1. For the term ‘immoralism’ see e.g., Dodds 1959, 266 (citing Shorey); Bernard Williams discusses the ‘amoralist’ (1972, 3–13, 1985, 22–32) and ‘immoralist’ (1997). Either label is misleading, in that no term corresponding neatly to our ‘morality’ occurs in Plato’s works, or indeed in the Greek language. What Thrasymachus and Callicles challenge is the value of justice, dikaiosunê. However, ancient talk of justice often maps on to modern talk about ‘morality’ reasonably well, since it is in relation to justice that, in the ancient world, questions about conflicts between self-interest and the demands of virtue tend to be framed. However, it is important to bear in mind that justice is only one of a number of virtues prized by the ancients, and so only one part of what, in the ancient tradition, constitutes the sphere of the moral or ethical. Note that ‘immoralist’ is especially misleading for Callicles in particular, since he seems to be the advocate of an anti-conventional morality of his own.

2. On the real Thrasymachus, see White 1995; on Callicles, Dodds 1959, 12–15; for both, and all of Plato’s dramatis personae, see also the wonderfully comprehensive Nails 2002. Thrasymachus’ fragments and related texts are included in Dillon and Gergel (eds.) 2003; two are of some interest for readers of the Republic. One is an extended excerpt from a political speech -- but (despite the ingenious speculations of White 1995) we cannot know the occasion, intended speaker, or whether it represents his personal views. Second, Thrasymachus is said by Plato in the Phaedrus to have been expert in rousing emotions such as pity in an audience (Phaedrus 267c), and the late Platonist Hermias, in his commentary on the text, cites Thrasymachus as saying "The gods do not view human affairs. For they would not overlook the greatest of goods among humans, justice [dikaiosunê]. For we see that humans make no use of this" (251-2). This sounds very unlike the Thrasymachus of the Republic, with his contempt for justice as naïveté; but there is some overlap in the idea that injustice is pervasive and triumphant in human affairs. Perhaps we should hear the cynicism and contempt of Plato’s character as born of an angry despair.

3. See Anderson 2024, de Romilly 1992, and Bonazzi 2020. Section 6 will briefly note the writings of the sophist Antiphon, who is almost certainly one of the historical models for all three of Plato’s versions of the immoralist position; beyond Antiphon, the most important pre-Platonic text is probably the anti-immoralist Anonymous Iamblichi, available in translation in Dillon and Gergel 2003.

4. Translations are by the author of this entry, otherwise noted.

5. This is an oversimplified picture. For one thing, aretê in Homer’s world sometimes seems to be simply a matter of noble birth, as it is in some later aristocratic authors like Theognis (see Finkelberg 1998). Also, though their relation to aretê is somewhat unclear, Homer and his characters also place enormous value on a complex of more cooperative or selfless character traits such as reverence, piety, self-restraint, compassion, and acceptance of one’s limitations.

6. For a classic discussion see Adkins 1960, though his terminology of ‘competitive’ and ‘cooperative’ virtues seems to me not quite right.

7. See Pendrick 2002 for the text, and Gagarin and Woodruff 1995 or Dillon and Gergel 2003 for translation; for discussion, see Barnes 2002, Riesbeck 2011, and Bonazzi 2020.