Proof of Lemma 2.16

Lemma 2.16.
\(\mathcal{M}(\omega)\) is common knowledge for the agents of \(N\) at \(\omega\).

Proof.
Since \(\mathcal{M}\) is a coarsening of \(\mathcal{H}_i\) for each \(i \in N,\) \(\mathbf{K}_i (\mathcal{M}(\omega))\). Hence, \(\mathbf{K}^1_N (\mathcal{M}(\omega)),\) and since by definition \(\mathbf{K}_i (\mathcal{M}(\omega)) = \{ \omega \mid \mathcal{H}_i (\omega) \subseteq \mathcal{M}(\omega)\} = \mathcal{M}(\omega)\),

\[ \mathbf{K}^{1}_N (\mathcal{M}(\omega)) = \bigcap_{i \in N} \mathbf{K}_i (\mathcal{M}(\omega)) = \mathcal{M}(\omega) \]

Applying the recursive definition of mutual knowledge, for any \(m \ge 1\),

\[\begin{align} \mathbf{K}^m_N(\mathcal{M}(\omega)) &= \bigcap_{i \in N}\mathbf{K}_i (\mathbf{K}^{m-1}_{N}(\mathcal{M}(\omega)) \\ &= \bigcap_{i \in N}\mathbf{K}_i (\mathcal{M}(\omega)) \\ &= \mathcal{M}(\omega) \end{align}\]

so, since \(\omega \in \mathcal{M}(\omega)\), by definition we have \(\omega \in \mathbf{K}^*_N (\mathcal{M}(\omega)).\) \(\Box\)

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