Compositionality

There have been many attempts to extend formal semantics to other sorts of representation, including maps (Casati and Varzi 1999, Camp 2007, Rescola 2009, Blumson 2012), images (Kulvicki, 2006, Greenberg 2021), and Venn and Euler diagrams (Shin 1994, Greenberg 2024). In each case, the issue of compositionality can be raised.

A related issue is whether thought is compositional. If thought is a kind of language, it is intelligible to ask whether it is compositional. Thought would not have to be much like English, Korean, or Swahili for the question of compositionality to make sense, but thoughts must have meanings and have meaningful constituents. These assumptions follow from the language of thought hypothesis (see entry).

Even if thought is not a language, it might be compositional in an extended sense. Compositionality demands that some complex representations be derivable from other representations. However, this derivability does not immediately entail that thought is language-like; cf. van Gelder 1990. If the representational properties (or meaning) of the complex representation are determined by the representational properties of the simpler representations and their structures, then the complex representation is compositional in the extended sense.

These issues arise in the major debate within the philosophy of mind between proponents of classical cognitive architecture and proponents of connectionism (see entry). The debate is sometimes presented as a debate about compositionality. However, the issue tends to be whether there are such things as meaningful constituents of thought, and if there are, whether these contribute the same thing to all thoughts in which they occur. If the answer to the first question is negative, the question of compositionality does not arise. If the answer to the first question is positive, the second is independent of compositionality. The debate about connectionism also raises the question about whether semantic composition is reversible. This notion of reverse compositionality is discussed below in section 1.4.2.

1.2 Meaning

Compositionality says that the “meaning” of an expression is determined by the “meanings” of its constituents and by their arrangement in the sentence. What notion of meaning is governed by the principle? Certainly, some notions of meaning such as conversational implicatures are not determined compositionally. However, logicians, philosophers, and linguists have proposed that various notions of meaning can be compositionally determined in a natural or artificial language. This section will briefly review some of these notions. In each case, there have been challenges to their claims of compositionality.

1.2.1 The Compositionality of Reference

Frege constructed an artificial language, the Begriffsschrift, to model reasoning in logic and arithmetic. Frege’s explanation of the Begriffsschrift is a milestone of compositional semantics. In The Basic Laws of Arithmetic, Frege most clearly laid out his syntax and semantics. Frege enumerated basic expressions of Begriffsschrift. The language includes proper names such as ‘Caesar’, ‘Cicero’, and ‘Gaul’. There are also n-ary predicates such as the binary predicate ‘conquered’. Finally, Frege specified rules for deriving complex expressions out of simpler expressions. A sentence is formed by combining an n-ary predicate and n names. So, sentence (2) can be formed by combining the binary predicate ‘conquered’ with two names ‘Caesar’ and ‘Gaul’.

(2) Caesar conquered Gaul.

Frege also proposed meanings for the basic expressions and rules specifying the meaning of a complex expressions in terms of its structure and the meanings of their constituents. The relevant notion of meaning is determined by what is important for logic. Frege calls this notion of meaning Bedeutung, or reference.

For Frege, a proper name refers to an object: ‘Caesar’ refers to Caesar; ‘Cicero’, to Cicero; and ‘Gaul’, to Gaul. An n-ary predicate refers to a function from n objects to truth-values. Since ‘conquered’ is a binary predicate, it refers to a function from two objects into truth-values.

The sentence that results from combining an n-ary predicate with n proper names refers to the value of the function referred to by the predicate for the arguments referred to by the names. For example, (2) refers to the value of the function referred to by ‘conquered’ for the arguments referred to by ‘Caesar’ and ‘Gaul’. So, a sentence such as (2) refers to its truth-value, the true, and a sentence such as (3) refers to its truth-value, the false.

(3) Cicero conquered Gaul.

For Frege, the truth-value is the referent of a sentence because it is sentence’s preeminent logical property.

