davidson’s remarks concerning the open-ended nature of interpretation (Davidson 1970, 223; see §4.1), Davidson himself makes no mention of shifting standards of rationality. Davidson’s picture is that revised interpretations result from a stable and statable set of rational standards taking into account new evidence. McDowell’s argument thus goes well beyond Davidson’s own views about rationality, even insisting (due to the gap between ideal rationality and our conception of it) that some rational norms may be empirically discoverable and not a priori (McDowell 1985, 394). This idea appears to be inconsistent with Davidson’s guiding idea that rationality is constitutive, which entails that constitutive rational norms are those that must be attributed to someone as a priori commitments if she is to be ascribed any mental content at all (Davidson 1985c; see supplement D.8). Davidson defends an internalist view of rational norms – they must be reflected in the agent’s actual psychology, in the beliefs, values, and desires that actually motivate the agent to do and think as he does. This idea is central to Davidson’s key claim that rationality is constitutive of mental ascription: what we ought to do and, in particular, think, is predominately what we in fact do and think. McDowell, on the other hand, is articulating an externalist view of rational norms (McDowell 1995), which sees them as binding on the agent – as what he ought to do and think – despite not necessarily being reflected in the agent’s actual psychology. This explains the gap McDowell insists on, but it clearly derives from a very different picture of rationality than Davidson’s.

Finally, it is very unclear how McDowell moves from the idea that rational principles are uncodifiable to the rejection of strict descriptive psychophysical laws (McDowell 1985, 389). Uncodifiability, as McDowell understands it, is a claim about what we ought to do or think. Strict psychophysical laws would state how we will think or act if certain mental and physical conditions obtain. How we in fact do act and think isn’t strictly decided by how we ought to, whether or not this is uncodifiable – we are sometimes irrational and also cognitively limited (see supplement D.8). Uncodifiability in McDowell’s sense thus appears to make no direct contact with the question concerning strict descriptive psychophysical laws.

McDowell is right to emphasize the broader conception of rationality in Davidson’s framework, but ultimately his highly idealized view of it does not appear to provide a secure foundation for mental anomalism given that framework. And McDowell’s emphasis on rationality as a normative ideal leaves him open to some of the same problems that Kim’s account faced (§4.1.2). For a more in-depth discussion of McDowell’s argument, see supplement D.5.

4.1.4 The Context/Complexity Argument

William Child (1993; see also McDowell 1979) argues that mere reflection on the sorts of psychological generalizations that we rely on to understand each other supports mental anomalism. We think of such generalizations as rules of thumb that hold only for the most part, and depend upon detailed contextual supplementation surrounding a particular case in order to yield understanding and explanation. He suggests that the contextual supplementation required is both enormously complex and also not appropriate for inclusion within strict lawful statements. Unlike McDowell’s claims about limitations on our grasp of rationality discussed above (§4.1.3), these considerations, according to Child, explicitly suggest that principles of rationality, in particular those governing practical reasoning not considered by Kim (§4.1.2), are ceteris paribus and not strict.

There are two problems with this argument. First, appeal to complexity does not appear to distinguish such generalizations from physical laws. Reflection on supplemental factors required in order to guarantee that when a match is struck it will produce a flame points towards an enormously complex but nonetheless strict law. There does not appear to be a significantly robust asymmetry between psychological and physical generalizations concerning such required complexity to underwrite mental anomalism but allow for strict physical laws. Second, and related, Child does not provide an explanation for why such factors can be included within a strict physical law but cannot be included within a strict psychological law. It appears to be proposed as merely a brute fact. For a more in-depth discussion of Child’s argument, see supplement D.6.

4.2 The Causal Definition Argument

Although Davidson’s discussions of mental anomalism are primarily connected to issues with rationality, he does offer a line of argument connecting the causal nature of mental states and psychological explanations with mental anomalism. Davidson has emphasized that reasons explain actions by causing them (1963; see §2.2). He also emphasizes that both the contents of mental states (Davidson 1987a, 44) and their psychological verbs (belief vs. desire etc. – Davidson 1987b, 41)) are causally defined. He then argues that causal explanations and causally defined concepts are anomic (Davidson 1987b, 42; see also Davidson 1991, 162 and Davidson 1995b, 4–5). They are anomic because causally defined concepts and causal explanations work by selecting, from the totality of factors that together produce some effect, the one or ones that answer to particular explanatory interests. In the case of mental explanation, that interest is rationalization. Explanation in physics, however, is not interest-relative in this way because it treats all the different factors that together produce the effect as “the” cause (Davidson 1987b, 45).

Davidson repeats these sorts of claims about the anomic nature of causally defined concepts and causal explanations throughout his later writings, but never provides an argument in support of them. And he never brings them into direct contact with his views about rationality as the basis for mental anomalism. It’s possible that Davidson is confusing two different issues: if mental concepts are causally defined, then perhaps they’re anomic; but this leaves open whether we need them to explain behavior, or instead should eliminate them in favor of nomic physical concepts. Rationality may be an answer to this second question: if we want to understand why the agent did or thought what she did, as opposed to have a full sufficient explanation of why her body moved as it did, we need a selective explanation, and rationality is the interest served by such selection (Davidson 1991, 63; see Yalowitz 1998a). Rationality, on this line of thinking, does not account for mental anomalism; but it does speak to the question of mental realism (see further §6.2). For a more in-depth discussion of these issues, see supplement D.7.

5. Monism

So far we have looked at Davidson’s three premises in support of Anomalous Monism – the interaction, cause-law and anomalism principles. In this section, we examine the conclusion that Davidson draws on the basis of these principles – the token-identity theory of mental events, according to which every causally interacting mental event is token-identical to some physical event. We will look at the derivation and nature of this theory, some questions about its adequacy, as well as the additional thesis that mental properties supervene on physical properties. As we shall see, both the token-identity and supervenience claims turn out to be controversial, in their motivation as well as in their consistency with mental anomalism. One key point to keep in mind at this point is that monism is supposed to be derived from the principles and other assumptions that, taken individually, should be acceptable to positions opposing monism.

