Attention

First published Tue Sep 8, 2009; substantive revision Mon Feb 2, 2026

Attention is involved in the selective directedness of our mental lives. The nature of this selectivity is one of the principal points of disagreement between the existing theories of attention. Some of the most influential of those theories treat the selectivity of attention as resulting from limitations in the brain’s capacity to process the complex properties of multiple perceivable stimuli. Others take that selectivity to be the result of limitations in the thinking subject’s capacity to consciously entertain multiple trains of thought. A third group attempt to account for attention’s selectivity in ways that need not make any reference to limitations of capacity. These latter theories relate the selectivity of attention to the selectivity required to maintain a single coherent course of action, to the weighting of sensory information in accordance with its expected precision, or to competition between mutually inhibitory streams of processing.

Instances of attention differ along several dimensions. In some of its instances attention is a perceptual phenomenon; in some it is a phenomenon related to action; and in others it is a purely intellectual matter of giving thought to some question. In some instances the selectivity of attention is voluntary. In others it is driven, independently of the subject’s volition, by the high salience of attention-grabbing items in the perceptual field. The difficulty of giving a unified theory of attention that applies to all of these instances makes attention a topic of philosophical interest in its own right.

Attention is also a topic of philosophical interest because of its apparent relations to a number of other philosophically puzzling phenomena. There are empirical and theoretical considerations suggesting that attention is closely related to consciousness, and there are controversies over whether this relationship is one of necessity, or sufficiency (or both or neither). There are also controversies—thought to be important to the viability of representationism about consciousness—over the ways in which the phenomenal character of a conscious experience can be modulated by attention. Different considerations link attention to demonstrative reference, to the experience of emotion, to the development of an understanding of other minds, and to the exercise of the will. Some work in the tradition of virtue ethics takes attention to be morally important, since there are at least some virtues that require one to attend appropriately. Attention has also been given a prominent role in some theories about the epistemic significance of emotional and perceptual experiences, and in some discussions of the epistemic peculiarities of self-attributed mental states.

The controversies concerning attention’s relations to these other phenomena often include debates about the philosophical significance of theories that have been developed through the empirical study of attention at the neuropsychological and cognitive levels. Attention’s cultural and economic aspects have also come to be a point of philosophical interest, with some theorists suggesting that the social and political significance of new media is primarily a consequence of the novel ways in which those media engage and compete for the attention that we individually and collectively pay.

1. Historical Overview

1.1 Descartes: Attention and Epistemology

In the early modern period several different explanatory roles were assigned to attention by a number of different writers. Descartes’ Meditations (1641) provides one prominent example. The result of Descartes’ First Meditation—that everything can be doubted—is in apparent tension with his claim in the Third Meditation that clear and distinct ideas are beyond doubt. Descartes introduces a point about attention to resolve this apparent conflict. He says, in reply to the seventh set of objections, that it is only when we pay attention to them that clear and distinct ideas provide a place where doubt does not take hold:

So long as we attend to a truth which we perceive very clearly, we cannot doubt it. But when, as often happens, we are not attending to any truth in this way, then even though we remember that we have previously perceived many things clearly, nevertheless there will be nothing which we may not justly doubt so long as we do not know that whatever we clearly perceive is true. (“Objections and Replies”, Seventh Reply 1661 [1985: 309])

This passage is usually cited for the point that it makes about memory, but the picture that Descartes outlines here is also one in which attention has an important epistemic role to play: clarity and distinctness realize their epistemic potential only when attention is being paid to the ideas that have them. Those ideas can be doubted, as, in accordance with the policy of the First Meditation they must be, but this doubt cannot be maintained by a properly attentive thinker. The crucial first move in Descartes’ epistemology—the move from radical doubt to certainty about the truth of particular clear and distinct ideas—is, therefore, a transition that is mediated by attention.

1.2 Berkeley and Kant: Attention and Abstraction

A quite different explanatory role is assigned to attention in Bishop Berkeley’s Principles of Human Knowledge (1710), although here again we find that it is in order to remove an epistemological glitch that the notion of attention is brought in. In the Introduction to his Principles of Human Knowledge Berkeley rejects Locke’s claim that there exist such things as Abstract Ideas. But he retains Locke’s commitment to the core empiricist claim that the thinking of thoughts is always a matter of handling ideas that have been received from experience. This would seem to lead to the conclusion that it is not possible to think about abstracta, but Berkeley realizes that that conclusion would be unacceptable. It is, as he says, perfectly possible to think about the properties of triangles in general.

In the second edition of the Principles (1734) Berkeley added a couple of sentences to this Introduction that make clear that it is attention and, in particular, the withholding of attention, that is supposed to explain the possibility of thinking about abstracta without the need to postulate Abstract Ideas. The added sentences tell us that:

[It] must be acknowledged that a man may consider a figure merely as triangular, without attending to the particular qualities of the angles or relations of the sides. So far he may abstract, but this will never prove that he can frame an abstract general, inconsistent idea of a triangle. (1710/1734, Introduction to second edition, §16; emphasis added)

In these sentences Berkeley is not attempting to elaborate a theory of attention. He says nothing more about the idea that attention might enable thought about abstracta, but it is nonetheless clear that he requires attention to play an important role in his picture of the mind. Kant gives a similar role to attention, but again he mentions it only parenthetically, in a footnote to one of the chapters that was added in the Critique of Pure Reason’s second edition, where he says that in:

every act of attention […] the understanding always determines the inner sense, in accordance with the combination that it thinks, to the inner intuition that corresponds to the manifold in the synthesis of the understanding. How much the mind is commonly affected by this means, everyone will be able to perceive in himself. (1787: B157)

Kant would go on to say a little more about attention in his Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View (1800), where it is made clear that he, like Berkeley, takes the withholding of attention to be more psychologically significant than the paying of it. Such withholding plays a role in Kant’s explanation of our capacity for abstract thought, and also—in a way not precedented by Berkeley—in his explanation of our capacity to exercise freedom in the formation of our thoughts and judgments:

Our effort to become conscious of our ideas is either paying attention to or turning away from an idea of which we are conscious (attentio or abstractio). In abstracting we are not merely neglecting to pay attention […] we are, rather, performing a real act of the cognitive power by which one idea of which we are conscious is held apart from its connection with other ideas in one consciousness. […] In this way our idea gets the universality of a concept and so is taken into the understanding.

The ability to abstract from an idea, even when the senses urge it on us, is a far greater power than that of paying attention to it; for it demonstrates a freedom of the power of judgment and the autonomy of the mind, by which the state of its ideas is under its control (animus sui compos). In this respect the power of abstraction, when it deals with sense representations, is much more difficult to exercise than the power of attention, but also more important. (1800 [1974: 13])

Berkeley and Kant’s idea that attention and abstraction are closely linked was taken up in the second half of the nineteenth century by William Hamilton, but Hamilton did not think that the link between attention and abstraction provided the starting point for an explanation of attention or abstraction. That is because he took it that the relationship between these two phenomena is too intimate to be explanatory. He writes that:

Attention and Abstraction are only the same process viewed in different relations. They are, as it were, the positive and negative poles of the same act. (1860: 88 [lecture VII])

1.3 Locke: Attention as a Mode of Thought

Descartes, Berkeley and Kant all treat attention briefly, but each assigns it to a particular explanatory role. Locke’s treatment of attention is also brief, and he has his own theory of the explanatory role that attention plays. He goes further than either Descartes or Berkeley in giving us a positive account of what attention is. That account is given as part of the catalogue of “Modes of Thinking”, which Locke sets out towards the beginning of Chapter Nineteen of Book Two of the Essay Concerning Human Understanding:

[W]hen ideas float in our mind without any reflection or regard of the understanding, it is that which the French call reverie; our language has scarce a name for it: when the ideas that offer themselves (for, as I have observed in another place, whilst we are awake, there will always be a train of ideas succeeding one another in our minds) are taken notice of, and, as it were, registered in the memory, it is attention: when the mind with great earnestness, and of choice, fixes its view on any idea, considers it on all sides, and will not be called off by the ordinary solicitation of other ideas, it is that we call “intention,” or “study.” (1689: II, 19 §1 emphasis added)

In addition to providing these quick theories of ‘reverie’, ‘attention’ and ‘intention or study’, the very same sentence of Locke’s Essay provides theories of ‘remembrance’, ‘recollection’, ‘contemplation’, ‘sleep’, ‘dreaming’, and ‘ecstasy’. It is significant that Locke’s account of attention is given so briefly, and significant that it goes by as part of a crowd of theories of these various other mental phenomena. Locke is not here engaging in an uncharacteristically slapdash piece of rapid-fire theorizing. His intention in going through this catalogue is to establish that these are topics for which no new substantive theory is needed. These are, in Locke’s theory, simply ‘modes of thinking’: ‘reverie’, ‘study’ etc. are not names for independent phenomena, existing in their own right. Instead they are the various names that thinking is given when it takes place in particular ways.

One consequence of Locke’s treatment of attention as a mode of thinking is that, once we have a theory of thinking before us, we need no further theory to account for the possibility of attention, contemplation, study, etc. (Just as, to use a classic example of ‘modes’, we need no substantive independent theory, once we have a theory of walking, to explain the possibility of limping, pacing or ambling.) We need to say something in giving an analysis of the nature of modes, but—once the thing-to-be-modified has been accounted for—our analysis can simply say something brief, along the lines indicated by Locke. We do not need to give a theory that postulates any substances or processes specific to the explanation of attention.

Locke’s modal view of attention has the consequence that no very substantive theory of attention is needed once our theory of thinking is in place. It also entails, and for the same reason, that attention cannot figure in the explanation of how thinking itself is possible: any explanation in which it did figure would be getting its explanatory priorities backwards, since it would be analogous to an explanation of walking that takes strolling to already be possible.

1.4 Early Psychological Theories: Attention in Perception, in Action and in Reflective Thought

Locke viewed attention as an explanatorily slight phenomenon—a mode of thought that is not in need of much explanation, nor capable of providing much. Theories of attention moved away from that view over the course of the eighteenth century, as the science of psychology began to emerge. Attention was increasingly treated as a phenomenon with its own explanatory work to do, and so as a phenomenon for which a substantive independent theory needed to be given. The attempt to provide such a theory got properly underway in 1732, when Christian Wolff’s textbook on psychology was the first to devote a whole chapter to the topic of attention (see Hatfield 1998, for an excellent discussion).

The explanatory remit for theories of attention broadened in this period in two directions. The first move was away from the idea that attention acts on already-received ideas and towards the idea that it is involved in the initial reception of those ideas. Locke had characterized attention as the registration of already-received ideas into memory. But by 1769, when Henry Home, Lord Kames added the appendix of “Terms Defined or Explained” to his Elements of Criticism, attention’s role as a regulator of cognitive input was regarded as definitive of it:

Attention is that state of mind which prepares one to receive impressions. According to the degree of attention objects make a strong or weak impression. Attention is requisite even to the simple act of seeing. (1769: vol. 2, 526–527 [appendix, para. 33])

As well as beginning to give attention a role in the initial reception of ideas, and in the exercise of the will in the formation of judgments (as we have seen in Kant), eighteenth century theories also moved towards including a role for attention in the production of behaviour, and in the execution of other mental acts. This is particularly clear in Dugald Stewart’s 1792 Elements of the Philosophy of the Human Mind. Stewart retains Locke’s view that attention has an essential role to play in determining which things get stored in memory (1792: 106 [ch. 2]), but he adds to that view the claim that attention also has a role in determining which particular memories get recalled, proposing that an account of attention should consider not only “those different degrees of attention which imprint things more or less deeply on the mind, but [also] that act of effort without which we have no recollection or memory whatever” (op cit: 108). He goes onto to claim that this active form of attention has a role in the execution of various skilled behaviours, using as his examples the acts performed by tightrope walkers who can balance several items on different parts of their bodies (op cit 119), and “the dexterity of jugglers” which, he says, “merits a greater degree of attention from philosophers than it has yet attracted” (op cit: 119).

In the century between Locke’s Essay and Stewart’s Elements attention ceased to be seen merely as a certain mode of idea-handling, and it came to be seen as a phenomenon in need of its own explanation, and with a role to play in the explanation of perception, in the explanation of judgment, in the explanation of skilled action, and in the explanation of memory (both in its storage and in its recall).

In the century after Stewart’s Elements the diversity among the phenomena that attention was expected to explain continued to grow, and it continued to include phenomena from across the psychological spectrum from perception, to thought, to action. By the end of the nineteenth century, in what was a crucial period in the development of scientific psychology, there were some psychologists, such as E.B. Titchener, who took the role of attention in perception and in ‘sensory clearness’ to be its most essential feature (see Titchener: 1908, 1910); others, such as Alexander Bain, who thought that the essential feature of attention was its role in action, (Bain 1859); and a third group, of whom G.F. Stout was the most prominent example, who argued that the primary job for a theory of attention was to explain attention’s role in reflective thought (see G. Stout: 1891). Others gave attention a role in unifying all of these several phenomena into a psychological whole. G.H. Lewes, for example, suggested that the “reflex attitude of Attention” imposes the regimentation of a well-ordered series onto all of our various ideas and impressions, and thereby explains why “Each state is the termination of some prior state, and the origination of a successor; not in discontinuous succession, but in serial integration” (1879: 205 [problem II, chapter XL]).

As a result of this diversity in their conceptions of attention’s explanatory remit (and as a result of the lack of any established methodology for empirical psychology) the debates between exponents of these various psychological theories of attention got themselves into what was acknowledged to be a “chaotic condition” (Pillsbury 1906 [1908: ix]).

1.5 William James and His Contemporaries: Deflationary Theories

The diversity of explanatory roles assigned to attention in the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries meant that theorizing about attention at the end of the nineteenth century was in a chaotic state. As the nineteenth century came to an end the ambition for theorists of attention was to get this chaos into order. The theories of attention that were proposed in this period therefore tended to take the form of attempts to reveal attention as something less mysterious and less complex than earlier writers had supposed. This ambition to give a ‘nothing but…’ reduction of attention can be seen in the most influential work from this period: William James’ The Principles of Psychology (1890).

James attempts to play down the more complex perceptual aspects of attention. His chapter on attention includes a discussion of experiments into what we now call ‘subitizing’—that is, into the ability to perceive the cardinality of small stimulus sets without needing to count their members—but James writes of these experiments that it “is obvious that such observations decide nothing at all about our attention, properly so called” (1890: vol. 1, 407).

Although James plays down attention’s role in complex perceptual phenomena, he does assign attention to an important explanatory role in the production of behaviour. He claims, for example, that “Volition is nothing but attention” (1890: vol. 1, 447). But when James makes such claims it is as part of a general project that seeks always to be deflationary where possible. When he associates attention with volition it is as a way of suggesting how volition could be given a deflationary treatment, not as a way of inflating attention’s explanatory role.