This fragment of Begriffsschrift is compositional. Indeed, it is widely held that Frege wanted reference to be compositional for the whole language of Begriffsschrift (including logical connectives and the quantifiers). The evidence for this is that Frege clearly holds that substituting expressions with the same reference preserves reference; cf. (Pelletier 2001, 101-2). However, even if Frege aimed for a compositional theory of reference, there is debate about whether he achieved it, for reasons having to do with quantification.^[4]

1.2.2 The Compositionality of Propositional Content

Frege observes that two sentences with the same truth-value can have different cognitive values. For example, the sentences (2) and (4) are both true.

(4) Cicero is identical to Cicero.

However, (2) is significant while (4) is trivial. Frege posits an additional level of meaning, sense, to explain this difference. The sense of a sentence is the thought that the sentence expresses. So, (2) has as its sense the thought that Caesar conquered Gaul, and (4) has as its sense the thought that Cicero is identical to Cicero. A Fregean thought is the object of thinking, belief, and other attitudes. Today, Fregean thoughts are commonly known as propositions (see entry).

Frege also posits senses for subsentential expressions such as names and predicates. One reason is that substituting co-referential names in a sentence does not always preserve its sense. The names ‘Cicero’ and ‘Tully’ both refer to the Roman orator Cicero, but sentences (4) and (5) differ in cognitive significance.

(5) Cicero is identical to Tully.

Frege concludes that names like ‘Cicero’ and ‘Tully’ have distinct senses even though they share a referent.

Frege seems to be arguing that because (4) and (5) express distinct thoughts but differ only in the substitution of ‘Cicero’ for ‘Tully’, these subsentential expressions must have different cognitive values. Although there are disagreements on this point, arguments of this sort suggest that Frege holds that the sense of a complex expression is determined by the senses of its constituents; cf. Dummett 1973, Heck and May 2011, and Pickel 2021. For dissent, see Janssen 1997 and Pelletier 2001.

1.2.3 The Compositionality of Intension

Another milestone in the discussion of compositionality is Carnap’s Meaning and Necessity. Carnap develops an artificial language to model reasoning about possibility and necessity. In this language, substituting one sentence of another with the same truth-value does not always preserve truth-value. The sentences (2) and (4) have the same truth-value, but the sentences ‘Necessarily: Caesar conquered Gaul’ and ‘Necessarily: Cicero is identical to Cicero’ have different truth-values. In Carnap’s language, if a constituent in a complex expression is substituted for another constituent with the same intension, then the new complex expression will have the same intension as the original. Thus, there is a clear sense in which the intension of a expression is determined by its structure and by the intensions of the expression’s constituents. (See Carnap 1947, §§11-12.)

But what are intensions? The intension of an expression determines what Carnap calls an extension for each possibility. An extension is very close to what Frege takes to be the referent of an expression. The extension of a sentence is a truth-value; the extension of a name is its referent; and the extension of a predicate is a set of individuals (or its characteristic function, as in Fregean reference). So, the intension of an expression can be modeled as a function that takes a possibility as argument and returns its extension (or Fregean referent) as value. In Carnap’s own work, possibilities are given by state descriptions, which are sets of sentences defining a possible situation. Today, these possibilities are taken as possible worlds.

The appeal of intensional semantics is not limited to artificial languages like Carnap’s. Compositional intensional semantics has become a dominant approach in contemporary formal semantics for natural language. See Montague 1970; Lewis 1970; Stanley 2009.

1.2.4 Meaning and Context

In contrast to artificial languages, natural languages contain indexicals, which require the distinction between two notions of meaning. On the one hand, expressions have a standing meaning fixed by convention and known to those who are linguistically competent. A sentence such as ‘I conquered Gaul’ is an unambiguous sentence of English. On the other hand, expressions in use are associated with occasion meanings which is discerned by interpreters in part on the basis of contextual information. The utterances of ‘I conquered Gaul’ by Caesar and by Cicero differ in all of the respects covered thus far: truth-value, propositional content, and intension. The terminology of standing meaning and occasion meaning comes from Quine (1960). Kaplan (1977) uses the terms character and content.

