Supplement to Branching Time

Long descriptions for some figures in Branching time

Figure 1 description

A tree diagram where m0 to m6, the moments, are nodes, which are connected by segments. Histories are made up of segments that go from bottom to top and cannot be extended further.

  • moment \(m_0\)
    • moment \(m_2\) connect to earlier \(m_0\) by a segment
      • moment \(m_5\) connected to earlier \(m_2\)  by a segment, so that \(m_0\), \(m_2\) and \(m_5\) form  a history, which is labeled \(h_0\)
      • moment \(m_6\) connected to earlier \(m_2\)  by a segment, so that \(m_0\), \(m_2\), and \(m_6\) form a history, which is labeled \(h_1\)
    • moment \(m_3\) connected to earlier \(m_0\) by history \(h_2\)
    • moment \(m_1\) connect to earlier \(m_0\) by a segment
      • moment \(m_4\) connected to earlier \(m_1\) by a segment, so that \(m_0\), \(m_1\), and  \(m_4\) form the history  \(h_3\)

Figure 2 description

Two trees. On the left, the forward branching tree extends into the past in a single line but splits into two lines to extend into the future. This illustrates a single past diverging into multiple possible futures. On the right, the backward branching tree extends to the past in two lines which meet and extend into the future in a single line.

Figure 3 description

A diagram where all lines meet at moment \(m\). The lines extending to the past both split and merge as do the lines extending to the future. 

Figure 4 description

A binary tree diagram with a single line from the past until moment m.  It splits into two lines and the left one extend until moment labeled \(m'\).  The two lines split again and the leftmost of the four lines extend until moment labeled \(m''\). The tree is divided into three horizontal layers,which are represented by dashed lines and represent the instants of  mm', and m".

Figure 5 description

A tree diagram on the left side and a Kamp frame on the right. The tree, \(\mathcal{T}\), is a vertical line which splits into two lines with the left line labeled \(h_1\). The main line continues and splits with the left line labeled \(h_2\) and the right line continuing and splitting again with the left line labeled \(h_3\) and the right line labeled \(h_4\).

The Kamp frame has at the top the \(W = \{w_1,w_2,w_3,w_4\}\), the set of worlds.  The frame itself has four vertical lines of varying heights, each representing a world composed of ordered moments. Each vertical line has the same structure as a path in the tree. Connections between lines (graphically expressed by a double tilde relation) show which moments are shared across worlds.

  • leftmost and shortest line is labeled \(\mathsf{K}_{w_1}\).
  • the column between it and the next has two double tilde symbols.
  • the next line which is the longest is labeled \(\mathsf{K}_{w_2}\).
  • the column between it and the next has five double tilde symbols.
  • the next line which is middlemost in length is labeled \(\mathsf{K}_{w_3}\).
  • the column between it and the next has seven double tilde symbols.
  • the last line which is the same length as the second is labeled \(\mathsf{K}_{w_4}\).

Figure 6 description

A tree diagram on the left side and a Ockhamist frame on the right. The tree, \(\mathcal{T}\), is a vertical line which splits into two lines at the node labeled \(m\) with the left line labeled \(h_1\). The main line continues and splits with the left line labeled \(h_2\) and the right line continuing and including a node labeled \(m'\). It later splits with the left line labeled \(h_3\) and the right line labeled \(h_4\). Other than the two nodes it is the same as the tree in the previous figure 5.

The Ockhamist frame has four vertical lines of varying heights (same heights as the previous figure’s Kamp frame) with a certain number of \(\sim\) symbols in the three columns between. Two moments are related by \(\sim\) whenever they correspond to the same moment in the tree.

  • leftmost and shortest line. It and all the subsequent lines have a node at about the three \(\sim\) symbol level. These nodes are labeled \(\{w_1,w_2,w_3,w_4\}\), meaning that they correspond to the moment m in the tree.
  • the column between it and the next has three \(\sim\) symbols.
  • the second line is the longest.
  • the column between it and the next has seven \(\sim\) symbols.
  • the third line is middlemost in length. In addition to the node at the three \(\sim\) symbol height, it and the next and last line have another at the eight \(\sim\) symbol height. These nodes are labeled \(\{w'_3,w'_4\}\),  meaning that they correspond to the moment \(m'\) in the tree.
  • the column between the third and the fourth lines has nine \(\sim\) symbols.
  • the fourth and last line is the same length as the second.

