Proof of Proposition 2.8

Proposition 2.8.
\(\mathbf{L}^*_N(E) \subseteq \mathbf{K}^*_N(E)\), that is, Lewis-common knowledge of \(E\) implies common knowledge of \(E\).

Proof.
Suppose that \(\omega \in \mathbf{L}^*_N(E)\). By definition, there is a basis proposition \(A^*\) such that \(\omega \in A^*\). It suffices to show that for each \(m \ge 1\) and for all agents \(i_1, i_2 , \ldots ,i_m \in N\),

\[ \omega \in \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \ldots \mathbf{K}_{i_m}(E) \]

We prove the result by induction on \(m\). The \(m = 1\) case follows at once from (L1) and (L3). Now if we assume that for \(m = k, \omega \in \mathbf{L}^*_N (E)\) implies \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \ldots \mathbf{K}_{i_k}(E)\), then \(\mathbf{L}^*_N(E) \subseteq \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \ldots \mathbf{K}_{i_k}(E)\) because \(\omega\) is an arbitrary possible world, so \(\mathbf{K}_{i_1}(A^*) \subseteq \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \ldots \mathbf{K}_{i_k}(E)\) by (L3). Since (L2) is the case and the agents of \(N\) are \(A^*\)-symmetric reasoners,

\[ \mathbf{K}_{i_1}(A^*) \subseteq \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \ldots \mathbf{K}_{i_{k+1}}(E) \]

for any \(i_{k+1} \in N\), so \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}_{i_1}\mathbf{K}_{i_2} \ldots \mathbf{K}_{i_{k+1}}(E)\) by (L1), which completes the induction since \(i_1, i_2 , \ldots ,i_k, i_{k+1}\) are \(k + 1\) arbitrary agents of \(N.\) \(\Box\)

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