Corresponding to these two notions of meaning, there are two versions of the principle of compositionality. Since occasion-meaning is determined, in part, by context (C\(_{\textit{occ}}\)) must be relativized to context:^[5]

(C\(_{\textit{stand}}\))

For every complex expression e in L, the standing meaning of e in L is determined by the structure of e in L and the standing meanings of the constituents of e in L.

(C\(_{\textit{occ}}\))

For every complex expression e in L and every context c, the occasion meaning of e in L at c is determined by the structure of e in L and the occasion meanings of the constituents of e in L at c.

Recently, a number of arguments have purported to show that (C) is false. These arguments pertain to the features that are often modeled as variables: bound pronouns, tenses, and modalities. Schlenker (2002, 64) offers a natural language example. A sentence such as (6) has as its occasion meaning that the referent of ‘he’ in context left two days prior to the context of utterance. So, an utterance of (6) on 4 January 2000 demonstrating John has the same occasion meaning as (7).

(6) He left two days ago.

(7) He left on 2 January 2000.

However, (6) and (7) seem to have different occasion meanings when embedded (even when they are both uttered on 4 January 2000). Contrast the following: ‘Over the years, John told me that he left two days ago’ and ‘Over the years, John told me that he left on 2 January 2000’. Schlenker judges that these two sentences have different occasion meanings. The former sentence says that John repeatedly told the speaker that John left two days before John’s speaking. This suggests that the expression ‘two days ago’ contributes something other than its occasion meaning. One standard response is that an expression such as ‘two days ago’ does not contribute its occasion meaning, but only its standing meaning to determining the occasion meaning of the longer sentence. A rival response appeals to internal dynamics in a sentence to find an appropriate occasion meaning. On these views, the context relevant to determining the occasion meaning of ‘two days ago’ depends on its position in the sentence. For discussion of related cases, see: Rabern 2012, Yli-Vakkuri 2013, King and Glanzberg 2020, and Stonjić 2021.^[6]

1.3 Determination

This section will discuss interpretations of compositionality that differ in their understanding of determination. In what sense is the meaning of a complex expression determined by its structure and the meanings of its parts?

1.3.1 Substitutional Compositionality

If the meaning of a complex expression is determined by its structure and the meanings of its constituents, then any expression with the same structure and the same meanings assigned to its corresponding constituents must have the same meaning. One way of implementing this idea is to hold that if two complex expressions differ only by the substitution of synonyms, then they are synonymous. The antecedent of this principle is meant to hold fixed the structure of the complex expression and the meanings of its pairwise constituents. The only thing that differs between the complex expressions are the words used, not their meanings. Thus, the complex expressions must have the same meaning.

This interpretation assumes that compositionality is local. If the expressions ‘book thieves’ and ‘biblioklepts’ are synonyms, then local compositionality demands that expressions that differ by substituting ‘book thieves’ for ‘biblioklepts’ have the same meaning. Global compositionality says that the meaning of a complex expression is determined not merely by its immediate structure and the meanings of its immediate constituents, but by its total structure and the meanings of all of its constituents (including both immediate and non-immediate constituents). If global compositionality holds, then substituting basic constituents with the same meaning will always preserve meaning. Substituting non-basic constituents can change meaning. Because local compositionality is more relevant for linguistics, the following discussion will be centered around this principle.

The interpretation also assumes that constituents (rather than mere sub-strings) are substituted. Otherwise, as Geach pointed out, the synonymy of ‘Plato was bald’ with ‘Baldness was an attribute of Plato’ would guarantee the synonymy of ‘The philosopher whose most eminent pupil was Plato was bald’ and ‘The philosopher whose most eminent pupil was baldness was an attribute of Plato’ (Geach 1965, 110).

The principle that synonyms are substitutable comes in two versions:

(S\(_{\textit{singular}}\))

If two meaningful expressions differ only in that one is the result of substituting a synonym for a constituent within the other, then the two expressions are synonyms.

(S\(_{\textit{plural}}\))

If two meaningful expressions differ only in that one is the result of substituting some synonyms for some constituents within the other, then the two expressions are synonyms.

