Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.4

Proposition 2.4.
If \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}^*_N (E)\) and \(E \subseteq F\), then \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}^*_N (F)\).

Proof.
If \(E \subseteq F\), then as we observed earlier, \(\mathbf{K}_i (E) \subseteq \mathbf{K}_i (F)\), so

\[ \mathbf{K}^{1}_N (E) = \bigcap_{i\in N} \mathbf{K}_i (E) = \bigcap_{i\in N} \mathbf{K}_i (F) = \mathbf{K}^{1}_N (F) \]

If we now set \(E' = \mathbf{K}^n_{N}(E)\) and \(F' = \mathbf{K}^n_N(F),\) then by the argument just given we have

\[ \mathbf{K}^{n+1}_N(E) = \mathbf{K}^1_N(E') \subseteq \mathbf{K}^1_N(F') = \mathbf{K}^{n+1}_N(F) \]

so we have \(m\)th level mutual knowledge for every \(n \ge 1\).

Hence

\[ \text{if } \omega \in \bigcap_{n=1}^{\infty} \mathbf{K}^n_N(E) \text{ then } \omega \in \bigcap_{n=1}^{\infty} \mathbf{K}^n_N(F). \]

\(\Box\)

Return to Common Knowledge

Copyright © 2022 by
Peter Vanderschraaf
Giacomo Sillari <gsillari@luiss.it>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free