Proof of Proposition 2.5

Proposition 2.5.
\(\omega \in \mathbf{K}^m_N(A)\) iff

(1)

For all agents \(i_1, i_2 , \ldots ,i_m \in N, \omega \in \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \ldots \mathbf{K}_{i_m}(A)\)

Hence, \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}^*_N (A)\) iff (1) is the case for each \(m \ge 1\).

Proof.
Note first that

\[\begin{align} \tag{2} &\bigcap_{i_1\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_1} \big( \bigcap_{i_2\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_2} \big( \cdots \big( \bigcap_{i_{m-1}\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_{m-1}} \big( \bigcap_{i_m\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_m}(A) \big) \big) \big) \big) \\ &= \bigcap_{i_1\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_1} \big( \bigcap_{i_2\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_2} \big( \cdots \big( \bigcap_{i_{m-1}\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_{m-1}}(\mathbf{K}^1_N(A)) \big) \big) \big) \\ &= \bigcap_{i_1\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_1} \big( \bigcap_{i_2\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_2} \big( \cdots \big( \bigcap_{i_{m-2}\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_{m-2}}(\mathbf{K}^2_N(A)) \big) \big) \big) \\ &\,\,\,\vdots \\ &=\bigcap_{i_1 \in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_1}(\mathbf{K}^{m-1}_N(A)) \\ &=\mathbf{K}^m_N(A) \end{align}\]

By (2),

\[ \mathbf{K}^m_N(A) \subseteq \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \cdots \mathbf{K}_{i_m}(A) \]

for \(i_1, i_2 , \ldots ,i_m \in N\), so if \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}^m_N(A)\) then condition (1) is satisfied. Condition (1) is equivalent to

\[ \omega \in \bigcap_{i_1\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_1} \big( \bigcap_{i_2\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_2} \big( \cdots \big( \bigcap_{i_{m-1}\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_{m-1}} \big( \bigcap_{i_m\in N} \mathbf{K}_{i_m}(A) \big) \big) \big) \big) \]

so by (2), if (1) is satisfied then \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}^m_N(A).\) \(\Box\)

Return to Common Knowledge