The principle (S\(_{\textit{singular}}\)) says that substituting one synonym at a time preserves meaning. The principle (S\(_{\textit{plural}}\)) says that substituting several synonyms at a time preserves meaning. The two principles are equivalent given a background assumptions about substitution.

The background assumption concerns whether substitution of synonyms can turn a meaningful expression into a meaningless one, and whether it can turn a meaningful expression into an expression with a different meaning. The principle that rules out the former possibility was first proposed by Husserl (1913, 318), and it is usually stated in terms of the notion of a semantic category. Two expressions belong to the same semantic category just in case they are intersubstitutable within any meaningful expression salva significatione (without loss of meaningfulness). According to Husserl’s principle:

(H)

Synonyms belong in the same semantic category.

Assuming in addition that the language satisfies (H), (S\(_{\textit{singular}}\)) is equivalent to (S\(_{\textit{plural}}\)); cf. Hodges (2001: Theorem 4). The reason that the two principles are not equivalent without (H) is that it is possible that a double substitution of expressions yields a meaningful expression while individual substitutions do not. Hodges (2001, 13) offers the example that starting with ‘fast asleep’ and jointly substituting ‘fast’ for ‘deeply’ and ‘sleeping’ for ‘asleep’ yields a meaningful expression ‘fast asleep’. On the other hand, the individual substitutions yields expressions that may not be meaningful: ‘fast sleeping’ and ‘deeply asleep’.

(H) is a controversial for natural language—intuitively, there are many synonyms that are not everywhere intersubstitutable. For example, ‘likely’ and ‘probable’ mean pretty much the same even though ‘Jacques is likely to leave’ is meaningful while ‘Jacques is probable to leave’ is arguably not; cf. Gazdar (1985, 32).^[7] And—more controversially—there might be synonyms that are almost nowhere intersubstitutable: ‘quick’ and ‘quickly’ are good candidates.

1.3.2 Rule-to-Rule Compositionality

Sometimes the claim that L is compositional is presented directly as a claim about the relationship between its syntax and semantics. The following thesis is often called rule-to-rule compositionality:

(RR)

To every syntactic rule corresponds a semantic rule that assigns meanings to the output of the syntactic rule on the basis of the meanings of its inputs.

Consider a rule of a toy syntax that allows one to combine a noun phrase (such as ‘Caesar’, ‘Cicero’, ‘Tully’) with a verb phrase (‘conquered Gaul’) to form sentences (‘Caesar conquered Gaul’, ‘Cicero conquered Gaul’, ‘Tully conquered Gaul’, and so on). Rule-to-rule compositionality says that there is a corresponding rule G that specifies the meanings of the sentence in terms of the meanings of its constituents. The meaning of ‘Caesar conquered Gaul’ would be the result of applying the operation G to the meanings of ‘Caesar’ and ‘conquered Gaul’. The meaning of ‘Cicero conquered Gaul’ would similarly be the result of applying G to the meanings of ‘Cicero’ and ‘conquered Gaul’.

Montague (1970) suggested a perspicuous way to formally capture rule-to-rule compositionality: compositionality requires the existence of a homomorphism between the expressions of a language and the meanings of those expressions. Consider the expressions of a language (including both simple and complex expressions) as a set E upon which a number of operations (syntactic rules) are defined. There is a set \(\Gamma \) of syntactic rules for the language. Each of the rules \(F_{\gamma}\) is characterized by a (partial) function that takes a fixed number of expressions from E and returns another expression of E. For example, one rule might combine a noun phrase (‘Caesar’) and a verb phrase (‘conquered Gaul’) to form a sentence (‘Caesar conquered Gaul’). The expressions E and rules in \(\Gamma \) define a partial algebra \(\mathbf{E} = \langle E, (F_{\gamma})_{\gamma \in \Gamma}\rangle\). Call this the syntactic algebra. This is just the set of expressions in the language and the set of formation rules relating them.

Compositionality concerns the relationship between the language (the syntactic algebra) and the set of meanings. A meaning-assignment m is a function that maps expressions in E to M, the set of available meanings for the expressions of E. On Montague’s implementation, compositionality demands that the meaning assignment m is a homomorphism.