To begin with, it is worth pointing out that Davidson is concerned only with the ontological status of events, and not substances. Events are changes in substances – things – from being one way (e.g. the candle is white) to being another way (e.g. the candle is yellow). That is, events are changes in the properties of things. Davidson, therefore, is interested in the status of mental and physical properties, such as believing x, desiring y, or being yellow, and not in the things that have these properties. Descartes, however, argued for the claim that mind and body are distinct things. While Descartes’s position has implications for accounts of mental events, the issues concerning event identity and substance identity are distinct (see Latham 2001). Davidson clearly takes himself to be establishing something that is inconsistent with Cartesian dualism about mental and physical things, however, and it is useful briefly to look at how Anomalous Monism bears upon substance dualism.

According to Descartes, mind and body are distinct substances in part because they do not share essential properties in common. In particular, minds cannot occupy a spatial location, while bodies necessarily do. Since mental events thus constitute changes occurring in a nonspatially-located entity, they also do not occupy a spatial region. Bodily events, on the other hand, do occupy spatial locations by virtue of being changes in material substances, which themselves are spatially located. On Descartes’s view, then, particular mental and physical events cannot be token-identical, since they fail to share a crucial property in common without which identity is unintelligible. While Anomalous Monism is not officially concerned with the ontological status of substances, it thus appears to have consequences that are inconsistent with Descartes’s substance dualism – though it doesn’t by itself establish substance monism, it does rule out the Cartesian thought that mental and physical events fail to be identical, and so conflicts with one of the bases for Cartesian substance dualism.

5.1 Token Identity

The structure of Davidson’s derivation of the token-identity of causally interacting mental events with physical events appears to be straightforward: causally interacting mental events (the interaction principle) must instantiate some strict law property (the cause-law principle) but mental properties are not suitable for inclusion in strict laws (the anomalism principle). So mental events must instantiate some other property, which is suitable for such inclusion. Given Davidson’s invocation of the causal closure of the physical domain, according to which every physical event has a physical explanation, he moves rather quickly to the conclusion that this other property must be physical, since closure entails that physical properties have a privileged status, which suggests that they hold out the promise of strict laws. (Davidson also has a tendency simply to identify as ‘physical’ those properties that figure in strict laws (Davidson 1970, 224; 1995a, 266), but this would of course simply beg the question of mental anomalism by definitionally ruling out mental properties from inclusion in strict laws.) Consequently, causally interacting mental events must be token-identical with physical events, ruling out Cartesian as well as other forms of dualism.

There are serious problems with the assumption of causal closure of the physical in Davidson’s framework (for detailed discussion, see supplement C.1). It is difficult, however, to see how Davidson can move from the claim that mental events must instantiate non-mental, strict law properties to the claim that these properties must be physical without assuming closure. Why assume that only ‘physical’ properties are nomic? This raises interesting issues about the nomic status of other special sciences – the relevant ones here being biology and chemistry – but there do not appear to be explicit, conclusive resources in Davidson’s own thinking for addressing this. Yalowitz 1998a has, however, provided an interpretation of Anomalous Monism stressing Davidson’s views on causality and the nomic status of dispositions (see §4.2) in which causal closure is derived from the cause-law principle, token-identity and the anomalism of causally defined properties. On this interpretation, the strict law properties that mental events must instantiate turn out to be physical because only physical properties are non-causally individuated – all special science properties are causally individuated, and all such properties are anomic.

Davidson’s token-identity theory is dramatically different than most previous identity theories of mind, in both its a priori status as well as its stance towards the role of laws in justifying monism. His theory is claimed to be known a priori to be true because it is based upon three premises – the interaction, cause-law, and anomalism principles – each of which is claimed to be known a priori to be true. Most previous theories had argued that claims concerning the identity of particular mental and physical events depended upon the discovery of particular lawlike relations between mental and physical properties. These theories thus held that empirical evidence supporting such laws was required for particular identity claims (see discussion of Lewis's version of such a theory in supplement A.2.1). According to Anomalous Monism, however, it is precisely because there can be no such strict laws (the anomalism principle) that causally interacting mental events must be identical to some physical event. The token-identity thesis thus requires no empirical evidence and depends on there being no such lawlike relations. It in effect justifies the token-identity of mental and physical events through arguing for the impossibility of type-identities between mental and physical properties (Davidson 1970, 209, 212–13; see Johnston 1985).