This deflationary approach to attention’s explanatory remit means that, when it comes to giving an account of the “intimate nature of the attention process”, James can identify two fairly simple processes which, he claims, “probably coexist in all our concrete attentive acts”. and which “possibly [form] in combination a complete reply” to the question of attention’s “intimate nature” (1890: vol. 1, 434). The processes that James identifies are:

  1. The accommodation or adjustment of the sensory organs, and
  2. The anticipatory preparation from within of the ideational centres concerned with the object to which attention is paid. (1890: vol. 1, 434)

The first of these processes is reasonably familiar. By “the accommodation or adjustment of the sensory organs” James means such processes as pointing one’s ears in the right direction, bringing one’s eyes into focus, taking a sniff, and so on.

James’s talk of “anticipatory preparation” of “ideation centres” is a little less clear, but the point is again a quite straightforward one. What James has in mind here is simply one particular species of imagination. His claim is that when attention does not involve adjusting one’s sense organs it consists in imagining the things or actions that one is acting on, or looking for.

James illustrates this claim about attention’s link to imagination with an example from Hermann von Helmholtz. This example is an important one for James, and it illustrates some important features of attention that subsequent theorists have tended to neglect. The example involves the variety of attention that needs to be paid when trying to discern the overtones in a note played on the piano. Helmholtz asks us to sit at the piano and to play a G, then, imagining the sound that we have just heard, to play a low C. Doing this, it is claimed, enables one to hear that G is discernibly there (as the third overtone) within the sound produced when C is played. Helmholtz’s claim, which James endorses, is that the kind of attention that is paid when listening for an overtone is constituted by the imagining of what that overtone would sound like. James goes onto claim that there is a wide range of cases in which paying attention to what one is doing consists in this same sort of preparatory imaginative engagement.

Here, as in his frequently discussed treatment of emotion, it is distinctive of James’s approach that he tries to account for a large-scale personal-level psychological phenomenon in a realist but somewhat revisionary way, so as to be able to give his account using relatively simple and unmysterious explanatory resources. An alternative deflationary approach—which James explicitly contrasted with his own—was taken in 1886 by F.H. Bradley.

Bradley advocated a view according to which attention is not the sort of phenomenon for which an independent and substantive theory can or needs to be given. Bradley does not develop this point in much detail, and it is a point on which he would later change his mind (for which, see Bradley, 1902), but in his 1886 article, “Is there a special activity of attention?”, Bradley was concerned with arguing that a project such as James’s one of identifying particular processes as the attention-constituting ones was wrongheaded. He claims that no particular attention-processes can be identified since:

Any function whatever of the body or the mind will be active attention if it is prompted by an interest and brings about the result of our engrossment with its product. There is no primary act of attention, there is no specific act of attention, there is no one kind of act of attention at all. (1886: 316)

Although Bradley does not use the Lockean vocabulary (and although James himself does not seem to have taken Bradley in this way), Bradley’s position here has much in common with Locke’s claim that attention is a mode. Bradley’s position, like Locke’s, is that what is essential to an instance of attention is not the matter of which processes are taking place, but the facts about how the things that happen happen. He therefore takes the ennumeration of processes to be the wrong form for a theory of attention to take.

Other writers who were contemporary with Bradley and James took different approaches to the project of giving a deflationary explanation of attention. In Théodule Ribot’s 1889 book La Psychologie de L’Attention the attempt to explain attention took an approach that we would now classify as behaviourist. In 1889 behaviourism had not yet been established as a general approach in philosophical or psychological theories of the mind, but Ribot’s suggestion that attention’s behavioural manifestations are essential to it is nonetheless recognizable as an early articulation of behaviourism in a strong form:

Are the movements of the face, the body, and the limbs and the respiratory modifications that accompany attention, simple effects, outward marks, as is usually supposed? Or are they, on the contrary, the necessary conditions, the constituent elements, the indispensable factors of attention? Without hesitation we accept the second thesis. (1889 [1890: 25])

A somewhat more moderate version of this behaviour-centred approach was taken by Alexander Bain, who identified attention, not with its behavioural manifestations themselves, but with truncated versions of the motor-control processes that typically bring about those behavioural manifestations: processes “stopping short of the actual movement performed by the organ” (Bain 1859: 410). Much as Ribot’s view can be seen as an early version of behaviourism, Bain’s can be seen as an early version of the motor-based approaches to attention that can be found in the literature of the present century (see §2.8 below).

1.6 The Twentieth Century: Locating Attention at a Bottleneck in Information Processing

The variety among the deflationary explanatory approaches that characterized the theories of attention offered in the nineteenth century gave way, in the early twentieth century, to a period in which one such explanatory tactic was dominant: the tactic of behaviourism. Although behaviourists tended to neglect attention, they did not ignore it entirely. John Dashiell’s 1928 Fundamentals of Objective Psychology, for example, is a behaviourist work that attempts to account for attention “as a form of posturing” (Ch. 10, §3). The project of identifying a behaviour with which to explain attention was, nonetheless, an understandably unpopular one. As Gilbert Ryle notes, it is not only attention, but also ‘heed concepts’ more generally, that resist a simple behaviourist analysis:

[W]hen a man is described as driving carefully, whistling with concentration or eating absent-mindedly the special character of his activity seem to elude the observer, the camera and the Dictaphone. Perhaps knitted brows, taciturnity and fixed gaze may be evidence of intentness; but these can be simulated, or they can be purely habitual. (1949: 133)

In the middle of the twentieth century behaviourism’s dominance waned, cognitive psychology established itself, and a new theoretical approach to the explanation of attention emerged. These three developments were intimately related to one another. Instrumental to all three was the publication in 1958 of Donald Broadbent’s Perception and Communication.

The year prior to Perception and Communication’s publication had seen B.F. Skinner’s attempt, in Verbal Behaviour (1957), to apply a behaviourist approach to the explanation of distinctively human aspects of cognition. Skinner’s project in that book failed, and Noam Chomsky’s 1959 review of his book made that failure conspicuous. Chomsky’s own work in Syntactic Structures (1957) went some way towards establishing the new cognitive paradigm for psychology, by showing how internal processing could be theorized by describing transformations on representations in abstraction from the question of how those representations were realized. Donald Broadbent’s distinctive contribution to the overthrow of behaviourism was to show how the move from behavioural data to the postulation of a particular cognitive architecture could be disciplined by the then-new strategy of importing into psychology the intellectual resources used in thinking about information technology. The year in which Broadbent’s book was published was an important year for the development of such technologies, being the year in which (inter alia) the integrated circuit chip was invented (see Mole 2011). It was also the year in which Subscriber Trunk Dialling was introduced to UK telephone exchanges, and it was the technology of the telephone exchange that naturally suggested itself as a metaphor for attention at the time when Broadbent was writing.

Towards the end of Perception and Communication Broadbent explicitly sets out the claim that the theoretical resources developed in thinking about the transmission of information through telephone exchanges provide the basis for an alternative to behaviourism. He also attacks the positivistic methodological principles that had given many behaviourists their motivation. But the central lesson from Broadbent’s work, so far as the theory of attention goes, is a lesson that he takes to be independent of this attack on behaviourism and its positivist foundations. At an early stage in Perception and Communication Broadbent remarks that:

Perhaps the point of permanent value which will remain in psychology if the fashion for communication theory wanes, will be the emphasis on problems of capacity. […] The fact that any given channel has a limit is a matter of central importance to communication engineers, and it is correspondingly forced on the attention of psychologists who use their terms. (1958: 5)

This introduction of the notion of capacity limitations into discussions of perception and attention was, as Broadbent here predicted, hugely and permanently influential.

Broadbent claimed not only that the human brain is subject to capacity limitations of the sort that communications engineers had learnt to theorize, he claimed also that these limitations are clustered so that there is a single bottleneck in capacity that is especially critical to the brain’s handling of the information that comes into it through the senses. This bottleneck was said to occur at the junction of two systems operating in series, with the first system having a large capacity for information processing, and operating automatically on all of the stimuli with which the perceiving subject is presented, while the second has a much smaller capacity, and therefore needs to be deployed selectively.

Those who followed Broadbent took it that the bottleneck that results from the connection of these two systems corresponds to attention in the sense that, when a representation of a stimulus passes through that bottleneck, the stimulus ipso facto counts as one to which attention has been paid.

Broadbent himself was cautious about presenting his claims about capacity-bottlenecks as a theory of attention. The word ‘attention’ occurs rarely in Perception and Communication. Broadbent’s later book, Decision and Stress (1971), does describe his earlier experiments as ‘studies of attention’, but here too Broadbent prefers to talk about ‘selective perception’ (chapter V) or ‘vigilance’ (chapters II and III). In an article from 1982, entitled, “Task Combination and Selective Intake of Information”, he admits that: “The topic of this paper is one that is often termed ‘attention’, and it may seem unduly artificial to have given it a more cumbrous title”. But he goes on to reassert his qualms:

‘Attention’ is a word in ordinary language, that can reasonably be used as a label for experiments in a particular area. Yet it has also been used as a theoretical concept, a mysterious asset or energy which is sometimes attached to human functions and sometimes not. This use of attention […] is not very helpful, and avoiding the word in the title is a step towards clarity. (1982: 253)

Many psychologists would endorse the sentiment that Broadbent was expressing here, together with the methodological recommendation that he extracted from it: they treat attention as a broad area of research with several subfields, and are happy to approach these subfields in an explanatorily piecemeal fashion, without looking for any one theory that unities them all. Michael Posner, and those who have been influenced by him, offer separate treatments of attention’s roles in vigilance, in perceptual orientation, and in the focalized deployment of processing resources (Posner & Boies 1971; Raz & Buhle 2006). Others give somewhat separate accounts of the processes by which attention is allocated ‘top-down’ and those by which its allocated ‘bottom-up’ (Buschman & Miller 2007). Henry Taylor points out that the psychologists’ pluralistic approach is at odds with recent philosophical attempts to give a general theory of attention, and suggests that the unifying ambition behind those attempts may therefore be misguided (Taylor 2015, 2018).

When Broadbent does use the word ‘attention’ it is mostly in discussions of attention shifting. His view, at least in his early work, seems to have been that where there is a bottleneck in our information processing capacity there need to be additional mechanisms that control how our limited capacity resources will be deployed. These additional mechanisms of bottleneck-control seem to have been what Broadbent thought of as the attention mechanisms. He never took himself to have given a theory of them, only to have given a theory of where they would be needed. Nor were these mechanisms the topic that was at issue in the debates about attention that were prompted by Broadbent’s work. Those debates were concerned with questions about the nature and location of the bottleneck itself, not about the factors that determine what, on any particular occasion, gets to pass through it.

In the decades following Broadbent a great many psychologists devoted themselves to the task of locating the attentional bottleneck that he had postulated. Almost all psychologists writing at this time were guided to some degree by Broadbent’s two-serial-systems-and-a-bottleneck picture of perceptual processing. The question of whether a given task is attention-demanding was therefore understood to depend on the question of whether the performance of that task requires the engagement of the small-capacity system that comes after the bottleneck of attention. Research into the attention-related demands of particular tasks therefore became another route by which to approach the issue of where the attentional bottleneck is located. Broadbent’s two-systems-and-a-bottleneck model was frequently questioned, but for most research into attention in the second half of the twentieth century it was the orthodox view. This has now changed. In psychology’s current paradigm, only a few aspects of Broadbent’s picture remain orthodox.

2. Theories of Attention

2.1 Capacity-Limitation Theories

Psychologists attempting to produce a theory of attention in the nineteen sixties and seventies were highly influenced by Donald Broadbent’s picture of attention as corresponding to a bottleneck in information processing capacity resulting from the connection of two separate stimulus-processing systems. The first piece of business for these psychologists was to locate this attentional bottleneck, by determining which sorts of processing are done by the large capacity, pre-bottleneck system, and which by the small capacity, post-bottleneck system. Debates between these psychologists gave rise to various theories in which the selectivity of attention was characterized with a claim about the location of this bottleneck.

2.1.1 Early Selection Theory

Broadbent’s own account of the distribution of processing between the pre-attentional system and the post-attentional system defines the ‘early selection’ theory of attention. He claimed that only very simple properties are detected by the large capacity system, and that any semantic properties, or any properties relating to the particular identity of a stimulus, are detected only after representations of that stimulus have passed through the attentional-bottleneck and into the smaller capacity system.

The personal-level consequences of this theory are that we can recognize what things are and what they mean only if we are paying attention to them, but can detect the simple physical properties of things even when paying no attention to them. The theory can be thought of as a communication-theoretic rendering of two intuitive ideas, which Broadbent’s own research had put on an empirically sound footing. The first is that one has no immediate control over one’s awareness of simple features of one’s environment, such as the fact that there are people talking in the next room. Whatever one is paying attention to, one will continue to hear some chatter to be going on, if any is. The second idea is that the details of things—such as the semantic content of that chatter—can be detected only for the one or two things to which one is paying attention: If one wants to know what the chatter is about, one has to listen, and this involves disengaging one’s attention from other things that might be happening.

Broadbent’s early selection theory also entails, more problematically, that the semantic properties of an unattended item must remain unrepresented in the nervous system, and so it entails that those properties can have no immediate psychological effects. According to this view the semantic features of unattended items cannot explain why those items attract attention to themselves, on the occasions when they do. It was to this aspect of the theory that its opponents most frequently objected.

2.1.2 Late Selection Theory

The chief rivals of Broadbent’s early selection theory were the ‘late selectionists’, who claimed that all (or almost all) perceivable properties are detected automatically, by a large capacity system that operates on all of the stimuli with which the perceiving subject is presented. According to this late selection theory of attention the consequences of passing through the bottleneck of attention into the post-attentive small capacity system are only (1) that the subject comes to be conscious of the contents that the large capacity system has already succeeded in encoding and (2) that those contents come to be stored in working memory (Deutsch & Deutsch 1963).

Although it was originally proposed against the background of Broadbent’s now superseded theoretical framework, the late selection theory has much in common with some plausible and empirically well-supported views that can be found in the more recent literature. Jesse Prinz, for example, shares the late selectionists’ view that attention’s primary role is not in managing limited perceptual processing resources, but in projecting already-processed representations to working memory. Prinz’s view, varying a theme from the work of Stanislas Dehaene, is that this projection to working memory is what makes it the case that the content represented comes to conscious awareness. (J. Prinz 2005, 2012; Dehaene et al., 2006).