Consider a specific syntactic operation F which takes k expressions, \(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k\), as input and specifies a complex expression, \(F(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k)\). m is a homomorphism for operation F if and only if there is a k-ary partial function G on M such that whenever \(F(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k)\) is defined,

\[m(F(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k)) = G(m(e_1),\ldots ,m(e_k)).\]

In English: this means that there is a partial function G from the meanings of \(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k\) to the meaning of the expression built from \(e_1 ,\ldots ,e_k\) through an application of the syntactic rule F. To return to the example, for the syntactic rule that forms a sentence by concatenating a noun phrase (‘Caesar’) with a verb phrase (‘conquered Gaul’), there is a semantic rule G such that the meaning of the sentence (such as its truth-value or intension) is determined by applying G to the meaning of the noun phrase (say, Caesar) and the meaning of the verb phrase (such as the set of people who conquered Gaul).

Finally, the meaning assignment m is compositional simpliciter just in case m is a homomorphism for each syntactic operation in E. Whenever m is compositional, it induces the semantic algebra \(\mathbf{M} = \langle M, (G_{\gamma})_{\gamma \in \Gamma}\rangle\) on M, and it is a homomorphism between E and M; cf. Westerståhl (1998). (For details, variants, and formal results, see Janssen 1983, 1997, Hodges 2001, and Pagin & Westerståhl 2010a. For generalizations that cover languages with various sorts of context-dependence, see Pagin 2005, Pagin & Pelletier 2007, and Westerståhl 2012.)^[8]

1.3.3 Compositionality Across Languages

The substitutivity of synonyms and rule-to-rule compositionality each seem to be entailments of the principle of compositionality. However, they are both language-bound in ways that the compositionality principle itself is not. Each principle rules out the existence of a pair of non-synonymous complex expressions with identical structure and pairwise synonymous constituents within a single language. However, the principles say nothing about how to compare meanings across languages. There are two issues with this.

One issue is that both implementations are compatible with the existence of non-synonymous complex expressions in different languages with the same structure and whose constituents have the same meaning. This is a violation of the idea that the meaning of a complex expression is determined by its structure and by the meanings of its constituents. Here is an illustration from Szabó (2000b). Suppose English is compositional. We define a new language Crypto-English that is just like English one small difference. So, Crypto-English has the same expressions and the same syntax as English. Semantically, all expressions of Crypto-English have the same meanings with one important exception. Take two of its non-synonymous sentences, say, ‘Elephants are grey’ and ‘Julius Caesar conquered Gaul’. The only difference between the two languages is that if a sentence is synonymous in English with one of the two designated sentences, then it is synonymous with the other in Crypto-English. Given the assumption that English is compositional, there is no pair of non-synonymous complex expressions in English with identical structure and pairwise synonymous constituents. Trivially, the same must hold for Crypto-English as well. But intuitively, Crypto-English is not compositional. The structure and the meanings of constituents of the Crypto-English sentence ‘Elephants are grey’ cannot determine what this sentence means in Crypto-English—if they did then the structure and the meanings of constituents of the English sentence ‘Elephants are grey’ would have to determine what ‘Julius Caesar conquered Gaul’ means in English. If there is a language such as Crypto-English in addition to English, it would follow that the meaning of a complex expression is not determined only by its structure and by the meanings of its constituents, but also by the language in which it occurs.

We have understood compositionality as saying that the meaning of a complex expression is determined by its structure and the meanings of its constituents. The problem is that this formulation is compatible with different languages having different functions from structures and the meanings of the parts to the meaning of the whole. This can be avoided by requiring that in every possible natural human language, the meaning of a complex expression is determined by the same function from structures and the meanings of the constituents.

(C\(_{\textit{cross}}\))

For every complex expression e in L, the meaning of e in L is functionally determined through a single function for all possible human languages by the structure of e in L and the meanings of the constituents of e in L.