An important point to recognize in Davidson’s version of token-identity is that he is not simply deriving the conclusion that mental events bear some property that we would intuitively acknowledge as ‘physical’ (such as spatial location). As pointed out in §2.1, the relevant ‘physical’ properties would more likely have to resemble the sorts of properties currently invoked in physics, our most mature science and the one closest to issuing in strict laws. This point has generated numerous objections to Davidson’s token-identity theory, but it also has been overlooked by some objectors (see below). Davidson’s central claim is that what makes a mental event identical to a physical event is that the mental event has a physical description. In Davidson’s original formulation, monism entailed that every mental event can be uniquely singled out using only physical concepts (1970, 215). It is this position that became the target of some Davidson’s critics (§5.2). However, Davidson eventually came to explicitly deny that his monism commits him to the possibility of providing descriptions of mental events or actions in physical terms suitable for strict laws (Davidson 1999d, 639; 1999b, 653–4). He noted that strict laws will say something to the effect that “whenever there is a certain distribution of forces and matter in a field of a certain size at time t, it will be followed by a certain distribution of forces and matter in a field of a certain size at time t′ ” (Davidson 1999d, 639). And he claimed that both the antecedents and consequents of such laws, when covering particular mental events and actions, will cover much larger regions of space than merely the agent or her action. Why? Because while singular causal statements are singular, and therefore select from a complete set of causal factors those that are salient or in line with our particular explanatory interests, strict laws don’t themselves select – “that’s what makes them strict” (Davidson 1999d, 640; see Yalowitz 1998a for an extended discussion of this issue and its bearing on the argument for both mental anomalism as well as monism). Davidson soft-pedals how this view bears on the uniqueness claim in the official statement of Anomalous Monism, parsing away that claim in favor of the blander idea that “some physical description applies to each mental event” (Davidson 1999b, 654). As subtle as it seems, this appears to be a fundamental shift in Davidson’s thinking about monism, though it goes unexplored in his later work and has failed to attract the attention of his critics. Perhaps it could be understood in such a way as to still rule out Cartesian dualism, but it is potentially so weak as to deem as “materialist” the claim that a thought that 2 + 2 = 4 occurs in the Milky Way – which is “some” physical description that applies to a mental event (for related discussion see supplement A.3.1).

In any case, Anomalous Monism thus does not inherit the problem of how to justify specific identifications between mental and physical events, because the claim that there is a physical description for each mental event is established purely a priori (for comparison with Lewis’s view, see supplement A.2.1). And the physical descriptions are not (indeed, cannot be) specifiable in precise and uniquely identifying spatial and temporal terms. As we are about to see (§5.2), each of these points is overlooked by many of Davidson’s critics. That the latter is overlooked is understandable, given its late appearance. However, the former point has always been fundamental, and critics’ failure to appreciate it is curious.

Davidson additionally claims that the relation between the mental and physical properties is not merely haphazard or coincidental. A relationship of supervenience obtains between the two (Davidson 1970, 214; 1973a, 253; 1993; 1995a, 266; for further discussion, see §5.3. Davidson never argues for supervenience. For discussion, see supplement E.3.) A working statement of this relationship is that if two events fail to share a mental property, they will fail to share at least one physical property (Davidson 1995a, 266) – or, equivalently, that if two events share all of their physical properties, they will share all of their mental properties. It is meant to articulate a kind of dependency of the mental on the physical, and correlatively a kind of explanatory primacy to the physical, but without claiming any kind of reductive relation between the mental and the physical. The working statement’s truth depends, it seems, on the thought that the distribution of physical properties somehow explains the distribution of mental properties – failure to share a mental property depends upon/is explained by failure to share at least one physical property. The supervenience relation is usually understood to issue in generalizations of the following kind: ‘P₁ → M₁’, ‘P₂ → M₁’, etc. (where antecedent and consequent occur at the same time). This allows for the empirical possibility that a number of different physical state kinds underlie the same mental state kind (for more on this, see supplement B.2). However, it also appears to suggest the existence of lawlike relations between physical and mental properties, and so to be in tension with mental anomalism. This issue will be explored in §5.3.

5.2 Objections to Token Identity

The token-identity thesis has been the subject of a number of interesting criticisms. Many of them, however, are difficult to bring fully into contact with Davidson’s own particular version of the thesis, primarily because Davidson’s version is derived a priori from the other premises in his framework. So, for instance, it has been argued that mental events cannot bear the burden of the very precise spatiotemporal location of physical events that they would need to if the former were genuinely identical to the latter (Hornsby 1981; Leder 1985). For example, it would seem arbitrary to identify the deduction of some conclusion from a chain of reasoning with some particular neural event or set of neural events occurring at a very specific time and place in the brain – especially given the micro-precision of the neural framework. Compare attempting to provide a physical description for the action of paying back a debt – how does one determine its spatial and temporal parameters with the precision demanded by the language of physics? Distinguishing between “the” identified physical event, as opposed to its close proximal causes and effects, can seem daunting if not outright nonsensical (Leder 1985; see also di Pinedo 2006). Further, it has been argued that the only possible empirical evidence for specific token-identity claims could be type-identities between either those or other mental and physical properties, because evidence needs to be drawn from variant cases in order to sort out merely coincident from actually identical events, and appeal to variant cases depends upon type-identities (Leder 1985).

Such criticisms become difficult to evaluate given Davidson’s a priori procedure for establishing the token-identity thesis. He can respond that we already know, a priori, that any particular mental event must instantiate some physical property if it causally interacts with any mental or physical event, given the cause-law and anomalism principles. Questions about how this physical property, whatever it is, relates to properties currently invoked in neuroscience come later and are necessarily secondary to this monistic conclusion. And there is no guarantee (indeed, it is quite unlikely) that neuroscientific properties currently in vogue are candidates for strict-law properties. As we have just seen (§5.1), Davidson eventually came to explicitly associate the physical properties that cover mental events with broad descriptions covering large space-time regions. Further, it would confuse epistemology with metaphysics to insist that, because we can only establish which physical property some mental token event instantiates by leaning on some type-correlations between other mental and physical properties, token-identity claims therefore presuppose type-identity. How we discover the particular physical properties is one thing; whether there can be psychophysical laws is quite another, and not settled by the method of discovery.

We also need to keep in mind that Davidson embraces the possibility of substantive mental-physical property correlations (ceteris paribus psychophysical laws), which directly address these epistemological issues. More generally, Davidson’s token-identity claim is that the predicates that come to form the vocabulary of the as-yet unknown strict-law science will be capable of being used to describe mental events. While we cannot judge this claim by appealing to features of current neuroscience, it also seems that it should be possible to adjudicate conceivability concerns. And, putting aside Davidson’s later views, while we are not currently in the business of assigning fine-grained spatiotemporal parameters to mental events, it does not seem obvious that we couldn’t come to accept such assignments on the basis of theoretical considerations without thereby committing ourselves to the existence of type-identities. However, Davidson’s official position, early and late, has always been that we do not need to be capable of making such assignments in order to assert token-identity – there must simply be such true assignments, and this is something we know on the basis of a purely a priori argument. (Davidson 1999b; for further discussion of this issue, see supplement A.3); for a different criticism of token-identity, see supplement A.4). For a criticism based upon Davidson’s own treatment of causal explanation, see Horgan and Tye 1985. For discussion of the criticism that Davidson’s monism is too weak to warrant the label ‘materialism’, see supplement A.3.1).