Objections have been raised as to whether the process of projection to working memory—which Prinz refers to as ‘attention’—can adequately account for the various things that attention does (Wu 2014: §6.3.2). If it cannot then—since his main philosophical business is with the explanation of consciousness—Prinz is willing to allow that this process is not the sole referent of the English word ‘attention’, writing that “other researchers may choose to define attention differently”, and that “those who disagree with my analysis of attention could simply drop the term ‘attention’” (J. Prinz 2012: 95).

The central component of the late-selection theory, as it was originally understood, was that the effect of withdrawing attention from a stimulus is to make it the case that that stimulus is processed without the subject’s awareness, rather than not being processed at all. This component of the view has, to some extent, been vindicated. It is now uncontroversial that unattended stimuli are subjected to some processing of which the subject lacks awareness, including some processing of those stimuli’s semantic properties. Since we know that the semantic properties of unattended stimuli can, for example, produce negative priming effects (Tipper & Driver 1988), we know that unattended stimuli are processed in a way that allows at least some of their semantic properties to be encoded. The semantic properties of unattended items have such effects despite the fact that experimental participants are typically unaware of what those properties are.

The traditional late selection theory was therefore right in taking it that inattention can lead to properties being encoded without our awareness, rather than not being encoded at all, but that theory was also committed to the claim that attention’s only effects are in determining what gets remembered and experienced, so that the direction of attention has no effects on the initial perceptual processing to which stimuli are subjected. These latter claims are now known to be false. Even in the first parts of the neural circuitry through which information from the retina passes, on its way to the visual cortex—even, that is, in the Lateral Geniculate Nuclei—there is a difference in the baserate of neural activity, and a difference in the response that stimuli elicit, depending on what participants are attending to (O’Connor et al. 2002). These findings indicate that attention’s effects are not limited to cortical loci that are upstream from a late process of attentional selection, and so refute any version of the late-selection theory according to which the selectivity of attention is entirely a ‘late process’, occurring only after initial perceptual encoding is complete.

2.1.3 Other Capacity-Limitation Theories

The early and late selection theories dominated discussions of attention in the decades following Broadbent’s seminal work, but by the beginning of the nineteen nineties it had become clear that the debate between advocates of the early selection theory and advocates of the late selection theory had become fruitless. Those debates were therefore thought to have been predicated on some sort of mistaken assumption. Several different diagnoses were proposed as to what that mistaken assumption might have been.

In response to the impasse between early and late selection theories, Nilli Lavie and her collaborators developed a theory that attempts to combine some aspects of the late selection theory with some aspects of its early selectionist rival. According to Lavie’s ‘load theory’, the selectivity of attention does result from a limitation in our capacity to process stimuli, but the differing demands of the task that is at hand lead to differences as to where this limitation creates a processing bottleneck: when one is performing a task that makes large perceptual-processing demands the resources that are available will be exhausted at a relatively early stage in perceptual processing, with the result that unattended stimuli will be processed rather little; but when performing a task that requires relatively little perceptual processing the bottleneck will operate at a later stage, with the result that unattended stimuli will be processed rather more (Lavie & Tsal 1994; Lavie, Hirst, et al. 2004). This theory predicts that peripheral stimuli will elicit less neural activation, and will be less distracting, when the subject’s task is a perceptually demanding one. These predictions have been borne out by behavioural and neurological observations (Lavie 2005). The theory’s theoretical apparatus has also provided a useful framework for the philosophical treatment of attention’s relationship to consciousness (Hine 2010).

Other psychologists prefer to avoid assigning a single locus to attention, even on a case-by-case basis. Some retain the Broadbentian idea that attention is required for the management of capacity limitations, while taking the selectivity of attention to be the result of multiple bottlenecks in processing capacity (see, e.g., Johnston & McCann 2006; Wicken, McCarley, & Gutzwiller 2022: Ch. 7). Others see capacity limitations as occurring throughout the brain, and not as clustered into bottlenecks at all (for an early suggestion along these lines, see Allport, Antonis, & Reynolds 1972, for more recent handling of it in Bayesian terms, see Butz 2022). Everybody agrees that there was something misconceived about the debate between the two theories of attention that dominated the decades following Broadbent’s reintroduction of attention to the psychological agenda. There is less consensus about whether the elements of those theories that are retained in current theorizing are problematic ones (Hommel & Dreisbach 2022)

2.2 Feature Integration Theory

In the nineteen eighties, Anne Treisman and her collaborators identified the existence of ‘the binding problem’, and described a process that could solve that problem. Treisman describes the way in which the problem arises like this:

Sensory information arrives in parallel as a variety of heterogeneous hints, (shapes, colors, motions, smells and sounds) encoded in partly modular systems. Typically many objects are present at once. The result is an urgent case of what has been labelled the binding problem. We must collect the hints, bind them into the right spatial and temporal bundles, and then interpret them to specify their real world origins. (2003: 97)

To illustrate Treisman’s point, suppose we have a subject who is presented at one time with a red tomato and a green apple. This visual input is, Treisman says, initially broken up for specialized processing—so that one part of the brain is responsible for detecting the shapes of things, and a different part is responsible for detecting their colours. The shape-detecting centres represent the fact that a tomato-shaped thing is present, and the fact that an apple-shaped thing is present. The colour-detecting centres represent the fact that a red thing is present, and the fact that a green thing is present. But the subject, if he is a normal human, knows more than is implied by these four facts: He knows that the red thing is the tomato-shaped thing and the green thing the apple-shaped thing. To know this he must have a way of ‘binding’ the representation of red in the colour-detecting system with the representation of the tomato shape in the shape-detecting system. The binding problem is the problem of knowing how to put together the properties that have been detected in separate specialized detection systems.

Treisman’s Feature Integration Theory proposed that the solution to this problem exploits the fact that spatial representations are ubiquitous. If the centre for detecting colours detects red at place one and green at place two, and if the centre for detecting shape detects a tomato shape at place one and an apple shape at place two, then, given the principle that there is a maximum of one visible object per place per time, the binding problem can be solved. Treisman therefore proposes that we achieve a correctly bound representation by moving a variously sized ‘window’ from one location in the perceptual scene to another. This window blocks out information from all but a single location, and all the features found at that location can then be ‘bound’ as being features of the same object. The area covered by the window within which features are bound is taken to correspond to the region to which attention is being paid.

The Feature Integration Theory has been pressed into more than one form of philosophical service. That theory plays an important role in John Campbell’s 2002 attempt, in his Reference and Consciousness, to use attention to explain how the reference of demonstrative expressions gets fixed by their producers, and understood by their consumers (see §3.2). And Treisman herself suggested, albeit tentatively, that descendants of the Feature Integration Theory might provide part of the explanation for “the bound, unitary, interpreted, personal view of the world of subjective experience”, and even that the sort of explanation that such a theory provides “should give us all the information there is about the conditions that create consciousness” (Treisman 2003: 111).

Opposed to those who think that a theory of feature binding will be a large component in our theory of attention, of the unity of consciousness, or of anything else, are a number of philosophers (and a smaller number of psychologists) who deny that feature binding creates a problem that needs any serious cognitive apparatus for its solution. Such claims have been made for a variety of reasons. They are generally made as part of large-scale revisionary proposals for the conceptual framework of cognitive neuroscience. Kevin O’Regan and Alva Noë’s rejection of the binding problem ‘as, in essence, a pseudo-problem’ comes as part of their general attack on the idea that perception requires the representation of the thing perceived (O’Regan & Noë 2001: 967). Vincent Di Lollo has suggested that the assumptions about neural coding that generate the binding problem have been superseded, with the result that the binding problem is an ill-defined one (Di Lollo 2012). And M.R. Bennett and P.M.S. Hacker, in their book-length critique of the philosophical foundations of neuroscience, claim that the notions of representation and information that enjoy currency in neuroscience are subject to various confusions, and that these confusions lead to it being ‘widespread’ for neuroscientists to make “confused statements of the so-called binding problem” (Bennett & Hacker 2003: 14). These debates about the status of the binding problem (reviewed by Plate 2007) turn on foundational issues for the cognitive sciences generally, and have ceased to be specifically concerned with the explanation of attention .

Even if these philosophical critics of the binding problem are right to suggest that a perceiver can typically experience several properties as belonging to a single object without the need for any special binding process to integrate the representations of those properties, it may nonetheless be true that, in some particular cases, attention does play a role in determining the way in which different streams of sensory information come to be combined. Even in these circumscribed cases, the question of how this binding-like role for attention should be characterized may raise its own philosophical difficulties. Several psychologists studying the integration of information from across different sensory modalities have found themselves running into such difficulties, claiming that the role of attention in integrated multisensory perception is ‘curious’, and ‘a paradox’, especially in cases that involve the perception of speech (Tiippana, Andersen & Sams 2004; Macaluso et al. 2016). The appearance of paradox here might derive from certain questionable assumptions about the predominantly bottom-up nature of perceptual processing, or from assumptions of a more metaphysical sort, concerning the localizable way in which attention’s causal influence is exerted (Mole 2020).

2.3 Coherence Theories

The view that the function of attention is the management of limitations in the brain’s information processing capacity has been an orthodox one among psychologists since Donald Broadbent introduced it in the nineteen fifties, but it has sometimes been called into question, and there are empirical reasons to think that the simplest versions of such a view are mistaken. In the nineteen seventies Ulric Neisser and his collaborators carried out a series of experiments showing that, when appropriately trained, a subject can perform two attention-involving tasks concurrently, without much interference between them (Hirst et al. 1980; Neisser 1976). Neisser interpreted these experiments as suggesting that, insofar as there is a bottleneck that attention is needed to manage, it must often be a bottleneck in behavioural coordination, rather than in information processing capacity. Simple bodily limitations are what prevent us from looking in two directions at one time, or from throwing a ball and writing with the same hand. Neisser’s suggestion was that in many cases cognitive processing was selective, not as a result of limitations in processing capacity, but only in so far as such bodily limitations required it to be.

In two papers from 1987, authored individually but published in the same volume, Odmar Neumann and Alan Allport developed a similar idea. Whereas Neisser emphasized the constraints that are imposed on cognition by the need to manage a single body, Neumann and Allport both emphasized the constraints that are placed on cognition by the need to maintain a coherent course of goal-directed action. They describe their position as a ‘selection-for-action’ theory. If we think of ‘action’ as here referring to bodily behaviour then the selection-for-action theory is very similar to Neisser’s view, but Neumann and Allport’s point is that action continues to require selectivity in cases of deliberate mental activities, such as puzzle-solving, for which no bodily limitations are in play. There is here an “analogy between practical and theoretical activity”, which was noted in an 1891 paper by G. F. Stout:

Thinking is action directed towards intellectual ends. Intellectual ends are attained by an appropriate combination of movements of attention just as practical ends are attained by an appropriate combination of movements of the body. If, therefore, we desire to explain the process of Thinking, we must clearly determine the nature of active Attention. (Stout 1891: 23)

As Stout and the later generations of action-oriented theorists indicate, almost all deliberately executed thoughts and actions require that we select among several possible sources of information, and select among several possible things that might be done with the information that has then been selected. This ubiquitous need for selectivity has been emphasized in a series of works by Wayne Wu, where it is referred to as the “many many problem”(Wu 2011a, 2014, 2019, 2023). Versions of the same idea continue to be championed in some parts of the psychological literature (see, for example, Ansorge et al. 2021).

In Wu’s handling of it, the idea that Neumann and Allport emphasized becomes part of a larger attempt to understand the essential connections between attention and agency (Wu 2011b, 2023). He suggests that any division we might attempt to draw between perceptual attention and the attentional selectivity required by agency would be an artificial one. Even the involuntary capture of attention by perceptually salient stimuli should, Wu thinks, be understood as involving a kind of readiness to act on the things to which we involuntarily attend (2011b: §3). Wu’s version of the selection-for-action theory of attention is therefore intended as a step towards a unification of our philosophical account of ourselves as agents and our philosophical account of ourselves as perceivers.

Wu’s position on this point has been criticized for overstating the tightness of the connections between selectivity and action, and between action and attention. Carolyn Jennings and Bence Nanay (2016) argue for the loosening of the first of these connections. They suggest that some semi-reflexive actions are elicited by stimuli directly, without there being any selection of those actions from a range of recognized alternatives (as when a surprising or disgusting stimulus makes one jump or squirm). Sebastian Watzl (2017: 119) argues for the loosening of the second connection. He suggests that some purely habitual actions can be performed inattentively, even when they are directed at targets that must be selected from a range of such alternatives. Wu responds to both lines of objection in his (2016) by arguing that attention and selectivity are indeed found in all of the cases where he needs to find them, even if that attention is sometimes invisible from the point of view of introspection, and even if its selectivity is sometimes accomplished via anticipatory process, in which the mapping between stimulus and response is ‘preset’. Laura Bickel develops a further response on Wu’s behalf in her (2024), drawing on a body of psychological research which supplements the psychologist’s traditional dichotomy between attention that is directed ‘top-down’, by a conscious intention, and attention that is directed ‘bottom-up’, by the salient properties of a present stimulus. Bickel cites a body of empirical work showing that, in addition to these influences on the direction of attention, we must also recognize an influence from one’s prior history of interacting with similar stimuli. Once this influence from past interactions is understood to modulate attention, Bickel thinks that the case for taking habitual actions to be inattentive is diminished, so that Watzl’s attempted counterexamples to Wu’s theory lose their force.

2.4 General-Purpose Prioritization

In the tradition perpetuated by Wu, the selectivity of attention is understood as providing the solution to a problem that is created by the fact that, at any one time, multiple courses of action might be taken, with the taking of any one requiring the others to be suppressed. That problem arises whether or not the brain contains capacity bottlenecks of the sort that were postulated by Broadbent, but—since the coordination of action is not the only cognitive need that could be served by an operation of selectivity—the selection-for-action theory is not the only alternative to Broadbent’s capacity-bottleneck theory. Other functions for attentional selectivity might also be proposed, or, rather than electing any one of these functions as being the function that is essentially served by attention, we might instead characterize attention as a quite general process of selectivity, recruitable on any of the various occasions when one thing needs to prioritized over another, whether this prioritization is required by the presence of a processing bottleneck, required in order for a coherent action-plan to be executed, or required for some quite different reason. The work of Sebastian Watzl develops the idea that attention might be such a non-specific process of prioritization (Watzl 2017).

In Watzl’s treatment of it, this idea places particular emphasis on the fact that, just as a binary ‘is greater than’ relation can introduce a partial ordering on a set, so a number of these binary prioritizations can be considered in sum, as introducing a prioritization structure on the several items that together constitute one’s mental life. For Watzl, attention is the process by which one’s mind comes to have such a prioritization structure. He also claims that any mind which lacked such a structure would therefore be lacking a particular perspective on the world, and so would not be the mind of a creature with the subjective point of view that is characteristic of conscious experiences. From this he derives the claim that every conscious creature is attentive. Carolyn Jennings has suggested that certain kinds of highly engaged expert performance may be a counterexample to this (Jennings 2015).