It was assumed that English and Crypto-English have the same syntactic rules (and thus the same structures) and that the meanings of the basic expressions are the same. If the function that determines the meanings of the complex expressions must be the same in all languages, then the possibility of a language such as Crypto-English, which differs from English only by switching the denotations of certain complex expressions, is ruled out.

The other issue arises from the fact that the principle of compositionality is meant to abstract away from the particular features of the words (e.g. spelling, pronunciation) in determining the meanings of complex expressions. For example, if ‘biblioklept’ and ‘book thief’ have the same meaning, then complex expressions that differ only by the choice of one expression for the other have the same meaning. The identities of the words don’t matter to determining the meaning of the complex expression. Suppose that there is a natural language that contains a word meaning the same as ‘Caesar’ and a phrase meaning the same as ‘conquered Gaul’. Suppose that there is a syntactic rule that combines these expressions into a sentence. Does the principle of compositionality (understood as either the substitutivity of synonyms or as rule-to-rule compositionality) entail that this sentence has the same meaning as the English sentence (2) ‘Caesar conquered Gaul’? It does not. The principle of compositionality says that if two sentences have the same structure and their corresponding constituents have the same meanings, then the two sentences have the same meaning. In order to infer that the meaning of the sentence of the new language is the same as the meaning of (2), one needs the additional premise that the two sentences have the same structure. In the context assumed so far, this would mean that the syntactic rule from which the new sentence is derived is the same as the syntactic rule from which the English sentence (2) was derived. This (toy) English rule said that a sentence can be derived by combining a noun phrase and a verb phrase. However, the new language might not even have the same syntactic categories as English.

One response strengthens rule-to-rule compositionality. Rule-to-rule compositionality says that for every rule generating a complex expression out of some constituent expressions, there is a function from the meanings of the constituent expressions to the meaning of the whole. In other words, for every syntactic composition rule, there is a corresponding semantic composition rule. The new response restricts the range of admissible semantic composition rules. There are only a few functions from the meanings of the constituents to the meanings of the complex.

Some have held that a single semantic evaluation rule specifies the meaning of a complex in terms of its structure and the meanings of its constituents and that this rule applies in every natural language. This type of view might be seen in Lewis’s (1970, 29) description of the appeal of a “uniform function-and-argument” rule. On this view, every complex expression E in any natural language has a constituent whose meaning is a function f, and the meaning of E is the value of f when it takes the remaining constituents as arguments. So, if (2) is composed of ‘Caesar’ and ‘conquered Gaul’, then the meaning of ‘conquered Gaul’ is a function and the meaning of ‘Caesar’ is an argument for the function. The meaning of (2) would be the result of applying this function to the meaning of ‘Caesar’. In any language, if there is a sentence with one component meaning the same as ‘Caesar’ and the other component meaning ‘conquered Gaul’, the meaning of this sentence will be determined in exactly the same way. Other approaches agree that there is a single uniform semantic evaluation rule for all natural languages but deny that it is functional application. For instance, Pietroski (2005, 2012, 2018) advocates a relatively uniform rule of conjunction. The meaning of any complex expression is the result of conjoining the meanings of its constituents.

Many standard works opt for a minimum set of rules rather than a single semantic rule. On these views, it is not the case that every syntactic formation rule corresponds to the same function in every natural language. Even within a language, different syntactic formation rules correspond to different function. However, each new semantic rule is considered a cost to the theory; cf. Heim and Kratzer 1998 (65-67).

These approaches can be freed from dependence on features of a particular language by embracing type-driven compositionality, which is another strengthening of rule-to-rule compositionality. Type-driven compositionality assumes that meanings divide into a variety of semantic types just as expressions divide into syntactic categories. There are certain admissible rules for putting meanings of some given types together in order to determine another meaning. Type-driven compositionality says that the meaning of a complex expression is determined by the meanings of its immediate constituents alone. Type-driven compositionality is meant to explain why speakers do not need to learn the particular identity of the syntactic rules of a language in order to derive the meaning of a complex expression from their knowledge of the meaning of its constituents. Type-driven compositionality is normally combined with the thesis that syntactic branching is binary so that every complex expression has exactly two immediate constituents. It would follow that the meaning of any expression is wholly determined by the meanings of its two immediate constituents. The original sources of this idea are Klein and Sag 1982 and Jacobson 1982. Some modern discussion includes (Heim and Kratzer 1998, §3.1) and (Jacobson 2014, chapter 6).