5.3 Is Supervenience Consistent with Mental Anomalism?

We have seen that Davidson supplements his monism with a claim of supervenience. There are many different conceptions of the supervenience relation (see Kim 1993b), and Davidson ultimately came to identify his own version with what is called “weak” supervenience, (Davidson 1993, fn. 4). Weak supervenience correlates specific mental and physical properties within the actual world, but allows for the possibility that if the past or the laws of nature were different than they in fact are (i.e. in other possible worlds), the very same physical properties might correlate with very different, or even no, mental properties. (It should be noted that Davidson never brought his views on supervenience into contact with his later views, noted above in §5.1, about the broad nature of the physical properties that mental events must instantiate according to Anomalous Monism. It is not at all clear whether or how these views can be combined. In the following discussion of supervenience, this complication will be ignored, and it will be assumed that the physical properties in question are not of this broad nature, since this is how Davidson’s own discussions of supervenience seem to proceed, and certainly what his critics presuppose.)

The puzzling aspect of Davidson’s doctrine of supervenience that arises within the framework of Anomalous Monism is that it appears to entail that there will exist strict laws – supervenience laws (see below) – on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained that were supposed to be ruled out by the anomalism principle. Davidson sometimes claims (Davidson 1995a, 266) that supervenience is actually entailed by Anomalous Monism, in which case it would then appear to follow that Anomalous Monism itself is an inconsistent theory – entailing both that there cannot be any strict psychophysical laws (the anomalism principle) and that there must be such laws (supervenience). But generally his position appears to be that Anomalous Monism is simply consistent with supervenience (Davidson 1993, 7). If supervenience and Anomalous Monism are indeed inconsistent with each other, and the former is rejected, the question of the plausibility of a materialist position with no discernible relation between mental and physical properties arises (see supplement E.3).

Why does supervenience appear to generate strict laws? When Davidson first stated the supervenience claim, he articulated it in the following terms: “there cannot be two events alike in all physical respects but differing in some mental respects” (Davidson 1970, 214)). This formulation appears to entail strict psychophysical laws of the form ‘P₁ → M₁’. Davidson later came to focus on the inversion of this formulation: “if two events fail to share a mental property, they will fail to share at least one physical property” (Davidson 1995a, 266). The advantage of this reformulation is that it brings out the fact that the requisite physical differences need not be the same in each case of mental difference (see Davidson 1973a, 253–4). As Davidson says,

although supervenience entails that any change in a mental property p of a particular event e will be accompanied by a change in the physical properties of e, it does not entail that a change in p in other events will be accompanied by an identical change in the physical properties of those other events. Only the latter entailment would conflict with [Anomalous Monism]. (Davidson 1993, 7)

There seem to be two problems here, however. First, the inverted reformulation actually entails the original thesis – that if two events share all physical properties they will share all mental properties – and so once again appears to generate strict psychophysical laws of the form ‘P₁ → M₁’. Second, even if the accompanied physical changes can be different, that simply generates more strict psychophysical laws – ‘ P₁ → M₁’, ‘P₂ → M₁’, and so on. So it is hard to see why Davidson thinks that the second formulation is consistent with the anomalism principle.

Some defenders of Davidson (Child 1992, 224; see also Davidson 1973, 258) have responded to the apparent tension between supervenience and mental anomalism by emphasizing that the degree of detail that would have to go into the formulation of such laws would make them useless for prediction, since it is unlikely that the relevant initial conditions will repeat. But as we have seen (§4.1.4), this seems to be true of any candidate for a strict law – it must take into account all possible interfering conditions, and doing so becomes quite unwieldy for generating predictions. And in any case, such laws would still provide strict explanations of mental events, contrary to Davidson’s own formulation of mental anomalism. So the problem that supervenience ‘laws’ seem to pose for the anomalism principle remains.

Other defenders of Davidson (see Macdonalds 1986) have responded to this problem by arguing that the existence of strict supervenience laws is compatible with mental anomalism so long as we are not actually able to state any such laws and thus be in a position to use them to predict and explain actual mental events – which is certainly the case currently and likely for the foreseeable future. This suggestion deploys a reading of Davidson’s official statement of the anomalism principle – which denies the possibility of strict laws on the basis of which mental events can be explained or predicted – that interprets “can” in a very demanding way, so as to entail “currently”. If no one currently can state true strict supervenience laws, then on this reading no one “can” explain or predict mental events on the basis of such laws, even though they exist in the sense that the metaphysical facts entail them. Thus, such laws are claimed to be compatible with the anomalism principle. But in deploying this demanding reading of the principle, this strategy makes Anomalous Monism into a much weaker position, dependent on the cognitive limitations of human beings. It in effect becomes a contingent epistemological position rather than the necessary metaphysical doctrine it appears to be. Compare an analogous view, epistemic freedom, which holds that we can understand ourselves to choose freely so long as we do not know what the future contains, and thus what we will choose – even if that future, and thus our choice, is actually determined by past facts and the laws of nature (see Kapitan 1986 for one version of this view, and for more general discussion Nelkin 2004). “Understanding ourselves to be free”, according to this view, is consistent with not actually being free, because our choices are in fact determined (for related discussion, see supplement B.3). Similarly, on the Macdonalds’ view, mental anomalism would be consistent with the existence of actual strict psychophysical laws that entail what we do and think. It also makes token-identity an epistemic and not a metaphysical claim: it’s not that mental event tokens are actually identical to physical event tokens, but instead that we can justifiably believe in such identities so long as we are unable to exceptionlessly predict and explain mental events. Neither view seems especially convincing given what is actually in question. Each substitutes an epistemological issue for what fundamentally seems to be a metaphysical issue.