2.5 Precision Optimization Theories and Prediction Error Coding

The idea that there might be reasons for attentional selection that have nothing to do with processing bottlenecks has also been a theme in the work of psychologists hoping to understand perception as a process of Bayesian inference (Friston et al. 2006; Summerfield & Egner 2014), and in the work of those philosophers who have been influenced by them (Hohwy 2013; Clark 2013, 2017).

In what has come to be the most philosophically developed version of this Bayesian approach to the mind (Hohwy 2013; Clark 2015), cognition as a whole is understood to be a process of Bayesian updating, in which a hierarchically-organized series of hypotheses is constantly being tested, with each hypothesis being updated in the light of evidence coming from the level below. The information that gets passed up through this hierarchy is taken to be encoded in the form of signals representing the errors in the predictions that have been made by hypotheses at the hierarchy’s next level up, with the content of one’s experience at any time being given by whichever hypothesis makes the least erroneous predictions. A central claim of these theories is that the role of our sensory encounter with the world is to provide information about the way in which our prior hypotheses get things wrong: instead of providing us with the information that it has started to rain, our senses provide only the information that it is more rainy than we had expected.

Advocates of this theory attempt to find room within it for all aspects of cognition, including perception, thought, and action. They claim that their perspective “allows us to see attention in a new light and to provide alternative conceptualizations of its functional role in our overall mental economy” (Hohwy 2013: 191). According to these ‘alternative conceptions’, attention adjusts the weighting of incoming prediction error signals in accordance with their expected precision (Hohwy 2012). ‘Precision’ is to be understood here in the sense that contrasts precision with accuracy. ‘Accuracy’, in the intended sense, is a measure of the difference between the value indicated by a signal and the actual value of the signal’s source, whereas ‘precision’ is a measure of the random fluctuation in that signal, even when the actual input is held constant. A miscalibrated instrument might, in this sense, be highly precise, without being especially accurate.

Various empirical results make it plausible that the brain takes account of expected precisions when it is processing perceptual signals. In the ventriloquist illusion, for example, it is plausible that expectations of precision have a role to play: It is because vision is expected to give a more precise indication of location than audition that sounds are heard to come from the location where their source is apparently seen. Other considerations make it similarly plausible that attention plays a role in adjusting to variations in these expected precisions, as we move from one context to another. If we expect that the signal from vision is likely to become a noisy one—perhaps because a thick fog has started to descend—then we might place more weight than usual on the information that is present in the signal coming from audition. It seems likely that there is a role for attention in bringing about this change of weighting. It is more controversial to claim, as the advocates of this theory do, that “attention is nothing but precision optimization in hierarchical inference.” (Hohwy 2013: 244; citing Feldman & Friston 2010). Ransom et al. have suggested that, by taking attention always to be precision optimization, this theory struggles to account for certain forms of voluntary attention (Ransom et al. 2017). Clark has suggested that this challenge can be met if the sources of voluntary attention are identified with beliefs, rather than desires (Clark 2017).

2.6 Competition Theories and Cognitive Unison

Like the precision-optimization theories that have been advocated by Hohwy and Clark from within the framework of the prediction-error coding theory, the Coherence theories advocated by Neisser, Neumann, Allport, and Wu have also suggested functions for attention other than the management of limitations in processing capacity. Despite the availability of these non-Broadbentian conceptions of attention’s function, the Broadbentian idea that attention’s selectivity serves to manage limitations in processing capacity continues to be regarded by many psychologists as axiomatic. Buschman and Kastner, for example, introduce their ‘integrated theory of attention’ by saying

attention is the selective prioritization of the neural representations that are most relevant to one’s current behavioral goals. Such prioritization is necessary because the brain is a limited capacity information system. (Buschman & Kastner 2015: 127, emphasis added)

Many other instances of this claim can easily be found.

For those who reject this idea, and think that the function of attention is something other than the management of limitations in processing capacity, it is natural to think that the mechanisms of attentional selection may be something other than capacity bottlenecks.

The clearest non-bottleneck mechanisms for achieving selectivity are competitions (and, despite their stated commitment to the capacity-limitation view of attention’s function, Buschman and Kastner’s own theory turns out to be one in which competitive mechanisms play a large role). Since well-organized competitions can always select one winner, however proficient and however numerous the competitors, the selectivity of a competitive mechanism need not have anything to do with bottlenecks, or with any other limitations of processing capacity.

Competition-based mechanisms for achieving selectivity come in at least two varieties: In a simple race mechanism each of the competitors independently completes a process that is comparable, along some dimension of variation, with the processes that are completed by each of the other competitors. The competitor that achieves the highest value on the relevant dimension of variation is selected as the winner. In a struggle the competitors do not just get on with their own processing in the hope that they will do it better than each of the other competitors. Instead the active suppression of other competitors is a part of the process that each competitor carries out. Simple race models of attention have been proposed (Shibuya & Bundesen 1988; Bundesen 1987), but our best current theories supplement the simple race mechanism with some components of mutual struggle, and with additional processes of top-down control (see, for example, Bundesen & Habekost 2008).

One suggestion for a supplemented-competition mechanism for attentional selectivity is the biased-competition model, elaborated in several works by Robert Desimone, John Duncan and John Reynolds. The biased-competition model accounts for various attention-involving effects, at the personal and at the sub-personal level, as being effects that arise from numerous struggles between the different stimuli that fall within the variously sized receptive fields of neurons throughout the perceptual processing hierarchy. It is hypothesized that each one of these struggles is biased, although not settled outright, by a top-down attention-specific signal (Desimone & Duncan 1995; Reynolds & Desimone 2001).

We have said that competitions are selective in ways that do not involve limitations in capacity, and that competition-based theories of attention’s underlying mechanisms are therefore natural accompaniments to selection-for-action type views of attention’s function (§2.3), and perhaps to other views that involve a break from the Broadbentian view according to which attention’s function is the management of capacity limitations. Competition views of attention’s mechanisms do not, however, require us to take a non-Broadbentian view of attention’s function. Although the biased competition view sits naturally with a non-Broadbentian view of that function, Reynolds and Desimone continue to introduce the biased competition theory as an attempt to understand attention in recognizably Broadbentian terms, writing that:

The visual system is limited in its capacity to process information. However, it is equipped to overcome this constraint because it can direct this limited capacity channel to locations or objects of interest. (2000: 233)

Some advocates of the biased competition view emphasize the particular importance of the top-down biasing signals that the theory postulates (e.g., Beck & Kastner 2009: 1156), taking the source of these signals to be the true locus of attentional selection. Others suggest that the biased competition theory is better understood as a theory that refuses to identify any such locus, and that can instead be read (as suggested in Duncan’s original [1996] presentation of the theory) as attributing the selectivity of attention to the totality of an integrated competition, involving processes of various sorts at various levels, any part of which can bias any other (Vecera 2000; Mole 2010: §6.7, 2015; Mole & Henry 2023).

When it is understood in this second way the biased-competition theory accords with the proposal that attention should be taken to have a metaphysical status analogous to that of unison in an orchestra. According to this view it is always a mistake to identify any one process as the attention process (or any set of processes as the attention processes); attention requires the unified activity of whichever processes happen to be relevant to a person’s current task, but since these vary from one task to the next it does not require any particular processes to be taking place. Such a view has been developed in work by Christopher Mole, who dubs it the ‘Cognitive Unison Theory’. Metaphysically speaking, such a theory can be understood as a revival of John Locke and F.H. Bradley’s view that attention is a mode of thinking (see §1.3 above). Phenomenologically the view has a precedent in Ribot’s suggestion that attention be identified with “monoideism” (Ribot 1889 [1890: 10]). It also draws on some ideas about the ‘polymorphousness’ of attention, which were advocated in a 1964 monograph by Alan White, on the basis of considerations drawn from the examination of various ‘heed concepts’ in natural language.

Because operating in unison requires an absence of task-irrelevant processing, the most straightforward version of the unison theory entails that full attention is a rare achievement, with most cases of attentiveness involving what is, strictly speaking, only partial or divided attention. Mole (like Ribot) accepts this implication. Yair Levy has suggested that this prevents the unison theory from giving an adequate account of phenomena such a listening, or observing, which always require some attention to be paid, but which can nonetheless be done more or less attentively (Levy 2019). Mole’s response to this charge is given in his (2024). Work by Philipp Koralus has suggested that a more satisfactory treatment of divided attention could be given, without departing from the main metaphysical commitments of the unison theory, if the attentive pursuit of a task is understood to share certain formal properties with the answering of a question (Koralus 2014). This characterization of attention as “the means by which we answer questions about the environment” (Eilan 1998: 305) has been argued for on phenomenological and epistemological grounds by Naomi Eilan (1998). (Eilan credits the thought to Rowland Stout, whose treatment of it can be found in Chapter 9 §5 of R. Stout 2006.) Koralus draws on Hamblin’s 1958 semantics of questions to provide a formal model of such questioning (Hamblin 1958). In more recent work, he has elaborated this proposal into a much more general theory of enquiry (Koralus 2023).

There are philosophical issues, independent of the cognitive unison theory, about the way in which partial or divided attention relates to full attention, and about whether a distinction should be drawn between the attention that is given to things by which we are merely distracted and the attention that is given to things on which we remain concertedly focused. Aaron Henry use the notion of constitutive norms to provide an answer to these questions, as part of a general discussion of attention and control. His account is one in which distraction always involves a certain sort of shortcoming, while nonetheless qualifying as a case of genuine attention, rather than merely being a defective approximation of it (Henry 2019). Zachary Irving has suggested that the wandering of a distracted mind presents philosophical puzzles of its own, and has worked towards giving an empirically-informed account of mind-wandering that avoids these puzzles. His account takes such wandering to be attentive but unguided (Irving 2016). Theories in which attention essentially depends on the performance of an understanding-guided task need to find some alternative account of the non-task-oriented phenomena of attention that Irving identifies.

2.7 Spotlight Theories

Whereas bottleneck metaphors have traditionally guided the theories that attempt to locate those cognitive resources that operate only on attended stimuli, it has been spotlight metaphors that have guided the theories that attempt to say which features of a stimulus determine whether attention is being paid to that stimulus at any given moment (e.g., Watchel 1967; Woodman & Luck 1999; see Fernandez-Duque & Johnson 2002, for discussion).

The appeal of such a metaphor is clear. If we are presented with a screen of differently coloured shapes, appearing and disappearing in various places, then there will be any number of attention-demanding tasks that we might perform, some of which might require us to attend to whatever is going on at the top of the screen, while others might require us to attend to all the red shapes, or to all the triangles, or to something else. Some of these ways of attending seem, from a purely introspective point of view, to be more basic than others. It seems, for example, that attending to things in the top part of the screen might be a primitive task, whereas attending to the triangles could not be primitive in the same way: we cannot simply attend to the triangles. If we want to attend to the triangles, we need first to work out where the triangles are. If, on the other hand, we want to attend to the things in the top part of the screen then we do not first need to work out whether they are triangles. It is therefore plausible that, when we attend to the triangles, we do so by attending to their locations. In this sense attending on the basis of location seems to be more basic than attending on the basis of shape. The image of attention being allocated in a spotlight-like fashion makes this idea vivid.

The appeal of the idea that attending to a location is more basic than attending to a shape might tempt one to think that attending on the basis of location is absolutely basic, so that attention is always and only allocated on the basis of location. If that were right then a theory about the moving and focusing of an ‘attentional spotlight’ would be a large and central component in an account of how attention works. This would be good news for the scientific project of explaining attention more generally, since attention’s spotlight-like behaviours are some of its best understood aspects (see Logan 1996; Szczepanski, Konen, & Kastner 2010).

But, although there are reasons to think that location does indeed play a special role in the allocation of attention, the role of location in the allocation of attention is probably not as straightforward as would be required by the most parsimonious of spotlight-based theories. Location does have a special role to play here, but location is not the only property to have such a role, and the role of location is more complicated than a simple spotlight metaphor suggests.

One source of evidence that points to need for these complications comes from case studies of the different patterns of attention failure that are shown by patients suffering from unilateral neglect. Those patterns suggest that various different frames of reference are involved in the spatial allocation of attention (Behrmann & Tipper 1999). This indicates that there is no single map of locations determining which items get attention: attention is sometimes allocated on the basis of location in egocentric space, and sometimes on the basis of location in more complex allocentric, object-centred, or body-part centred, frames of reference (a point that was among those raised by Allport, in his influential critique of the Broadbentian debates [see Allport 1993: 197]).

There are also some well-known experimental effects suggesting that attention is allocated, not merely on the basis of spatial coordinates, but in ways that are constrained by the distribution of objects in space. The classic work in this area is John Duncan’s demonstration that attention shifts more readily between two locations that fall within the bounds of a single object than between equidistant locations that are separated by an object boundary (Duncan 1984). Equally important here are findings from experiments using three-dimensional stimuli, and using virtual three-dimensional displays. These suggest that experimental participants are unable to differentially attend to depths in an empty space, but that they are able to shift their attention forwards and backward (to a place in front of or behind the point that their eyes are fixating) when the relevant locations are ones in which there are objects (see Yantis 1998).

These sources of data indicate that the spotlight of attention is not allocated simply on the basis of coordinates in any single spatial frame of reference. That is important for attempts to localize mechanisms for the allocation of attention within the brain (since different brain areas differ in their mapping of space). It has been influential in leading psychologists to turn away from simple spotlight metaphors. It should be noted, however, that these findings do not threaten the core of the idea that was suggested by the spotlight metaphor: the facts about what a person is attending to might still supervene on the facts about where that person is attending, even if quite numerous and sometimes complex factors are responsible for determining which location that is, and how it is bounded.

Other effects, demonstrated in a series of experiments by Dwight Kravitz and Marlene Behrmann, are somewhat more damaging for a purely location-based view, although they also stop short of refuting it entirely (Kravitz & Behrmann 2011). Participants in these experiments had their attention cued by a brief stimulus that was presented at one end of a shape that was shown on a computer screen. This shape might be a simple rectangle, a rectangle with bulbous ends, or a more complex ‘H’ or ‘h’ shape. It was presented alongside another shape, which in some cases had the same shape and colour, and in other cases was different. The resulting allocation of attention was then probed by measuring the reaction times to stimuli that are presented on and near these two objects. Kravitz and Behrmann find that all the different properties of their stimuli interact to determine the way in which attention is allocated to the various parts of the screen on which those stimuli appear. Most strikingly, they find a difference in the allocation of attention between trials in which the shapes on the screen are an upper and a lower case ‘H’, and trials in which the shapes are an upper case H and number 4, even though the number 4 shape that was used in these experiments was exactly the same as the lower case h, but presented upside down. Such findings suggest that, even when it is elicited by a simple spatial cue, attention is not allocated merely on the basis of location, but also on the basis of shape, colour, and arbitrary learned meaning. Other studies suggest that it can also be allocated, in a spatially non-specific way, on the basis of a stimulus’s direction of motion (Serences & Boynton 2007).

