Figure 2 description

The diagram illustrates how God’s power produces the universe. At the top, ontologically and diagrammatically, is God understood as a supersubstantial being. He proceeds as two substances, the Universal Soul (together with the Universal Intellect) and Universal Matter. The former has active, the latter passive power.

The diagram shows five ontological steps.

Step 1 “God, the supersubstantial, unexplicated, unity in which all opposites coincide, explicates as two substances”, shown in here in two columns:

Left-hand column:

• Step 2: “Universal Soul/Universal Intellect (the formal principle/cause), substances, in act, which, comprising”
• Step 3: “the substantial forms (Ideas), has”
• Step 4: “active potential”

Right-hand column:

• Step 2: “Universal Matter (the material principle & subject of the formal principle), a substance, in act, and genus of”, leading to
• Step 3, which is set out in two sub-columns:
  • Step 3a: “intelligible matter, which, joined immutably with substantial forms, has”
  • Step 3b: “sensible matter, which, joined with material forms elicited from it by substantial forms, has”
• Step 4, into which these preceding two sub-columns of Step 3 converge: “passive potential or, synonymously, possibility,”

The columns converge in Step 5, centre bottom. Step 5 reads: “by virtue of which the formal & material principles, in mutually reciprocating combination, generate all things, which, as a unity, constitute God’s cognizable image, the universe”.

Between the left- and right-hand columns runs a central column, differentiated from them by the use of grey italics for the wording and dotted connecting lines. This third column proceeds in three steps:

• The same Step 1 as the others: “God”, at the top of the diagram.
• Step 2: “God as absolute, infinite, act, &”, (linked to the steps 2 in the other columns by a horizontal bracket: Univeral Soul/Universal Intellect and Universal Matter).
• Step 3: “His absolute, infinite, potential” (linked by a bracket to the steps 4 in the other columns: active potential and passive potential)

From Step 3, the central column proceeds to the common Step 5, “The Universe”, as described above.

Figure 3 description

God intrinsically a supersubstantial trinity, comprising, as Father, Son & Spirit (this and the next list labeled “God per se, intrinsically, hidden”),

• First Mind, the cause of Being.
• First Intellect, the ‘fount of the Ideas’,
• & Love or, synonymously, Life,

which express themselves extrinsically as (the next list is labeled “God extrinsically”; in addition, from here to the end is set against a grey background labeled “matter, in the intelligible realm, that is, in God’s extrinsic expression, & in the sensible realm”)

• the Being,
• the Universal Intellect, understood as the unity of the Ideas,
• & the Universal Soul

that concomitantly inform sensible matter to produce (the last list labeled “God’s image”):

1. the One Being, that is, the physical universe as an infinite & eternal corporal whole, & hence
2. each thing in it, the variegated presence of being-intelligence-life in things constituting, collectively, Nature