Davidson in one place offers a very different suggestion in response to the problem. He claims that the supervenient relations between mental and physical predicates that he envisages are of a ceteris paribus nature. He accepts the requirement that any satisfactory account of the relation between mental and physical properties must permit appeal to local correlations and dependencies between specific mental and physical properties (Davidson 1993, 9). But he blocks any entailment from this requirement to strict psychophysical laws, suggesting that such ‘correlations’ and ‘dependencies’ are of a ceteris paribus form.

Such a ceteris paribus conception of supervenience has not been discussed in the extensive literature on the topic (its possibility is recognized and endorsed by Kim 1995, 136; however, see Kim 1993, 24–25) and it is unclear whether it can deliver a suitably strong notion of dependency to satisfy materialist intuitions. But it does seem to be an attractive way of reconciling supervenience with mental anomalism so that Anomalous Monism remains a consistent theory.

6. The Epiphenomenalism Objections

It has been widely held that Anomalous Monism cannot avoid epiphenomenalism – the view that mental events lack causal/explanatory powers. At a first approximation, the concern derives from a tension between mental anomalism and the apparently privileged status assigned to physical properties in Davidson’s framework – in particular, that all events are physical, and all physical events have a strict explanation in terms of other physical events. It then becomes an important question what sort of causal/explanatory role mental properties can play when all events already have a physical explanation.

Some welcome this result, holding that mental events explain actions in a sui generis way not accountable for in the terms of typical scientific explanations (see von Wright 1971; Stoutland 1976; Wilson 1985; Ginet 1995; Campbell 1998 and 2005 and related discussion in supplement E.2). Many, however, see this charge as devastating to the prospects of Anomalous Monism’s attempt to occupy a position between reductionist materialism and dualism. Without a distinctive causal role for mental events to play in the explanation of action, many think that they would lack the sort of robust reality needed to compete with reductionism and dualism, each of which, in its own particular way, provides a clear causal role for mental events. On this way of thinking, only causal powers can justify mental realism. So if Anomalous Monism cannot avoid epiphenomenalism, it appears to open the door to eliminative materialism, which holds that mental vocabulary and explanations are vacuous and ought to be thrown out and replaced by neuroscience (assuming, which seems extremely doubtful, that neuroscience can itself supply strict laws – if not, then this line of thought would lead to throwing out all but ‘physical’ strict law properties and explanations).

As noted, the epiphenomenalist worry arises from two points that are absolutely fundamental to Anomalous Monism – first, that mental events are at the same time physical events, and, second, that while mental predicates cannot figure into strict causal laws, physical predicates must. Early critics moved quickly from these points to the epiphenomenalist conclusion that mental properties are causally irrelevant, because there are always strict law properties – physical properties – to causally explain the occurrence of any event. (For detailed discussion of this line of argument, see supplement E.1.) Among many other problems with this line of argument, however, there is the one immediately capitalized on by Davidson: that within the extensionalist metaphysical framework that Anomalous Monism is developed (§2.1 above), properties themselves don’t cause anything, and so can be neither causally relevant nor irrelevant. According the Davidson, only particular events – which instantiate properties – are causal relata. Properties can figure into laws and explanations, but laws and explanations concern how we describe the events that stand in causal relations. (It should be remembered, as noted in section §1, that Davidson prefers to talk about predicates, but allows for a loose equivalency between predictes, concepts, and properties except when the metaphysics of causation is at issue.)

Davidson expresses general skepticism about epiphenomenalist objections to Anomalous Monism that depend on the idea that events cause ‘by virtue’ of the properties they instantiate (Davidson 1993, 6, 13). This is closely connected to his sharp distinction between causation – a metaphysical relation between particular events independently of how they are described – and explanation – which relates events only as they are described in particular ways. But as we will now see, this doesn’t end the concerns about epiphenomenalism. (For related discussion concerning epiphenomenalism and its bearing on the relationship between Anomalous Monism and human freedom, see supplement B.3.2)

One point to note at the start of this discussion is that Davidson’s distinction between causation and explanation is closely tied to his extensionalism about causation (§1), which holds that there are events that stand in causal relations independently of the terms we use to refer to them. This extensionalism enables him to make sense of the idea that reasons cause actions in the following way: Jane waved her hand because she wanted to greet a friend, and this involves Jane’s desire to greet a friend causing her hand to wave, in the sense that there is a causal relationship between an event that instantiates the property desires to greet a friend and an event instantiating the property one’s hand waves, and those two properties stand in an explanatory relationship of rationalization. Epiphenomenalist critics often balk at this analysis, claiming that it is an artificial and unconvincing way of making sense of the commonsense idea that our reasons cause our actions to appeal to metaphysical entities like events that take part in metaphyscial processes such as instantiating properties that stand in rationalizing relations to each other. Some insist that the causal relationship must be between the mental properties in order to make sense of the way we ordinarily think about psychological explanation. But their way of making sense of the idea that reasons cause actions is equally artificial: it says that there is a causal relationship between the property desires to greet a friend and the property one’s hand waves, and that this causal relationship underlies an explanatory relationship of rationalization between them. But appealing to properties themselves, and causal relations between them, is no less artificial and unconvincing. The fact is that philosophical analyses of anything are often artificial in these sorts of ways, because they parse common sense notions (“I waved my hand because I wanted to greet her”) into theoretical philosophical language. Artificiality of analysis is therefore not a convincing objection to Davidson’s view.