An argument against pure spotlight views can also be made on more traditional, phenomenological grounds. A pure spotlight theory, according to which attention is always allocated on the basis of location, seems unable to account for the sort of case that Hermann von Helmholtz and William James were concerned with (see §1.5). There is, as their example suggests, a difference between attending to the pitch of a note and attending to its timbre, or to its overtones. This difference in attention does not seem to correspond to any difference in the location attended. Nor does any purely location-based theory of attention allocation seem able to account for the sort attention that one must pay in order to perform a time-based task, such as finding out which of a group of shapes appears on screen for longest. Such temporal aspects of attention have been a relatively late addition to the psychological research agenda (see the papers collected in Nobre & Coull 2010). The research concerning them is beginning to reveal a diverse range of effects, with a range of similarly diverse neural underpinnings (Nobre & van Ede 2018, 2023). Some philosophical work has been devoted to the exploration of these temporal aspects of attention (see Phillips 2011), but it is work that has tended to address questions that further our understanding of the experience and perception of time, without attempting to contribute directly to our philosophical understanding of attention itself (see the entry on temporal consciousness).

The discovery that attention can preferentially modulate the processing of stimuli on account of their non-spatial properties does not prevent us from maintaining that the location of a stimulus has some special role to play in the process by which attention is allocated to it. More than one line of research in psychology has sought to identify a representation in the brain that determines the extent to which attention will be allocated to the various items that are present. In the longest established of these lines of research—beginning with the work of Koch and Ullman (1985)—this representation is taken to be a map, in some quite literal sense: The representation is taken to be one in which every location in some region is represented, and where the representation of these locations is taken to be in some format that immediately encodes the spatial relations between them. Every object that is represented is taken to be represented as being at some location, and the properties assigned to these objects are taken to determine the likelihood that attention will be paid to the location that the objects occupy. According to the theory that postulates these ‘salience maps’, location does play a unique role in determining the way in which attention is allocated, despite the fact that other properties also contribute to that allocation.

In some treatments of this idea (Pessoa 2013) such maps are taken to include representations, not merely of the objective properties that make an item salient, but also of subjective properties, such as emotional-valence and current-task-relevance. The more we think of these maps as being augmented with additional, non-spatial information, the less spotlight-like the allocation of attention represented in them will seem to be, but, provided the representation in question is still understood to be map-like, location can still be understood to have an important role, and perhaps even a uniquely important one.

Debates about the role of such maps, and about the variety of subjective and objective properties that are represented within them, may have some wide-ranging philosophical consequences, concerning more than just the aptness of the spotlight metaphor. Aaron Henry has suggested that the viability of some recent philosophical theories depends on the outcome of these debates. Since the recent philosophical theories of attention have tended to emphasize the role of agency in attention, they face potential counterexamples from instances of involuntary attention. Henry suggests that the threat of such counterexamples can be defused if the mechanisms of involuntary attention capture are understood to involve attention being allocated on the basis of a map in which the agent’s own priorities for action are represented (Henry 2017).

2.8 Motor Theories

Work in which electrodes are used in vivo to stimulate areas of the macaque brain known to be associated with eye-movement coordination has provided evidence for an anatomical overlap between the brain areas that are involved in eye-movements and those that are involved in determining which stimuli elicit the strongest responses in visual cortex. This anatomical fact might signify something about the role of these brain areas in the allocation of spatial attention. It is particularly suggestive that the links between frontal eye-movement-control areas and attention-like effects in occipital visual areas are spatially specific ones: an electrode that is placed so that it elicits an eye movement to a particular part of the visual field when activated at one level will, if activated at a lower level, elicit changes in neural responsiveness that are exactly similar to the changes that are seen when attention is shifted to that same location (T. Moore & Armstrong 2003; Armstrong & Moore 2007).

These facts have been taken to be supportive of a ‘motor theory’ of attention, according to which the processes underpinning attention are, in at least some cases, truncated versions of the processes underpinning the coordination of movements of sensory orientation. The central idea of such a theory is that “the program for orienting attention either overtly or covertly is the same, but in the latter case the eyes are blocked at a certain peripheral stage” (Rizzolatti et al. 1987: 37). The advocates of motor theories (such as T. Moore, Armstrong, & Fallah 2003) have characterised their work as a revival of the picture that Alexander Bain proposed at the end of the nineteenth century. Bain (as we saw in §1.5, above) identified attention with truncated versions of the motor-control processes that typically bring about attention’s behavioural manifestations—processes “stopping short of the actual movement performed by the organ” (Bain 1859: 410).

These versions of the motor theory should be distinguished from theories that regard attention and motor control as intimately linked while placing no particular emphasis on the fact that the motor control processes that have been implicated in attention are processes that control the movement of sensory organs. In these latter theories (which are natural but not obligatory concomitants of the ‘selection-for-action’ views discussed in §2.3) attention stands in an intimate relation to motor control more generally. One line of evidence in support of these theories comes from work by Heiner Deubel and his collaborators, in which changes to the way in which an object figures in action are shown to have an attention-like influence on the perceptual discrimination of stimuli that are presented on or near that object. Deubel and Schneider found, for example, that the way in which attention is allocated to the space around a 6.5cm wooden X shape depended on whether the experimental participant was reaching with her left hand to grasp the shape by the top-left and bottom right arms, or reaching with her right hand to grasp the shape by the arms at its top-right and bottom left (Deubel & Schneider 2004). In each case attention was allocated not only to the shape, but to the to-be-gripped parts of it. (For other evidence of interactions between attention and action-targeting, see Tipper, Howard, & Houghton 1998.)

Motor theories and other action-based theories give a plausible account of some of attention’s instances, but they have limitations that prevent them from applying with full generality: Since movement of the eyes, or of the limbs, is always movement to a location, motor theories will struggle to account for the allocation of attention on the basis of anything other than location. They therefore face the limitations that we saw when considering pure spotlight theories, of being unable to account for shifts in attention that do not correspond to differences in the location attended. Nor is it clear how motor theories could be applied to spatial attention in those sensory modalities where the orientation of the sense organs is less straightforward than it is in the visual case. The motor theory does, nonetheless, provide a plausible and well-supported account of the location-based variety of visual attention that is displayed in typical attention-lab experiments (T. Moore & Zirnsak 2017).

The success of motor theories in accounting for these particular instances of attention can be given either an optimistic or a pessimistic interpretation. The optimistic interpretation sees the motor theory as providing a successful account of the processing underpinning some of attention’s simpler and more central varieties. The pessimistic interpretation sees it as revealing a problem with our usual experimental paradigms. The participants in typical laboratory tasks direct their attention to different parts of their visual field while keeping their eyes fixated on a central spot. The behavioural signatures of attention in such tasks are usually reductions in reaction time to the attended stimuli. The neural correlates of these signatures are certain biases as to which stimuli most strongly drive the neural circuitry that processes them. The central finding of the motor-theorists is that these neural and behavioural effects can result from attenuated versions of the activity responsible for directing eye movements. The pessimistic interpretation of this finding is as revealing that signs that have often been taken to indicate the direction of attention are actually no more than consequences of the truncated eye-movements that our experimental paradigms induce, by imposing the restriction that experimental participants fixate their gaze on a single location. If that is right then the phenomenon studied in attention labs may not be the psychologically important one that it has been taken for.

3. Explanatory Roles for Attention

3.1 Attention and Consciousness

3.1.1 Is Attention Necessary for Consciousness?

Some theorists think that lots of unattended items appear in consciousness. Others thinks that only a very few do, and a third group think that unattended items never figure in consciousness at all. There is evidence that people differ as to which of these views they find pre-theoretically plausible (Schwitzgebel 2007). A number of psychologists endorse the view at one end of this spectrum, according to which attention to a thing is always necessary for consciousness of it, so that the things to which we are not paying attention do not figure in our consciousness at all (e.g., Cohen, Cavanagh, et al. 2012; Noah & Mangun 2020). Some philosophers take the same view (e.g., Prinz 2012; Carruthers 2015; Montemayor & Haladjian 2015). Historical precedents for this position can be found in James’s remark, at the beginning of his chapter on attention, that “my experience is what I agree to attend to” (James 1890: ch. 11), and in Kames’ remark that “Attention is requisite even to the simple act of seeing” (Kames 1769: vol. 2, 526–527 [appendix, para. 33], see §1.4, above).

The view that we are wholly unconscious of the things to which we pay no attention is generally taken to be somewhat at odds with our commonsense conception of the mind, and so it is taken to be a claim that needs considerable empirical support. The evidence that has most often been cited in support of it comes from a range of experiments showing the surprising extent to which experimental participants are ignorant of the items to which they have paid no attention. In Arien Mack and Irvin Rock’s ‘inattentional blindness’ paradigm, for example, many of the participants who are given an attention-demanding task pertaining to a stimulus in one part of their visual field fail to notice shapes or words that are flashed up elsewhere, even when these are presented at the centre of the visual field (Mack & Rock 1998). In Rensink et al.’s ‘change blindness’ paradigm participants often need to see an alternating pair of pictures between ten and twenty times before they can identify a large but narratively inconsequential difference between them (Rensink et al. 1997; Rensink 2002). In the most memorable of these experiments, a large number of participants fail to notice the central appearance of a man in a gorilla suit when their attention is taken up with the business of counting the number of passes made by one of two teams in a concurrent basketball-type game (Simons & Chabdris 1999).

No single one of these experiments can establish the claim that attention is always necessary for consciousness. That claim is a universally quantified one, and so it is not entailed by any one of its instances, nor are the cases that have been observed in these experiments exceptionless. Something therefore needs to be said to account for those occasions on which experimental participants do succeed in identifying stimuli that are presented in the conditions that lead others to exhibit ‘inattentional blindness’, and about those stimuli—such as one’s own name—that seem to be immune to such blindness (Wentzell 2025). Even when all participants do experience such ‘blindness’, it need not be taken to show that unattended stimuli drop out of consciousness altogether. The participants’ ignorance of the gorilla’s appearance, for example, is compatible with it being the case that the presence of the gorilla does make a phenomenal difference to their inattentive experience. To explain those participants’ ignorance we need only say that any phenomenal difference that the unattended gorilla makes is a difference that the participants are unable to use in answering the experimenter’s question about whether anything strange happened in the scene. It may be a phenomenal difference that is epistemically unusable because it is immediately forgotten (see J. Wolff 1999), or it may be a difference that is unusable because it is too unstructured and inchoate to be epistemically mobilizable. In that case the effect of inattention would be inattentional amnesia, or inattentional agnosia, rather than inattentional blindness (see Simons 2000).

Absolute amnesia for unattended items, or thoroughgoing agnosia for them, may be indistinguishable from inattentional blindness, both behaviourally and from the point of view of retrospective introspection. For that reason it is not a straightforward matter for advocates of any one of these interpretations of the inattentional blindness and change blindness effects to rule out the alternative views, but subpersonal sources of data may provide some further information that can help to settle the question. In a 1999 experiment by Rees, et al. 1999, for example, fMRI data were used to argue against the amnesia interpretation of inattentional blindness effects involving written words. Such data are interpretable as evidence for the presence or absence of consciousness only when additional assumptions are made, and these assumptions have sometimes proven to be questionable. In a 2020 study by Cohen, Ortego, et al., for example, evidence is given to suggest that an EEG signal that had been thought to be a signature of consciousness is instead a signature of reportability.

It is only narratively insignificant differences that go unnoticed in the change-blindness paradigm, and so change blindness might be taken as showing, not that there is no consciousness in the absence of attention, but that there is consciousness in the absence of attention the contents of which are restricted to the scene’s overall gist. Again there are difficulties in adjudicating between these interpretations experimentally. When features of gist do seem to be perceived in the apparent absence of attention, the defender of the claim that attention is necessary for consciousness may reply by claiming that attention has been paid to these items, either in a dispersed, non-focal way (Prettyman 2013), or else because these features are briefly and involuntarily attention-catching (J. Prinz 2012: 119). Without an experimental operationalization of complete inattention, these rival interpretations cannot be ruled out. Empirical debates about the extent of consciousness beyond attention are, therefore, in something of deadlock. Experimenters claim only to have demonstrated conscious perception (for evolutionarily-pertinent stimuli such as faces or animals) in the ‘near absence’ of attention (Li et al. 2002; L. Reddy, Wilken, & Koch 2004; L. Reddy, Reddy, & Koch 2006; Matthews et al. 2018), and so they provide only inconclusive support to the hypothesis that attention and consciousness are dissociable (Koch & Tsuchiya 2007).

The methodological puzzle that we face when trying to settle the dispute between different interpretations of the inattentional and change blindness effects raises the question of whether our commonsense beliefs about the conscious status of unattended items are well founded. In addition to varying from person to person (Schwitzgebel 2007), reports of such beliefs also seem to vary with certain features of the context in which they are probed (De Brigard 2010). To the extent that we find it natural to suppose that unattended items do figure in consciousness, this may simply be owing to a version of the ‘refrigerator-light illusion’: If our reason for believing that we are conscious of the things to which we pay no attention is a reason that depends on our finding that we are conscious of those things whenever we check on them then that belief is on shaky ground. A checking procedure cannot provide us with good evidence about the status of unattended items since the act of checking is itself an act that involves a shift in attention to the things checked (O’Regan & Noë 2001).

Because a direct checking procedure is ruled out, we need a more theory-driven way of assessing the dispute between those who claim that the consequence of not attending to an item is that that item drops out of conscious experience and those who claim that inattention simply puts the subject in a poor epistemic position vis-à-vis such unattended items. It would be premature to try to settle this dispute by an inference to the best explanation, since neither side of the dispute has a theory of the attention/consciousness relation that has been worked out to a degree that would allow their different explanations to be compared. We can, nonetheless, see some of the considerations that the two sides in this debate might invoke. Those who endorse the idea that attention is necessary for consciousness can point to the fact that this view accords well with theories in which attention features prominently in the explanation of consciousness (e.g., Prinz 2005, 2012). They might also be able to develop arguments based on theories of the way in which consciousness and attention evolved (Montemayor & Haladjian 2015). Those who prefer the epistemic-deficit interpretation of the inattentional blindness effects (Mole 2010: §7.3.7) can point to the fact that that interpretation flows naturally from the view according to which attention to an item provides the sort of acquaintance that is needed for the use of a demonstrative concept that refers to that item (a view advocated by J. Campbell 2002, and discussed in §3.2 below): If attention to the gorilla is necessary for the forming of a demonstrative-involving thought (such as ‘That’s a gorilla’) then there is an immediate explanation, consistent with the idea that unattended items nonetheless feature in consciousness, for the fact that inattentive people are unable to answer questions such as ‘Was there a gorilla?’.

