Programmatic Reading Guide

The following Guide has been divided into sections to facilitate programmatic reading.

A. General books on category theory

A.1 Introductory texts

The following two texts are intended for undergraduates or nonspecialists.

• Lawvere & Rosebrugh 2003
• Lawvere & Schanuel 1997

A.2 Intermediate texts

The following classic textbook includes much more than category theory, but it contains the rudiments of the theory with applications.

• Birkoff & Mac Lane 1999

The following books provide an accessible approach to category theory and categorical logic:

• McLarty 1992
• Awodey 2006

The standard reference on category theory is unquestionably:

• Mac Lane 1998

A.3 Other interesting and useful books

• Adamek et al. 1990
• Borceux 1994
• Freyd 1990
• Hatcher 1982
• Leinster 2014
• Pareigis 1970
• Pedicchio & Tholen 2004
• Riehl 2016

B. Books and articles on higher-dimensional category theory

• Baez 1997
• Baez & Dolan 1998a, 1998b, 2001
• Batanin 1998
• Cheng & Lauda 2004 (Other Internet Resources)
• Cisinski 2019
• Hermida, Makkai, & Power 2000, 2001, 2002
• Leinster 2002
• Lurie 2009
• Simpson 2011

C. Books and articles with a philosophical bent

C.1 Category theory and the philosophy of mathematics

• Awodey 1996, 2004
• Carter 2008
• Couture & Lambek 1991, 1992
• Hellman 2003, 2006
• Krömer 2007
• Lambek 1982, 1994
• Landry 1999, 2001, 2007, 2013, 2018
• Landry & Marquis 2005
• Linnebo & Pettigrew 2011
• Mac Lane 1981, 1986, 1996
• Makkai 1999
• Marquis 1993, 2000, 2006, 2009, 2013, 2018
• McLarty 1993, 1994, 2004, 2005, 2006, 2011, 2018
• Peruzzi 2006, 2016
• Shapiro 2005, 2011
• Sica 2006

C.2 Category theory and set theory

• Awodey 2007, 2008
• Bell 1981, 1982, 1986
• Blass 1984
• Feferman 1977, 2004
• Mac Lane 1969a, 1969b, 1971
• McLarty 2018
• Marquis 1995
• Moerdijk 1998

C.3 Categorical foundations of logic and mathematics

• Bell 1988, 1995, 2001
• Johnstone 1985
• Kock 2006
• Lambek 1994
• Lawvere 2003
• Mac Lane 1997
• Makkai 1998
• McLarty 1991
• Walsh 2017
• Wood 2004

C.4 Applications of category theory to philosophical and cognitive issues

• Ehresmann & Vanbremeersch 2007
• Ellerman 1988, 2017
• La Palme Reyes et al. 1994, 1999
• Lambek 2004
• Lawvere 1992, 1994a, 1994b
• MacNamara & Reyes (eds.) 1994
• Marquis 2000
• Pitts & Taylor 1989
• Yanofski 2003

D. Books and papers on categorical logic

D.1 Introductory books and papers

One of the first introductory books on the subject is and still extremely useful for readers without a strong background in category theory:

• Goldblatt 1979

For readers with a background in logic and set theory:

• Bell 1988
• Bunge 1984
• Caramello 2018
• Mac Lane 1975

D.2 Advanced textbooks

Note that the second volume of (Johnstone 2002a) contains a clear and exhaustive presentation of categorical logic in a topos theoretical setting.

• Barr & Wells 1985
• Jacobs 1999
• Johnstone 1977, 2002a
• Lambek & Scott 1986
• Mac Lane & Moerdijk 1992
• Taylor 1999

D.3 Research monographs

• Adamek et al 1994
• Makkai & Paré 1989
• Makkai & Reyes 1977

D.4 Books and introductory papers written for computer scientists

• Barr & Wells 1999
• Crole 1994
• Peirce 1991
• Pitts 2000
• Plotkin 2000
• Scott 2000

D.5 A book on nonclassical logics from a categorical point of view

• Ghilardi & Zawadowski 2002

D.6 Research papers on various aspects of categorical logic

D.6.1 Completeness results

• Awodey & Butz 2000
• Boileau & Joyal
• Galli & Reyes & Sagastume 2000
• Makkai 1987, 1988, 1997a, 1997b, 1997c
• Makkai & Reyes 1995
• Pitts 1987, 1989

D.6.2 Categorical logic and constructivism

• Awodey & Warren 2009
• Freyd & Friedman & Scedrov 1987
• Johnstone 1979a, 1979b, 1981, 1982
• Lambek 1989
• Lambek & Scott 1981, 1983
• Moerdijk 1984, 1995a
• Moerdijk & Palmgren 1997, 2002
• Pitts 1992
• Seely 1984
• Taylor 1996
• Van der Hoeven & Moerdijk 1984a, 1984b, 1984c

D.6.3 Applications of categorical logic to set theory

• Blass & Scedrov 1983, 1989, 1992
• Bunge 1974
• Freyd 1980, 1987
• Joyal & Moerdijk 1995
• Scedrov 1984
• Tierney 1972

D.6.4 Proof theory

• Blute & Scott 2004
• Cockett & Seely 2001, 2018
• Hyland 1982, 1988, 1991, 2002
• Hyland & Robinson & Rosolini 1990
• Lambek 1986, 1989, 1994
• Van Oosten 2008

D.6.5 Modal logic and other logical systems

• Freyd 2002
• Ghilardi 1989
• Kishida 2018
• Lambek 1993
• McLarty 1986
• Porter 2004
• Rodabaugh & Klement eds. 1992
• Reyes 1991
• Reyes & Zawadowski 1993
• Reyes & Zolfaghari 1991, 1996

E. Applications of category theory

E.1 Books and papers on synthetic differential geometry

• Bell 1998
• Bell 2001
• Hellman 2006
• Kock 2006
• Lawvere 2002
• Moerdijk & Reyes 1991

E.2 Other applications of category theory

• Arzi-Gonczaworski 1999
• Baianu 1987
• Ehresmann & Vanbremeersch 1987, 2007
• Healy 2000
• Healy & Caudell 2006
• Spivak 2014

F. Major books and papers of the history of category theory

F.1 The first period: the origins and first applications 1942-1957

• Eilenberg & Cartan 1956
• Eilenberg & Mac Lane 1942, 1945
• Eilenberg & Steenrod 1952
• Mac Lane 1950

F.2 The second period: the emergence of an autonomous field 1957-1970

• Dieudonné & Grothendieck 1960, [1971]
• Freyd 1964
• Grothendieck 1957
• Grothendieck et al. 1971–1977
• Kan 1958

F.3 The birth of categorical logic

• Freyd 1965, 1972
• Lambek 1968, 1969, 1972
• Lawvere 1963, 1964, 1965, 1966, 1969a, 1969b, 1970, 1971, 1972, 1975, 1976
• Reyes 1974

F.4 On the history of category theory and categorical logic

• Awodey & Reck 2002a, 2002b
• Johnstone 2001
• Krömer 2007
• Lawvere 2000
• Mac Lane 1988, 1989
• Marquis 2009
• Marquis & Reyes to appear
• McLarty 1990, 2006
• Van Oosten 2002