6.1 Mental Properties and Explanatory Relevance

Critics of this extensionalist line of defense insisted that related questions remained about Anomalous Monism even taking into account the distinction between causation and explanation. In particular, they questioned whether mental properties could play any genuine explanatory role – whether they had explanatory relevance – given the priority assigned to physical properties in Davidson’s framework. Why think that mental properties explain anything given that the events which instantiate them always also instantiate physical properties that figure in strict causal laws? One key thought here is that genuine explanations require laws, and mental anomalism, in ruling out strict psychological and psychophysical laws, thus cannot account for any explanatory role for mental properties regarding either physical or mental effects.

In response, Davidson makes two points, the first concerning ceteris paribus covering laws and the second concerning supervenience. He notes that while Anomalous Monism rejects the possibility of strict laws in which mental predicates can figure, it allows for ceteris paribus psychological and psychophysical laws (Davidson 1993, 9–12). His point appears to be that if backing by law is sufficient for explanatory relevance, then mental properties are explanatorily relevant because ceteris paribus psychological and psychophysical are not only possible, they actually play a clear role in how commonsense psychology functions, a point that no one denies.

This first point does not get developed by Davidson in any systematic way, though it has been explored by others interested in defending nonreductive monism from epiphenomenalist concerns. Some have focused on exploiting ceteris paribus covering laws for psychophysical causal relations, claiming that this allows mental properties to be sufficient for their effects, thus providing the needed type of explanatory role (McLaughlin 1989; Fodor 1989, 1991). Others have attempted to sidestep the issue of covering laws entirely by appealing directly to the truth of psychological and psychophysical counterfactuals in grounding the explanatory role of mental properties (LePore and Loewer 1987, 1989; Horgan 1989; Campbell 2010, 2020 develops an interventionist variant of this approach based on Woodward 2003).

Davidson’s second point, in response to concerns about the explanatory relevance of mental properties, focuses on supervenience (although as we will see, the possibility of ceteris paribus laws may be relevant to his account). It is worth first noting that both Davidson and his critics often slide between the issues and language of causal relevance and explanatory relevance. Davidson sometimes talks about causal efficacy because he is responding to critics using such language. But given Davidson’s hard commitment to extensionalism about causation, and subsequent rejection of the notion of properties having causal efficacy, one must interpret some of his remarks so that they concern explanatory relevance. This comes out in Davidson’s appeals to the supervenience of mental properties on physical properties in order to ground the explanatory role of mental properties. Davidson says that

properties are causally efficacious if they make a difference to what individual events cause, and supervenience ensures that mental properties do make a difference to what mental events cause. (Davidson 1993, 15)

This is because

if two events differ in their psychological properties, they differ in their physical properties (which we assume to be causally efficacious). If supervenience holds, psychological properties make a difference to the causal relations of an event, for they matter to the physical properties, and the physical properties matter to causal relations. (Davidson 1993, 14)

Sticking for the moment with Davidson’s actual language, the point here is not simply that mental properties inherit or piggyback on the causal powers of the physical properties on which they supervene – which doesn’t by itself establish a causal role for mental properties themselves. Rather, Davidson appears to be claiming that mental properties influence the causal powers of their subvenient physical properties. And since physical properties are assumed by Davidson’s critics to be causally efficacious, this is supposed to establish the causal efficacy of mental properties. But since causation is, unlike supervenience, a temporal relation between events, and because Davidson’s official extensionalist position rejects the very idea of property causation, the notion of influence here must be understood in terms of explanatory relevance: mental properties are explanatorily relevant, on this view, to the physical properties that they supervene on because mental properties somehow explain those subvenient physical properties. And since physical properties are assumed by all parties to be explanatorily relevant because of their primacy, this is supposed to establish the explanatory relevance of mental properties in the physical world.

One problem with Davidson’s claim here is its reversal of the dependency relationship between mental and physical properties that is typically claimed in supervenience relationships. A central rationale for positing supervenience is to mark a kind of explanatory primacy to the subvenient properties (see supplement E.3). And this is reflected in the first part of Davidson’s formulation above – surely a difference in psychological properties entails (requires) a difference in physical properties because the difference in physical properties is needed in order account for the difference in psychological properties. So the sense in which psychological properties “matter” to physical properties is that changing the former amounts to a change in the latter because a change in the latter explains a change in the former. This, however, does not appear to be helpful in establishing the explanatory relevance of mental properties. It gets the cart before the horse, so to speak.

Another problem, discussed above (§5.3), is that it is difficult to see how a supervenience relation of sufficient power to make mental properties explanatory of an event’s physical properties in the way Davidson seems to suggest does not issue in strict laws. Because it is unclear how supervenience is consistent with the anomalism principle, it is also unclear how it can help block epiphenomenalist concerns. We did, however, previously note one potentially worthwhile but unexplored possibility – a ceteris paribus supervenience relation – which Davidson endorses, that may help with this.

6.2 Explanatory Exclusion, Interest-Relativity and the Dual Explananda Strategy

Kim has explored a related but different route from Anomalous Monism to mental epiphenomenalism – the problem of explanatory exclusion (Kim 1989, 44). A causal explanation of an event cites a sufficient condition for that event’s occurrence. This sufficiency seems to exclude the possibility of other independent causes or explanations of that event. So if, as Anomalous Monism entails, physics can provide a sufficient explanation of any particular event, there appears to be no room for an independent and irreducible mental explanation of an event (Davidson 1993, 15). It is because the cause instantiated some particular physical property that the effect (which happens to instantiate a mental property) came about. Any mental properties that the cause instantiates seem superfluous in explaining why the effect occurred – unless those properties are identical or related in some strict lawlike way to the physical properties, something ruled out by the anomalism principle.