The difficulty in the case of the unnoticed gorilla is to discern whether unattended items are present to consciousness but present only as unindividuated items to which no demonstrative reference has yet been directed, or whether those unattended items are instead absent from consciousness altogether. Part of this difficulty originates in the fact that, although most people give no attention to the gorilla, they could attend to him, and would have done so if anything had prompted them to do so. More data may be available, both to introspection and to laboratory measurement, in cases where our failure to attend has some more systemic explanation. Ned Block has suggested that such a case can be found by considering our perception of peripheral stimuli, when these are subject to the phenomenon of ‘identity crowding’ (Block 2012). An individual ‘T’ or ‘F’ can be seen reasonably clearly, even when presented in a peripheral part of the visual field, but if additional characters are presented alongside this character then the properties of these several characters become prone to perceptual confusion. Attention seems to bind together properties from all of the characters in the vicinity of the one individual that we are trying to pick out. It therefore seems that, in the perceptual periphery, attention cannot be successfully directed onto a region that tightly circumscribes any one individual character. Due to this ‘crowding’ effect, individual letters become impossible to individuate from the others with which they are clustered, when they fall into parts of the visual field that are outside the high-definition centre. The properties of objects that are crowded in this way can nonetheless be seen, even when those objects cannot be visually separated, and the fact that several items are present can be reliably reported, even when those items are only seen as part of a crowd. Block claims, on the basis of empirical and introspective considerations, that such crowded characters are consciously discriminated from their backgrounds. Since attention cannot be allocated to anything more fine-grained than the crowd of which these characters are a part, the characters are not themselves objects to which attention is paid. Block therefore takes this phenomenon of ‘identity crowding’ to give a counterexample to the claim that we are conscious of objects only when paying attention to them.

Block’s claim that the crowded characters figure in consciousness as individuated objects, rather than as parts of some feature-rich texture, has been contested (Taylor 2013; Richards 2013). In response, Block has suggested that an inference to the best explanation of several related phenomena favours his interpretation of the effect (Block 2013). Here again inference to the best explanation is a hazardous business, especially since we are in the vicinity of an explanatory gap. In the interpretation of identity crowding, as in the interpretation of inattentional blindness and change blindness, the inescapability of abductive considerations suggests that our answer to the question of whether attention is necessary for consciousness may have to wait until we have a better understanding of the relation of attention to demonstrative reference (of the sort that is involved in thinking ‘That’s a gorilla’), and perhaps until we have a better understanding of attention’s role in the formation of judgments more generally. (See §3.3 & §3.4, below.)

In addition to these disputes about whether attention to particulars is necessary for consciousness of those particulars, there has also been some discussion of whether attention is necessary for ‘creature consciousness’, so that every conscious creature must be an attentive one. The theory developed by Watzl, in his 2017 book, gives an affirmative answer to that question because Watzl takes it that consciousness must have the organized structure that attention imposes upon it. A similar verdict is given by Brian O’Shaughnessy, in his 2000. O’Shaughnessy’s arguments on this point are developed over several chapters, and they depend on the details of his own particular theory, but the outline of his claim is that consciousness consists in a certain openness to the world, which is possible only in a creature that is capable of paying the sort of attention that is required for it to take an experience as one in which something in that world is made present (see O’Shaughnessy 2000, especially Ch. 8–9). Unless one supposes (as O’Shaughnessy does not) that every conscious creature must always be conscious of some object, such theories are compatible with a variety of view about the relationship between attention to an object and the conscious perception of that particular object.

3.1.2 Is Attention Sufficient for Consciousness?

The question of whether we are conscious of only those things to which we attend is paralleled by a question about whether we are conscious of everything to which we attend. If we were then a complete theory of attention might be given by giving an account of the way in which attention modulates consciousness.

The claim that attention is paid only to things of which we are conscious sits uneasily with some empirical results indicating that consciousness is not required for the operation of certain psychological processes that are responsible for effects that have often been taken to be signatures of attention. In Lazarus and McCleary’s classic work on Pavlovian conditioning, for example, experimental participants who had been conditioned to display a galvanic skin response to written nonsense words (by pairing these words with an electric shock) continued to show such a response when those words were presented at speeds that were too fast for conscious recognition, thereby suggesting that stimuli can modulate affectively appropriate arousal without coming to consciousness (Lazarus & McCleary 1951).

Such modulation of arousal may not be selective enough to qualify as a phenomenon of attention, but the selectivity that was missing from the effects that were observed in these early studies can be seen in a more recent experiment. Yi Jiang et al. (2006) presented their participants with attention-attracting stimuli in such a way that, thanks to an arrangement of mirrors, those stimuli were given to just one eye. Because a more vivid stimulus was presented concurrently to the other eye, and because this more vivid stimulus wins the competition for consciousness that occurs in such cases of binocular rivalry, the participants in this experiment did not consciously experience the less vivid stimulus. Those unconsciously processed stimuli included erotic photographs. And these photographs did seem to elicit shifts of spatially selective attention, despite being unseen, as is evidenced by the fact that consciously experienced stimuli that were presented in the same location as these unseen attention-grabbers were more accurately responded to in an attention demanding task (involving detecting the orientation of Gabor-patches). One striking finding from Jiang et al.’s experiments is that the way in which these unseen photographs attract and repel attention depends on the sexual orientation of the experimental participants.

A natural interpretation of these experiments is as showing that the erotic pictures draw the participants’ attention in a spatially selective way, despite the fact that those participants have no conscious experience of those pictures. This suggests—although it does not conclusively demonstrate—that one may be attending to a thing without being conscious of it. The same conclusion is suggested by a quite different set of experiments involving a patient with blindsight. These experiments show that, even though the blindsighted patient has no experience of cues that are presented in his scotoma, those cues can elicit the facilitation of processing and reduction of reaction times that are usually taken to be the signatures of attention (Kentridge & Heywood 2001; Kentridge, Heywood, & Weiskrantz 2004).

One complaint against both these lines of evidence is that they do not enable us to distinguish between attention to a thing and attention that is directed to a part of space (in which that thing happens to be), with the result that they cannot demonstrate attention to a thing in the absence of consciousness of that very thing (Mole 2008). Research by Liam Norman, Charles Heywood and Robert Kentridge goes some way towards addressing this complaint. Norman, Heywood and Kentridge present normal participants with a screen showing an array of small Gabor patches, each of which was rapidly flickering between two orthogonal orientations. Within this array were two objects, the boundaries of which were defined by the orientations of these patches. Because of the rapid flickering, those objects were not consciously experienced: Participants merely saw the whole screen as a flickering array of patches. Cues that directed the attention of those participants did nonetheless seem to draw attention to these unseen objects, as indicated by differences in the response times to items that are subsequently presented in and outside of their boundaries (Norman, Heywood, & Kentridge 2013).

Such experiments show that there is an influence operating between unconscious processing and the direction of attention, and they perhaps indicate that attention can be paid to objects that make no showing in conscious experience (Mole 2014). They therefore place a limit on the closeness of the relationship that can be claimed to exist between attention and consciousness.

The disputes about whether attention is sufficient for consciousness, necessary for consciousness, or both, are related to questions about attention’s metaphysics. The claim that attention is not sufficient for consciousness is typically made as part of a defence of the idea that attention and consciousness are underpinned by two distinct brain processes, which can occur independently (see, e.g., Koch & Tsuchiya 2007; Maier & Tsuchiya 2021). The claim that the things to which we attend are a proper subset of the things that appear in our consciousness is required by those who, like Locke (see §1.3), think that there is a process of conscious thinking, and that this constitutes attention when it happens in a certain way. The claim that attention is both necessary and sufficient for consciousness is required by those who think that the process by which things come to consciousness is identical to the process by which attention is allocated (Prinz 2005, 2011). Some scientific theories of consciousness also carry commitments concerning its relationship to attention: Taylor Webb and Michael Graziano emphasize these commitments in making the empirical case for their ‘Attention-Schema’ theory, according to which consciousness emerges from processes in which the control of attention requires a schematic representation of the way in which one’s own attention is being allocated (Graziano & Webb 2014; Webb & Graziano 2015).

Disputes about the relationship between attention and consciousness have also been approached from an epistemological starting point. Declan Smithies has argued in favour of a position according to which everything to which we pay attention must make some appearance in consciousness, on the grounds that (1) all instances of attention must have a connection with their subject’s ‘rational-access’ to the contents of her experience, and (2) there is no connection to rationality in the case of processing that is wholly unconscious. Smithies’ view is, therefore, that attention is essentially involved in the ‘rational-access’ of consciously experienced contents (Smithies 2011). The nature of any such connection between paying attention to an experience and taking that experience to have justificatory force is itself a source of ongoing controversy: Johannes Roesller has argued that John McDowell’s theory of perceptual experience’s reason-giving force cannot account for the role that is played by attention in experience (Roessler 2011); Susanna Siegel and Nicholas Silins have claimed that the doxastic influence of an experience can be an instance of rational access even when that experience receives no attention (Siegel & Silins 2014; Silins 2025); Terry Horgan and Matjaž Potrč have argued that the justification of beliefs by experience must outrun both the contents of attention and the contents of consciousness (Horgan & Potrč 2011). Here, as above, one’s understanding of attention and one’s understanding of epistemology constrain one another, and may provide a theory-driven route by which to settle questions about the possibility of unconscious attentiveness. The direct settling of these questions by experimental or introspective means faces philosophical complications that currently look to be insurmountable, but there are several suggestive findings that could provide the basis for an inference to the best explanation.

3.1.3 How Does Attention Modulate Phenomenology?

Whether or not one thinks that attention is always responsible for bringing things into our consciousness, there are good reasons to think that changes in the direction of our attention can make some difference to the character of our conscious experience. Phenomenologists and Gestalt psychologists have characterized this difference in various ways. Maurice Merleau-Ponty emphasized the way in which attention can organize the array of perceived items into a figure/ground structure. He attributed particular importance to the fact that this configuration is one in which the perceiving subject themselves has a place, at the origin of the perspective from which the figure is located (Merleau-Ponty 1945 [1962: Ch.3–4]). Aron Gurwitsch elaborated a theory, in deliberate contrast to Merleau-Ponty’s, according to which the configuration imposed by attention has a more complex, three-part structure, in which there is a foregrounded figure, a background against which that figure is presented, and also a periphery of things that are not themselves in the foreground, but that appear as relata for the relational properties that situate the foregrounded object in some larger gestalt (see Gurwitsch 1957 [1964]; Arvidson 2006). Sebastian Watzl develops a similar suggestion, in the second half of his 2017 book, on the basis of his claim that the role of attention is to impose a priority structure on our mental lives (see above §2.4), (Watzl 2011, 2017).

There is currently some dispute about whether the differences made by shifts of attention can be adequately characterized as differences in the content of the attended experience. If, as Watzl contends, they cannot, then phenomena of attention create a serious difficulty for any fully general attempt to explain the character of conscious experience by reference to the contents that are represented in it (Chalmers 2004), but such explanations might still be viable in circumscribed domains (Speaks 2010).

Marisa Carrasco and her collaborators have examined the phenomenological influence of attention in a series of studies, which have revealed that the differences produced by shifts of attention include differences in the perceived brightness, contrast, and saturation of colours, but not differences of perceived hue (Carrasco, Ling, & Read 2004; Fuller & Carrasco 2006). Ned Block has suggested that these perceived differences should not be thought of as differences in the content of experience, since to characterize them in that way would be to take it that attending to an item creates an illusion as to its brightness, contrast, etc.; a result which he takes to be implausible. Block therefore interprets Carrasco’s findings as indicating an aspect of experience that cannot be accounted for with a theory in which the phenomenal character of an experience is a function of that experience’s content (Block 2010).

There have been similar disputes, transacted on the basis of more introspective considerations, concerning the effects of attention on the perception of ambiguous figures (such as the Necker Cube, or the Duck/Rabbit). In response to considerations first raised by Fiona Macpherson (Macpherson 2006), Bence Nanay has suggested that the effects of attention on the perception of such figures can be explained by those who maintain that every difference in consciousness is a difference of content (Nanay 2010, 2011). His contention is that the effects of attention on the character of conscious experience should be understood as including a modulation of the specificity of an experience’s content, in which the representations of determinable properties are made more or less determinate. The effects of attention and inattention therefore belong in the family of phenomena that have been thought to create possible counterexamples to representational theories of consciousness (for which, see §4.5 of the entry on representational theories of consciousness).

Other philosophers have approached these issues from somewhat different perspectives. Mattia Riccardi casts attention in a rather different phenomenological role, suggesting (in opposition to the proposal of Matthen 2010) that attention explains the presentness that differentiates one’s perceptual experiences of the real objects in one’s immediate environment from one’s experiences of objects that are seen in photographs, or that are pictured by the mind’s eye during episodes of vivid imagination (Riccardi 2019). A different range of considerations are invoked by Jason Day and Susanne Schmetkamp, who suggest in a 2022 paper that the phenomenological effects of psychedelic drugs should be understood as depending on changes to way in which attention is paid. Jonardon Ganeri’s 2017 book explores the possibility of translating claims about attention’s role in the modulation of consciousness into the terms given by the earlier tradition of Buddhist thought.

3.2 Attention and Demonstrative Reference

Consciousness is only one of the philosophically puzzling mental phenomena that have been thought to be related to attention in ways that may prove to be explanatorily revealing. Demonstrative reference is another. John Campbell has championed the idea that attention contributes to the explanation of demonstrative reference, writing that:

… the notion of conscious attention to an object has an explanatory role to play: it has to explain how it is that we have knowledge of the reference of a demonstrative. (2002: 45)

A similar idea was explored in the manuscript on Theory of Knowledge that Bertrand Russell abandoned (under the influence of Wittgenstein) in the summer in 1913. In that work Russell gives the following statement of the idea that reference to particulars requires attention to them:

At any moment of my conscious life, there is one object (or at most some very small number of objects) to which I am attending. All knowledge of particulars radiates out from this object. (1913: part I, chap. III, 10 [1984: 40])

In support of the Russellian claim that there is an explanatory relation between attention and demonstrative reference, Campbell develops two lines of thought. The first comes from reflection on examples concerning the requirements that need to be met in order to understand demonstrative expressions in conversational contexts where one of the speakers uses expressions such as ‘that woman’, but where various women are present, each of whom is a possible referent for this demonstrative. Knowing which women is meant, according to Campbell, requires attending to the woman in question and knowing that it is to her that the speaker was attending. This is intended to show more than just that the direction of a speaker’s attention is a possible source of evidence for what that speaker means. It is intended as showing that attention and reference stand in a particularly intimate relationship—a relationship that Campbell characterizes by saying that “knowledge of the reference of a demonstrative is provided by conscious attention to the object” (2002: 22).