Figure 7 description

The left diagram depicts causal dispersion: At the bottom is a node labeled \(e'_2\) from it two equal length solid lines go up to nodes labeled \(e'_1\) and \(e'_3\) respectfully. From these two nodes two equal length dotted lines arise and meet.

The right diagram depicts branching dispersion. Like the causal dispersion diagram, at the bottom is a node labeled \(e'_2\) from it two equal length solid lines go up to nodes labeled \(e'_1\) and \(e'_3\) respectfully. Unlike the causal dispersion diagram, there are no dotted lines.

Figure 8 description

A legend and two tree diagrams. The legend describes five possible states for parts of the trees, represented by two segments that branch out at a node:

  • Perspectival actuality, labeled by gray “Act”: one of the segments and the node are grayed out
  • Perspectival presentness, labeled by gray “Now”: the node is grayed out
  • Absolute actuality, labeled by black “Act”: one of the segments and the node are solid black and thicker
  • Absolute presentness, labeled by black “Now”: the node is circled
  • Nonexistence, no label: a completely grayed out node and lines

Both trees have the same structure except for what bits are partially or completely grayed out. Both start at the bottom and branch out at several nodes. 

  • Bottom starts with a line then a node labeled “Act”. The left tree has these as Perspectival actuality while the right has them as Absolute actuality.
  • At the Act node the line splits with one line continuing up and the other branching to the right. The left tree has the right branch in solid black. The right tree has the right branch completely grayed out as a mark of Nonexistence.
  • The line continues up from the Act node to another node labeled “Now”. The left tree has this marked as Perspectival presentness and the right tree as Absolute presentness.
  • The line splits at the Now node and these split again further up. Both trees have these lines and nodes as black.

Figure 9 description

Two very similar trees except for how some of the nodes are labeled (one of nothing or with “Act” or with ”Now”).

  • Bottom starts with a line then a node labeled “Act”
  • The line splits here and these two lines continue up to nodes at the same height. These nodes are labeled “Now” on the first tree and unlabeled on the other tree.
  • The lines split again here and the four lines continue up to another set of nodes at the same height. These are unlabeled on the first tree and labeled with “Now” on the other tree.
  • The two rightmost lines split here and all six lines continue to rise before ending in a series of dots. The four rightmost have nodes at the same height labeled “Act”.

Figure 10 description

The actualism and possibilism trees are similar except for what is grayed out.

  • Bottom starts with a thick black line which rises. It splits once with the right line being thinner and splitting again. The right line and its branches are gray in the actualist tree and black in the possibilist tree.
  • The left line continues up as a thick black line until a gray node labeled “Now”. The line splits here with again the right line being thinner and splitting. The right line and its branches are gray in the actualist tree and black in the possibilist tree.
  • The left line veers left and continues up as a thick black line until a black node labeled “Act”. The line splits here with again the right line being thinner. The right line is gray in the actualist tree and black in the possibilist tree.
  • The line continues as a thick black line until ending in a series of dots.

Figure 11 description

Both trees have the same structure except for what bits are partially or completely grayed out. Both start at the bottom and branch out at several nodes.

  • Bottom starts with a solid black line then a node labeled in black as “Act”.
  • At the Act node the line splits with one line continuing up and the other branching to the right. The right branch is completely grayed out.
  • The line continues upward from the Act node to another node, which is circled and labeled 'Now' in the first tree but neither labeled nor circled in the other tree.
  • The line splits at this node and these split again further up. Both trees have the right branch as gray.
  • For the left branch, the first tree has it as gray. The other tree has it as solid black until the next node which the right tree labels “Now”; subsequent branches are gray.

Figure 12 description

Both trees have the same structure except for what bits are partially or completely grayed out. Both start at the bottom and branch out at several nodes. These are very similar to the trees in Figure 11 except for what is grayed out.

  • Bottom starts with a solid thick black line then a node labeled in black as “Act”.
  • At the Act node the line splits with one line continuing up as thick black and the other branching to the right. The right branch is completely grayed out.
  • The line continues up from the Act node to another node, which is circled and labeled 'Now' in the first tree but neither labeled nor circled in the other tree.
  • The line splits at this node and these split again further up. In the next moment tree the right branch is gray.
  • For the left branch, the first moment tree has it as thin black. The next moment tree has it as thick black until the next node which the next moment tree labels “Now”; subsequent branches are thin black.

Copyright © 2025 by
Giuseppe Spolaore <giuseppe.spolaore@unipd.it>
Alberto Zanardo <alberto.zanardo@unipd.it>

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