Davidson responds by arguing that citing only the physical properties of the cause to provide a sufficient explanation of an action does not address the particular interests that psychological explanations of actions serve – providing the reasons of the agent in light of which she performed the action that she did. Serving these explanatory interests compensates for the fact that such explanations cannot be sharpened into strict laws or folded neatly into physical laws (Davidson 1991, 163). We only understand why the agent waved her hand – why the effect is of the mental kind ‘waving one’s hand’ (as opposed to merely ‘one’s hand going up and down’) – by citing mental properties of the causing event, such as her wanting to greet her friend. The citation of physical properties of the causing event and the associated mere bodily movement will not bring about such understanding, assuming mental anomalism, because of the lack of any reductive relationship between either the physical properties of the cause and the agent’s reasons or the physical properties of the effect and the agent’s action. And those physical properties will not explain why the agent was performing the intentional action of waving her hand. They will not make the action intelligible.

Here we see the interest-relativity of explanation and its bearing on explanatory relevance (see supplement E.1) playing an important role for Davidson. Mental properties must be cited if we want a rational explanation of mental effects. Davidson’s response to epiphenomenalist concerns, and the explanatory exclusion problem posed by Kim, can thus be described as a kind of ‘dual explananda’ theory of the explanatory role of mental properties. According to this theory, for every (causally interacting) mental event there are generally at least two distinct explananda in need of explanation: an event of a certain physical type and an event of a certain mental type. Mental properties are accorded an ineliminable and (given Anomalous Monism) irreducible explanatory role by virtue of their singular capacity to make intelligible the occurrence of other mental properties through the sui generis relation of rationalization. This reflects the point made at the end of §4.2 by the causal definition interpretation of the argument for mental anomalism: that rationality underlies, not mental anomalism, but rather mental realism. (For related discussion of the dual explananda approach, see Macdonalds 1995 and Gibbons 2006.) On this view, to the extent that we believe there are actions and thoughts to be explained at all, we must attribute an explanatory role to mental properties of their causes, since only these provide the sort of explanation – through rationalization – that makes them intelligible to us in the way that we need in order to understand them. Citation of physical properties of the causes just does not provide for such understanding. It can explain the physical properties of the effect (one of the dual explananda) but as a general rule cannot provide illumination or intelligibility of the kind needed for understanding the mental properties of the effect. If you asked someone why she raised her hand and she responded “Because activity in my brain resulted in muscle contractions leading to my hand moving as it did”, you would rightly be mystified and think your question hadn’t been answered. Her response did not make her action intelligible.

It should be noted, however, that there are cases where mental properties do appear to explain physical properties and vice-versa. To deny this would lead to an “outlet” problem, with mental properties being explanatorily insulated from physical properties – something inconsistent with the way in which we ordinarily think of mental-physical interaction, captured in Davidson’s interaction principle (§2) (for discussion of the outlet problem, see Gibbons 2006). A blow to the head can, for instance, sometimes explain the occurrence of a thought popping into one’s head. And a thought can explain the physical behavior of an object, as when my decision to quench my thirst leads to the movement of a glass of water to my lips. However, the blow to the head cannot rationalize the thought – it can’t explain its content, only the fact that an event which happens to have that content occurred. And the decision to drink cannot rationalize the movement of the glass, though it can rationalize the action of moving the glass. The dual explananda strategy is silent concerning such cases, and more work is needed to account for how such cross-level causal explanatory cases can be squared with Kim’s explanatory exclusion principle. (For a critique of Kim’s principle based on a very different conception of causal explanation, see Campbell 2020, 156–157.)

Moreover, scientific research suggests that thoughts are able to explain bodily effects like stress, and perhaps even the cessation of pain and bodily injury – as in the placebo effect (for a fascinating study of such cases summarizing decades of research and experiments, see Langer 2023). And brain injuries and diseases can explain psychiatric phenomena such as hearing voices in one’s head, or delusions such as Capgras syndrome, where one believes that one’s spouse has been replaced by an imposter. (For excellent discussion questioning whether such phenomena can be explained without any appeal to mental properties, see Campbell 2001; Campbell 2009 contains related useful discussion.) More work is needed to see whether the dual explananda strategy can account for such psychological phenomena.

Nonetheless, so long as there are occurrences of mental properties in need of the distinctive kind of explanation provided by rationalization, mental properties occupy an ineliminable explanatory role. And given Anomalous Monism, that role is irreducible. It is worth noting that this dual explananda strategy is consistent with Davidson’s commitment to the causal closure of the physical domain (Crane 1995 seems to miss this point) – every physical event can have a physical explanation, even if the mental component of some physical events can be rationally explained only through appeal to mental components of the causing event. Therefore, however causal closure ultimately enters into Anomalous Monism (see supplement C.1), it does not appear to create any further problems for Anomalous Monism’s ability to account for the ineliminable, irreducible explanatory role of mental properties.

The interest-relativity of causal explanation is thus crucial in Davidson’s grounding of the ineliminable explanatory role of mental properties within the framework of Anomalous Monism. As we have seen (§2.2, §4), Anomalous Monism contends that all mental properties, including mental event-types such as actions, are not reducible to physical-event types. Therefore, the only way to explain actions (as opposed to mere bodily movements) so as to make them intelligible – to meet that explanatory interest – is by appeal to the mental properties of the cause. These properties are the reasons – beliefs, desires, intentions – that we appeal to in everyday psychological explanations. (For discussion of whether, in light of this, reason explanations can still be maintained to be causal explanations within the framework of Anomalous Monism, see supplement E.2.)