The second line of thought that Campbell develops in support of the view that attention explains demonstrative reference is one pertaining to deductive arguments in which the premises refer to items that are picked out by demonstratives: Arguments such as ‘(1) That is F. (2) That is G. Therefore (3) That is F and G’. Campbell’s thought here is that such arguments depend for their validity on there being no possibility of equivocating on the meaning of ‘that’, as it occurs in the two separate premises. Such arguments can figure in rationally-entitling reasoning only so long as there is a single fixing of the referent of ‘that’ in both premises. This reference fixing is achieved, Campbell thinks, if and only if there is no redirection of attention between the acts of thought in which the premises are entertained. Again this is intended to show more than just that there is some causal or evidential relation between attending and referring. It is intended to show that the role played by attention in fixing the reference of a demonstrative is analogous to the role played by a Fregean Sense in fixing the reference of a proper name (J. Campbell 2002: Chapter 5).

The explanatory approach that Campbell advocates, and that Russell considered, has traditionally been thought to suffer from a problem of circularity. This problem was urged by Peter Geach in Mental Acts (1956). Geach considers the suggestion that we can use attention to explain our ability to make reference to the things that we perceive, but thinks that no such suggestion can provide a genuine explanation of reference because:

… it is quite useless to say the relevant sense-perceptions must be attended to, either this does not give a sufficient condition, or else “attended to” is a mere word for the very relation of judgment to sense perception that requires analysis. (1956: 64)

Geach’s threat of circularity can be avoided if an independently given theory of how attention is constituted can be shown to illuminate the way in which reference is fixed by it. Imogen Dickie has attempted to show just this. In a 2011 paper she shows that cognitive psychology provides a theory of the role that is played by attention in tracking objects over time. She suggests that such a theory can be used to account for the way in which attending to an object removes any knowledge-defeating component of luck from our inferences involving it, thereby establishing the attended object as a possible topic of demonstrative thoughts (I. Dickie 2011, 2015). This treatment of attention exemplifies some of the central themes in Dickie’s more general attempt to explain how thoughts come to be about ordinary objects (and so how singular terms come to refer to those objects). The explanation that she offers is one in which a thought comes to be about a thing when the justificatory practices in which that thought figures are anchored to the object in question (in a sense of ‘anchoring’ that is spelled out in detail in I. Dickie 2015).

Whether or not a theory of attention can be turned into a non-circular explanation of demonstrative reference, the idea that attention and reference are related does cast some light on what goes on when we understand referring expressions (De Leon forthcoming). Campbell’s examples succeed in suggesting that the things to which we attend and the things to which we refer are often the same. Empirical work on the complexity of maintaining attention has been used to argue that we should allow for similar complexity in the explanation of our capacity to refer (Quilty-Dunn & Green 2023).

There is also some empirical evidence, coming from work in developmental psychology, indicating that attention-related abilities play a crucial role in infants’ development of an understanding of their caregiver’s demonstrative use (see §3.3). Lessons have been drawn from this work that are not only about the comprehension of linguistic expressions. These developmental studies have also been taken to imply something about our grasp on directly referring thoughts. Here—as in the work of Dickie and Campbell—the idea is not only that attention contributes to our production and comprehension of verbal expressions that have particular referents, but that it also contributes to the establishment of those referents as the contents of our thoughts. In addition to these developmental considerations, Michael Barkasi has suggested that the nature of attention’s contribution to fixing the reference of thoughts can be illuminated by considering the pattern of neural projections to the frontal eye fields. Whereas Campbell characterizes attention in epistemic terms, Barkasi favours a sub-doxastic characterization, in which attention ‘sets targets’ and thereby regulates the flow of visual information (Barkasi 2019).

3.3 Attention and Other Minds

There are empirical results, coming from developmental psychology, which are suggestive of an intimate link between the development of various abilities related to attention and the development of various capacities that are involved in understanding the mental states that are expressed in interactions between an infant and its caregiver.

The development of an ability to appreciate what others are attending to appears to be a crucial stage in a normal infant’s progress towards understanding the fact that its caregivers’ utterances have referential intentions behind them. It is also more generally true that capacities for attention develop at important milestones on the route to the acquisition of some distinctively human cognitive capacities (C. Moore & Dunham 1995). There is a distinctive developmental pathway in which normal human infants first develop an ability (and a willingness) to attend to their mother, then to attend to the thing that she is attending to, and then, most importantly, to enter into episodes in which there is a third object that mother and child are attending to jointly, with mutual appreciation of the fact that their attention is shared (V. Reddy 2010; Trevarthen 2011). At various stages along this trajectory infants and caregivers employ complex cues, involving speech, gaze-following, and pointing. Children begin to make use of these cues in their first year of life (Salter & Carpenter 2025)

There is good evidence that the child’s progression along this trajectory is related to its development of abilities to respond appropriately to the mental states of others, and to the development of its ability to acquire new vocabulary on the basis of an understanding of what the words used by its mother refer to (Brooks & Meltzoff 2005; 2008). A longitudinal study has suggested that the earlier stages in this pathway are predictive of the age at which infants reach the later ones—thereby providing some evidence for the hypothesis that this sequence is a causal one—with the mastery at twelve months of pointing as a means to direct the attention of others being predictive of false belief understanding at the age of fifty months, even when factors relating to temperament and language are factored out (Sodian & Kristen-Antonow 2015). A further source of evidence comes from the fact that the arrested development of these attention-involving abilities is a marker of the social and language-related symptoms shown by autistic children (Kanner 1943; Charman 2003; Hobson & Hobson 2011). Other evidence may come from the fact that a lack of such abilities is related to limitations in the mental-state attribution abilities of non-human primates, although this last claim is more controversial (Call & Tomasello 2005).

Some progress has been made towards extracting philosophical lessons from the empirical work indicating that joint attention has a role to play here, in the explanation of distinctively human aspects of cognitive and social development, and that it has a further role to play—once that development is complete—in the explanation of the way in which some elementary social phenomena are transacted. (For several developmental examples, see the papers collected in Eilan et al. 2005 and Seemann 2011; for a discussion of joint attention in adult cases of shared intention, see Fiebich & Gallagher 2013, who argue that jointly attending has a basic, elementary status, as the most minimal instance of a joint action.)

One of the points at which philosophical difficulties arise is in characterizing the sharedness of the attention that is implicated in this developmental trajectory. Christopher Peacocke has argued that the way in which joint attention episodes are shared involves a kind of reciprocal recognition of the other’s recognition of one’s own attention, and that it therefore involves a kind of mutual openness that is analogous to the openness of ‘common knowledge’, as that notion figures in philosophical analyses of communication and convention (see the entry on convention). Since joint attention is achieved by young children, its achievement cannot plausibly be thought to make any very sophisticated intellectual demands. Peacocke therefore argues that awareness of reciprocated openness must be more fundamental than the intellectual achievement of common knowledge. He suggests that it should instead be understood as a variety of perceptual awareness that makes such common knowledge possible (Peacocke 2005). John Campbell shares Peacocke’s view of joint attention as being a perceptual phenomenon, as opposed to a phenomenon that is achieved when one’s perception is cognitively reflected on in a certain way, but Campbell differs from Peacocke in taking the person with whom attention is shared to be a fellow subject of the joint experience, not an object who figures in the content of the experience that each joint-attender individually has (J. Campbell 2002: Ch. 8). Campbell’s attempt to shift the explanation of sharedness from the cognitive to the perceptual domain is rejected by Lucas Battich and Bart Geurts (Battich & Guerts 2021), who suggest that Campbell’s view suffers from problems that originate in his relational conception of perception. They therefore claim that the issues here cast light on the long-running debates between representation-based and relation-based theories of perception (see the entry on the problem of perception).

3.4 Attention and Knowledge

The apparent links between attention and demonstrative reference (see §3.2), and between attention and knowledge of other minds (see §3.3), might be special instances of a more general connection between attention and the making of epistemic moves. A general connection of that sort may have been what Descartes had in mind when he suggested that attention to clear and distinct ideas is a necessary condition for those ideas to realize their special epistemic potential (see §1.1). It might also have been what Stewart had in mind when he suggested that, without an “act or effort” of attention, we have “no recollection or memory whatever” (see §1.4). And we have seen (in §1.2), that Kant’s anthropological writings also cast attention in an epistemically crucial role, as explaining the control that one can exert over representations in thought and in imagination, where this perhaps includes the kind of imagination that Kant took to be involved in making one’s experiences into experiences of an objective spatiotemporal world (Merritt & Valaris 2017).

Although each of these philosophers tended to frame it in a way that reflected their other theoretical commitments, some version of the idea that attention is always involved in the making of epistemic moves can be made pre-theoretically plausible. The inattentional blindness experiments, in which participants are visually presented with large changes while attending to something else, show that inattentive people can fail to notice all sorts of perceivable things that appropriately attentive people would find obvious. Something exactly similar seems to be true in the case of inferential reasoning: just as no item is so large, so central, and so well-lit that no conscious and sighted observer could miss it, so there is no step in reasoning that is so simple, so compelling, and so obvious, that every thinker, whether attentive or inattentive, can be expected to recognise it. Just as the inattentional blindness effects might seem to show that there are attentional demands that a thinker has to meet before his perceptual encounter with things can provide him with knowledge of those things (see §3.1.1), so it is plausible that there are similar attentional demands that have to be met before the thinker’s grasp of a thought gives her a justified belief in that thought’s consequences. This interpretation of the inattentional blindness effects is, however, controversial. Nicholas Silins and Susanna Siegel have suggested that—even if inattention does sometimes explain a perceiving person’s failure to form a belief about the things happening in their visual field—the unattended aspects of an experience are nonetheless capable of providing justification for such beliefs (Silins & Sigel 2019; Silins 2025). Émile Thalabard argues to the contrary (Thalabard 2020). Similar controversies arise in the inferential case.

In both the perceptual and the inferential case the acquisition of knowledge seems to require attention on at least some occasions, and the same has been said about the acquisition of knowledge by introspection (Morris 2025). In all of these cases, the requirement for attention seems to be a practical one. It may be that knowledge of some proposition is required if one’s experience with a gorilla is to provide one with knowledge of the gorilla’s presence (with that proposition being of a sort that could serve as a major premise in an inference by which one’s perceptual experience was interpreted), but the requirement on gaining knowledge from experience cannot merely be that one has this proposition someone in one’s stock of knowledge. Nor can it be that one must be bearing such a proposition in mind. The same is true in the inferential case: What is required before an inferential entitlement can be recognized cannot be that one has to entertain one’s prior knowledge of a proposition from which that entitlement can be deduced. To suppose that occurrent propositional knowledge is what is necessary for such moves would be to embark on the regress set by Lewis Carroll’s tortoise to Achilles (Carroll 1895). What epistemic move-making requires is not occurrent knowledge of a proposition. The thing that it requires is the right sort of active attention.

The attentional requirements that have to be met before one can acquire knowledge from experience or recognize an a priori entitlement are not requirements merely for alertness. They are not captured merely by saying that, in order to gain knowledge, the thinker has to pay attention to the right ideas. A thinker may be attending to a syllogism, but, if he is attending to its rhythm, then it may not occur to him that the conclusion follows. A non-question begging characterisation of the attentional requirements of knowledge acquisition in general would be an important contribution to epistemology. Current work on attention, focusing as it does on attention as a perceptual phenomenon, may give us only part of the general theory that we need. Work on the purely intellectual forms of attention continues to be scarce. This shortcoming has been emphasized by Mark Fortney, who argues that the neglect of intellectual attention has led philosophers to misinterpret some of the claims made in the empirical literature on attention and consciousness (Fortney 2019). Fortney also claims that considerations pertaining to intellectual attention should have a central role in debates about the transparency of phenomenology, and about the consequences of this transparency for the epistemology of self-attributed thoughts (debates that are exemplified, in Fortney’s discussion, by Byrne 2018). Fortney suggests that, when intellectual attention is given this role, certain results from cognitive psychology cast light on these debates. When seen in this light, he suggests that some of the claims that have been made about the transparency of occurrent thought start to seem dubious (Fortney 2020).

3.5 Attention and Voluntary Action

The theories of attention emerging from experimental psychology have focused almost exclusively on attention’s perceptual instances, and have had relatively little to say about its role in reasoning, or in the voluntary production of actions. In this respect these theories contrast with the theories that were developed in the period before psychology and philosophy split from one another, in which a much greater emphasis was placed on attention’s role in the our authorship of our own actions and thoughts. Schiller’s 1779 Philosophy of Physiology takes attention’s role in directing the course of thought to be fundamental to the way in which voluntary control is exercised, and Schiller therefore takes attention to sit at the crux of the mind/body problem. “The soul”, he says:

has an active influence on the organ of thought. It can make the material ideas stronger and at discretion stick to them, and thus it also makes the spiritual ideas stronger. This is the work of attention. It has power over the strength of motivations [Beweggründge]; indeed it is [attention] itself that makes motivations. And now it would be rather decided what freedom is. […] All human morality has its basis in attention, i.e., in the active influence of the soul on the material ideas in the organ of thought. […]. It is attention, then, through which we fantasize, through which we reflect, through which we separate and write, through which we will. It is the active influence of the soul on the organ of thought that accomplishes all of this. And so, the organ of thought is the true tribunal of the mind [Verstand]. (Schiller 1779: §10, quoted in Spiegel 2023: 32)

William James perpetuates this tradition in the Principles of Psychology, when he says that “volition is nothing but attention” (James 1890: vol. 1, 447), and at one time (in what might be read as an anticipation of the competition-based theories discussed above, in §2.6) he proposed that

Attention, belief, affirmation and motor volition are […] four names for an identical process, incidental to the conflict of ideas alone, the survival of one in spite of the opposition of others. (1880: 31)

The issues surrounding attention’s relationship to the voluntariness of action are parallel to some of the issues surrounding attention’s relationship to the consciousness of perception. It seems natural to think that attention is necessary for the voluntary performance of finely tuned behaviours, much as it seems necessary for the conscious perception of fine detail. But it does not seem natural to think that we must be paying attention to the execution of every act that we voluntarily perform, any more than it seems natural to suppose that we must pay attention in order to be consciously perceiving anything at all. A case could therefore be made, on commonsense grounds, for claiming that attention figures in the production of some but not all voluntary behaviours. One can imagine this view being challenged by a theorist who claimed that attention is necessary for any action to be voluntary, arguing that there is an illusion (analogous to the refrigerator light illusion) that gives us the mistaken impression that our inattentive acts are voluntary too. As in the case of attention and consciousness, there is a methodological puzzle (with epistemologically deep roots) about the sort of evidence that could settle this issue. This may be a topic for future research. Denis Buehler has argued that there is a central role for attention in the explanation of flexible goal-directed behaviour, while nonetheless resisting the idea that attention is either necessary or sufficient for an act to be voluntary (Buehler 2019). And in cases of behaviour that involve the exercise of skill, Alex Dayer and Carolyn Jennings have argued against the idea that any simple account can be given of attention’s role in the production of that behaviour, claiming that a theory of attention’s role in skilled performance must instead be ‘pluralist’ (Dayer & Jennings 2021). For the control of actions that are wholly mental, such as inferences, Jennings gives her own account of attention’s role in explaining the control that a person might exercise, and in explaining the way in which this control might be lost or ceded in cases of mind-wandering and Attention Deficit Hyperactivity Disorder (Jennings 2022).

