Notes to Albert Camus

1. The story is told by Aristotle and cited by Plutarch (Moralia, II, Consolation to Apollonius, 27).

2. In his brief essay, “Remarque sur la Révolte” (Camus 1965, 1682–97), published in 1945, Camus mentioned Being and Nothingness twice while first laying out his idea of revolt. His Notebooks also refer to his reading it in November, 1943 (91).

3. It is found, among other places as “Outcomes justify actions” in Ovid (Heroides, ii, 85—see the Other Internet Resources).

4. Another contemporary approach, focusing on Camus’s stress on authenticity in the use of violence, may be found in Neiman 2017.

5. The 2021 translation by Laura Marris says: “But still, I must tell you: there is no heroism in any of this. It’s about honesty. That idea might seem laughable, but the only way to fight the plague is with honesty.” (P 2021, 175). Stuart Gilbert’s 1948 translation of “honnêteté” as “decency” has been retained above.

Copyright © 2021 by
Ronald Aronson <ac7159@wayne.edu>

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