6.3 The Causal Constitution of Reasons

A final point to consider in evaluating the epiphenomenalist objections to Anomalous Monism is the way in which causality enters into the constitution of reasons and reasons-explanations according to Davidson. Before we have established the anomalism principle, or go on to derive monism, we already know that reasons explain actions by causing them (the ‘because’ problem discussed in §2.2). And, as we have seen (§4.2), we know that propositional attitudes and mental contents are individuated, and thus defined, partially in terms of what they are caused by and cause (for attitudes, see Davidson 1987b, 41; for contents, see Davidson 1987a, 444, and extended discussion in supplement B.2). But if something cannot even be identified as a reason unless it is a cause, then the charge that mental properties are causally impotent appears to have difficulty gaining traction. And since these claims are known prior to the argument for monism, they are neutral about whatever else reasons must be in order to be causes. So reasons must be recognized as causes prior to the discovery, through Davidson’s argument for monism, that they are also physical events. This appears to secure the causal potency of reasons in a way entirely independent of the claim of token-identity.

This widely unrecognised point can be put this way: before even addressing the quesiton of whether mental events are identical, at either the type or token level, to physical events, we must first know what individuates mental events – what makes an event a mental event. Davidson argues that part of what identifies events as mental is their causal nature. Within Davidson’s framework, reasons can only play the rationalizing and explanatory role that they do by virtue of their causal nature. Davidson only then argues, partly on the basis of this, that mental events are token-identical to physical events, by appeal to the anomalism and cause-law principles. Davidson has therefore entitled himself to the claim that mental events cause and are caused by physical events before the question of how mental properties can be causally efficacious or relevant can even be raised by epiphenomenalist critics. Their concern about the causal potency of mental events is a reaction to the anomalism principle’s rejection of type-identity, and the subsequent derivation of token-identity through the cause-law principle. But this rejection and derivation assumes the causal potency of mental events, as part of what identifies an event as mental in the first place.

Practically all of Anomalous Monism’s epiphenomenalist critics do not address this rich causal background, in particular the role of causation in individuating mental properties. As we have seen, the background is not sufficient by itself to silence all epiphenomenalist concerns. But it does significantly affect how those concerns can be formulated and addressed. Anomalous Monism is clearly deeply committed, at a number of levels, to the causal explanatory relevance of the mental, and so charity suggests that we try to understood it in a way such that these commitments are respected. The dual explananda strategy discussed above (§6.2) provides one promising framework for doing this, while at the same time displaying sensitivity to the sorts of concerns driving the epiphenomenalist objections.

Related to the point that causality enters into the constitution of reasons and reasons-explanations is that, for Davidson, there can be no sharp divide between how one ought to think and act and how one in fact thinks and acts (see §4, §4.1 and supplement D.8). This constitutive conception of rationality complements the causal constitution of reasons: just as something cannot be identified as a reason unless it’s a cause, similarly a thought or action cannot generally be identified as the causal upshot of a reason unless it bears a rational relation to it. The psychological causal order must contain predominately rational patterns. On Davidson’s view, therefore, one cannot neatly cleave apart the space of reasons from the space of causes in order to raise a skeptical question about whether and how those spaces can intersect. That is how most epiphenomenalist critics of Anomalous Monism proceed, and it ignores the frameworks of causation and rationality upon which Anomalous Monism is erected.

7. Conclusion

Despite the initial appearance of simplicity in its assumptions, structure and argumentation, we have turned up several important problems and lacunae that stand in the way of any overall final assessment of the plausibility of Anomalous Monism. While the central objections it has faced have derived from epiphenomenalist concerns, the force of these objections is not clear. Arguably, the most serious difficulties for Anomalous Monism are not with its adequacy but with its justification. We still stand in need of a clear argument for how rationality leads to the anomalism principle; there are the substantial problems surrounding the status of the causal closure of the physical and its bearing on monism; and the cause-law principle’s strictness requirement is still in need of a compelling rationale. Even with these problems, Anomalous Monism continues to provide an extraordinarily rich and useful framework for exploring fundamental issues and problems in the philosophy of mind, and has earned a central and permanent place on the rather short list of genuinely important positions concerning the relation between mental and physical events and properties.

8. List of Supplements

• A. Related Views
  • A.1 Spinoza’s Parallelism
  • A.2 Functionalism
    • A.2.1 A Comparison of Davidson’s and Lewis’s Arguments for Monism
  • A.3 Bare Materialism
    • A.3.1 Token-Identity and Minimal Materialism
  • A.4 Other Positions
• B. Related Issues
  • B.1 Anomalous Monism and Scheme-Content Dualism
  • B.2 Mental Anomalism and Semantic Externalism
  • B.3 Anomalous Monism and Freedom
    • B.3.1 Anomalous Monism and Kant’s Theory of Freedom
    • B.3.2 Anomalous Monism and Contemporary Compatibilism
• C. Physical Causal Closure, Nomic Generalizations, and the Cause-Law Principle
  • C.1 Causal Closure of the Physical in the Argument for Monism
  • C.2 Homonomic and Heteronomic Generalizations
  • C.3 Causes, Changes, and Laws
• D. Mental Anomalism
  • D.1 Deviant Causal Chains and Mental Anomalism
  • D.2 Rationality and Mental Anomalism
  • D.3 Holism, Indeterminacy of Translation, and Mental Anomalism
  • D.4 Kim’s Reductio Strategy for Establishing Mental Anomalism
  • D.5 Uncodifiability and Mental Anomalism
  • D.6 Context, Complexity, and Mental Anomalism
  • D.7 Causation and Mental Anomalism
  • D.8 Rationality as Constitutive of the Mental, Irrationality, and Mental Anomalism
• E. Mental Causation and Supervenience
  • E.1 Mental Properties and Causal Relevance
  • E.2 Explanatory Epiphenomenalism
  • E.3 Supervenience and the Explanatory Primacy of the Physical