The attentive exertion and focusing of our mental efforts plays a similarly central role in Galen Strawson’s account of the way in which one’s mental life can be brought under voluntary control, but, unlike Jennings, Strawson is keen to emphasise the limits of this control. He endorses William James’s dictum that “the faculty of voluntarily bringing back a wandering attention, over and over again, is the very root of judgement”, but he insists that in exercising that faculty we supervise the progress of our thoughts, rather than exercising any spontaneous control over them (Strawson 2003: 233).

The separation of attention’s role in action from attention’s role in perception is somewhat artificial, especially when the perception in question is perception of one’s own moving body. Psychological research into that particular form of perception has been largely independent of research into the role of attention in vision and audition. A 2016 paper by Gregor Hochstetter reviews the research into this bodily case, and argues, following Marcel Kinsbourne (1995, 2002) that internal representation of a ‘body image’ must play some role in guiding attention during normal bodily awareness (Hochstetter 2016).

4 Attention and Value

Attention makes an explanatorily significant appearance in a broad range of value-theoretic contexts, many of which have been explored in the recent literature.

4.1 Attention in Aesthetics

The subject matter of aesthetics can be demarcated in various ways, each of which is somewhat controversial (see Lopes 2014). One natural thought is that aesthetics might be identified as the branch of philosophy that is concerned with one particular sort of experience, but if that proposal is to be informative then it needs to be supplemented with some specification of which sort of experience this is. That specification cannot be given via an extensional specification of the objects that are experienced, since the same wine might be experienced by the connoisseur and the thirsty man, for example, with only one of their experiences being aesthetic; the same painting might be seen aesthetically by the art lover, and from a purely financial point of view by its dealer.

One response to this would be individuate experiences more finely than their objects, by instead identifying some particular set of properties that are experienced as belonging to those objects in the aesthetic case (see the §2.1 on aesthetic objects in the entry on the concept of the aesthetic). An alternative response is to consider not only the contents that are experienced, but also the way in which the subject experiences them, perhaps by identifying some particular attitude that characterises the subject in the aesthetic case, or perhaps by identifying some mode of attention that that subject instantiates (see §2.1 on the aesthetic attitude in the entry on the concept of the aesthetic). Several attempts have been made to identify such an aesthetic mode of attention. Kant’s famous claims about judgements of beauty having a first moment of disinterested pleasure are usually read as a paradigm of this attitude-identifying approach (see the entry on Kant’s aesthetics and teleology), but Jessica Williams has argued that Kant must also be operating with a notion of aesthetic attention, as being a mode of attention that involves a distinctive combination of imagination and understanding (Williams 2021).

Some such notion of attention also plays a central role in R.G. Collingwood’s account of the way in which art contributes positively to a society’s culture. Collingwood describes attention as “the assertion of ourselves as the owners of our feelings”, and he takes this self-assertion to be crucial in enabling us to exercise volition over those feelings, so that “Their brute power over us is thus replaced by our power over them” (Collingwood 1938: 222). Collingwood therefore takes the diminution of a society’s artistic culture to make it vulnerable to emotive influences (while himself suggesting that this might best be read, not as a fully general philosophical claim, but as a point that is specifically about Europe in the nineteen thirties).

Attempts to demarcate the aesthetic via the identification of an aesthetic attitude or of an aesthetic mode of attention were attacked—for their details, and for their more general orientation, by George Dickie, in a 1964 paper. Arguments inspired by his lines of attack have led to a widespread acceptance of the idea that there is something wrongheaded about specifying necessary and sufficient conditions for an experience to qualify as aesthetic via the identification of some particular aesthetic attitude. Many philosophers nonetheless retain the idea that, in the service of less strictly defined theoretical ends, there are informative things that can be said about the sorts of attitude that are found to be exemplified in typical aesthetic experiences. It is in this spirit that some ideas about distinctive forms of aesthetic attention have recently been revived.

Servaas van der Berg suggests that a distinctive mode of attention can be seen in cases of aesthetic appreciation (van der Berg 2019). He claims that this mode of attention is distinguished by its motivational structure, which has a form that is similar to the motivational structure of game playing, as theorised by Bernard Suits and Thi Nguyen (Suits 1978; Nguyen 2020). This structure is one that inverts the normal order of priorities between means and ends: in normal actions one’s means are typically taken in order to bring about one’s ends, but the game-playing golfer (for example) instead adopts the end of getting his ball into a hole in order that he can take the means to reaching that end. Van der Berg argues that a similar inversion of means and ends is seen in aesthetic appreciation, where the cognitive means that are required in order to reach understanding provide the reasons for adopting the end of understanding an item that is being appreciated aesthetically.

Bence Nanay has set out a position with similar aims—not aspiring to give necessary or sufficient conditions for the aesthetic, but aiming to cast some light on the way in which certain central cases of aesthetic experience operate. He does this by giving an account of the distinctive way in which our attention is engaged in the course of these experiences. Nanay emphasizes the psychological distinction between focused and distributed attention, and uses examples from a range of arts to suggest that aesthetic experiences often require attention of both sorts. He also suggests that this contributes to the value that we place on such experiences (Nanay 2015, 2016).

4.2 Attention in Ethics

Simone Weil suggested that attention has an absolutely central role in ethics, and in value theory more broadly, writing that:

The authentic and pure values—truth, beauty and goodness—in the activity of a human being are the result of one and the same act, a certain application of the full attention to the object. (Weil 1947 [1986: 214])

This apotheosizing of attention provided the basis for Weil’s claims about priorities for education. On these points, her position is shared by a number of other figures whose work sits at the interface of philosophy and literature (see Mole 2017). Christopher Thomas has suggested that the role played by attention in Weil’s ‘ethics of affliction’ can be interpreted as an attempt to extract ethical work from some central notions that are taken from Kant’s aesthetics (Thomas 2020). The influence of Kant was in the foreground when Weil’s claims about attention’s ethical and aesthetic import were developed in the work of Iris Murdoch. Murdoch suggests that there are certain forms of outward-directed attention that play an essential role in the exercise of the virtues, and that certain forms of self-directed attention tend to promote a vicious sort of self-importance, or self-deception (Murdoch 1970; see Bagnoli 2003; Mole 2007). She implies that a capacity for the good forms of attention can be cultivated through experiences of beauty, and so suggests that attention should play an important role in our account of the way in which ethics and aesthetics are related.

These themes have been taken up by Dorothea Debus, who places particular emphasis on Weil’s claim that it is full attention to which value is attributed (Debus 2015). Antony Fredriksson and Silvia Panizza suggest that the aspects of attention that Murdoch takes to be important are seen with particular clarity if one adopts the perspective of Maurice Merleau-Ponty’s account of attention, in which the openness of the attentive mind is emphasized (Fredriksson & Panizza 2022). Nicolas Bommarito has developed an account of modesty along broadly Murdochian lines, as being a ‘virtue of attention’, and he argues that this avoids epistemic difficulties that other accounts of modesty face if they instead characterize modesty as requiring false beliefs about the extent of one’s strengths (Bommarito 2013). In order to develop a more general version of this point, Bommarito and Ganeri draw comparisons between Weil’s treatment of attention and the treatment of attention that can be found the sixth century writings of Buddhaghosa. They suggest that the interplay of ethical and epistemic virtues can very often be understood more clearly—not only for the case of modesty by also more generally—if we take attention to have a central role in virtues of both sorts (Bommarito & Ganeri 2022).

Similar issues are approached from a somewhat different direction by Peter Goldie (2004) and Michael Brady (2010), both of who relate attention and virtue to the epistemic significance of a person’s emotional life. Both Goldie and Brady suggest that the attention-modulating profile of an emotion is essential to it, and both claim that this modulation of attention by emotion plays an ineliminable role in our having a full appreciation of the evaluative properties that we encounter in the world around us. Goldie and Brady disagree as to how this role should be characterized, with Goldie taking the experience of one’s own emotion to itself be a reason-giving experience, with an epistemic authority analogous to one’s experiences of the things in one’s visual field, whereas Brady takes the emotional subject’s experience of items in the world to have an epistemic authority that is not shared by the subject’s experience of their own emotional state, so that that state’s epistemic significance must instead be exhausted by its influence on our outwardly-directed attention (Brady 2013). Jonathan Mitchell has raised questions about how this influence of emotion on attention could be explained (Mitchell 2023), while John Monteleone has drawn on work by Jean-Paul Sartre and Robert Solomon to make the case for thinking that such influences will often be epistemically deleterious (Monteleone 2017).

4.3 Attention and the Norms of Enquiry

Ethically consequential things often happen in the course of the individual and social practices in which we form, scrutinise, and share beliefs (see the section on epistemic deontologism in the entry on doxastic voluntarism), especially when those beliefs pertain to other people. The ethical appraisal of these practices can interact in various ways with their epistemic appraisal, but the norms that are involved in these two forms of appraisal do nonetheless seem to be somewhat distinct, since a rationally unimpeachable process that leads to the formulation of a true belief might nonetheless constitute an improper line of enquiry (on account of being, for example, salacious, impertinent, belittling, or censorious). In appraisals of this latter type, it is quite plausibly the enquirer’s allocation of their attention that is being assessed: we criticise the impertinently nosy enquirer into a person’s weaknesses, not for the rationality or falsity of their beliefs, but for the attention that they pay in forming them. This idea has been used to cast light on a number of questions concerning the norms of enquiry.

Jessie Munton has suggested that an assessment of attention is typically what is at issue when a person is criticised for being prejudiced, and has developed a theory of ‘salience structures’ as a way to represent the import of such criticisms (Munton 2023; 2025). Ella Whiteley has suggested that artists should be understood as giving voice to such assessments of attention and salience when they complain that their art is too often interpreted as an expression of their race or gender identity (Whiteley 2023). Georgi Gardiner has suggested that the norms that are at work in several different assessments of enquiry are ones in which certain patterns of attention are taken to be virtues, and others are taken to be vices, and so has suggested that these norms should be understood using the theoretical apparatus of virtue ethics (Gardiner 2022). Cat Saint-Croix has argued, in dialogue with Rima Basu and Mark Schroeder, that cases of ‘doxastic wronging’ typically involve assessments of attention, rather than assessments of belief as such (Basu & Schroeder 2018; Saint-Croix 2022). Leonie Smith and Alfred Archer have argued that failures to give due attention constitute a distinct and pervasive form of epistemic injustice (Smith & Archer 2020).

4.4 Attention in Social and Political Theory

Many theorists and commentators have noted that some of the largest companies are, like Google and Facebook, ones that receive very little money from the end-users of their best known products, since their business model is instead dependent on them receiving an enormous amount of attention from those users, and on them being paid to influence the way in which this attention is directed. The theorists who have noted this have often taken it to be symptomatic of something that contributes centrally, and regrettably, to the current zeitgeist (James Williams 2018; Odell 2019). Michael Goldhaber seems to have been among the first to describe the underlying phenomenon here as a shift from an ‘information economy’ to an ‘attention economy’ (Goldhaber 1997), following Herbert Simon’s suggestion that one might give an economic construal of the fact that attention becomes scarce when information is abundant (Simon 1971).

The resources of economic modelling are sometimes put to work in support of claims about the political implications of this shift. Balles, Matter and Stutzer, for example, use economic principles to model the shift towards a media-landscape in which the information that influences voting behaviour is determined by the individual voter’s rational allocation of their attention, rather than by the media organizations that control which information is available (Balles, Matter, & Stutzer 2024). Economic terminology is also used to characterize the social importance of attention by theorists with no such commitment to the methods of economic modelling, as when the suggestion is made that the present century has seen a distinctive shift towards the commodification of attention (D. R. Campbell forthcoming). Yves Citton finds that such ideas about the economics of attention already enjoyed some currency at the start of the twentieth century, and argues that the current ‘regimes’ of attention-commodification should be seen in this broader historical context (and without the typical prioritisation of individual attention over its communal and social counterparts). He argues that, in order for the social significance of changes in media to be understood, the effects of these media should be understood in terms that are not only economic but also ecological (Citton 2014). Graham Burnett has suggested that current philosophical theories of attention take an approach that is ill-suited to accounting for the social importance of the ways in which our capacity to pay attention is influenced by these changes (Burnett forthcoming).

The developments of advertising, and of other media industries that have the capture of attention as their goal, have been theorized using the conceptual resources of various social and political philosophies. Jonathan Beller exemplifies a broadly Marxist approach when offering his ‘attention theory of value’ (Beller 2006). Clinton Castro and Adam Pham draw on Debra Satz’s notion of ‘noxious markets’ to argue that technologies designed to maximize attentive engagement should be regulated in ways analogous to the regulation of the tobacco industry (Castro & Pham 2020; drawing on Satz 2010). Georg Franck uses concepts drawn from the work of Levinas and Heidegger to give an account of the attention economy’s role in mediating our transactions of mutual recognition and respect (Franck 1998).

Some attempts to account for the social significance of attention draw on psychological theories (such as Atchley & Lane 2014, who refer to a bottleneck theory of attention [see §2.1]). Other claims about the role of attention in the media economy have been framed with reference to theories of the psychological basis of addiction (e.g., Bharvaga & Velasquez 2021). More metaphorical framings can be found in some work that attempts to foment broader public interest in resisting the ways in which the new media influence our capacity for attention. Recent work by a collective of ‘attention-activists’ compares the commercial exploitation of the new-media’s influence on our attention to a form of psychological ‘fracking’, and champions the establishment of ‘attention sanctuaries’ as a means for resisting this (Friends of Attention, 2026). White and Skorburg offer an account of the way in which some of these metaphors might be exchanged for something more literal (White & Skorburg forthcoming).

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Other Internet Resources

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Christopher Mole <cmole@mail.ubc.ca>

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