2 Related Principles

This section compares (C) to some principles often discussed alongside compositionality.

2.1 Collective Compositionality

Compositionality says that the meaning of a complex expression is determined by its structure and the meanings of its constituents. One plausible consequence was the substitutivity of synonyms: that if two complex expressions differ by the substitution of one term for a synonym, then the complex expressions have the same meaning sentence. However, to derive this consequence, compositionality must be construed as distributive. Each occurrence of an expression contributes its meaning individually to expressions that contain it.

Distributive compositionality has been challenged, however. Putnam (1954), Kaplan (1990, 95, footnote 6), and Fine (2007) have held that ‘Cicero’ and ‘Tully’ are synonyms, but ‘Cicero is Cicero’ and ‘Cicero is Tully’ are not. They argue that the difference in meaning arises from the fact that the former sentence encodes semantic co-reference between ‘Cicero’ and ‘Cicero’, but the latter does not encode coreference between ‘Cicero’ and ‘Tully’. They thereby propose principles weaker than compositionality such as collective compositionality (C\(_{\textit{coll}}\)):

(C\(_{\textit{coll}}\)) For every complex expression e in L, the meaning of e in L is determined by the structure of e in L and the meanings of the constituents of e in L collectively.

On Fine’s view, what the constituents of ‘Cicero is Cicero’ collectively mean goes beyond what the constituents of ‘Cicero is Tully’ do. The collective meaning comprises the individual meanings plus certain meaning-relations that hold among them. Call the weak principle (C\(_{\textit{coll}}\)) collective compositionality; following usual practice (C) will be understood as distributive compositionality.

Fine thinks the meaning of ‘Cicero is Cicero’ depends on its structure (this is why it is not synonymous with ‘Is Cicero Cicero?’), on the individual meanings of its constituents (this is why it is not synonymous with ‘Cicero is Caesar’), and in addition on the intended co-reference relation between the subject and the object, which is an aspect of the collective meaning of its constituents (this is why it is not synonymous with ‘Cicero is Tully’).

Fine (2007, 38) is explicit that this his approach is meant to be a departure from standard conceptions of compositionality such as local and global compositionality glossed above. This is certainly true of the views of Putnam and Kaplan. It is debatable whether Fine’s own approach abandons many standard forms of compositionality. By making the co-reference relation a separate input to the semantics, Fine’s view may preserve global compositionality; cf. Pickel and Rabern 2017.^[9]

2.2 Reverse Compositionality and the Building Principle

A commitment of compositionality as understood by (C) is that if two expressions have different meanings, then they must either have different structures or some corresponding pair of constituents must have different meanings. Reverse compositionality say that this claim is reversible: if two expressions have the same meaning, then they must have the same structure, and all of their corresponding constituents must have the same meaning. For example, ‘book thief’ and ‘biblioklept’ have different structures. So, by reverse compositionality, they must have different meanings. Reverse compositionality neither entails nor is entailed by compositionality understood as (C). While (C) is a widely assumed principle in natural language semantics, reverse compositionality is not. However, many debates in philosophy of mind (especially those pertaining to connectionism) concern reverse compositionality. (Fodor (1998b), Fodor & Lepore (2001), and Pagin (2003) advocate reverse compositionality; Patterson (2005), Robbins (2005), and Johnson (2006) are among its opponents. The debate is complex, in part because at least some proponents of reverse compositionality advocate it only for the language of thought; cf. Fodor 2001.) The issue is also discussed in connection with the representational properties of images; see Isaac 2017.

The claim that L is compositional is sometimes taken to mean that the meaning of an arbitrary complex expression in L is built up from the meanings of its constituents in L—call this the building principle for L. This is a fairly strong claim, at least if the building metaphor is taken seriously. For then the meanings of complex expressions must themselves be complex entities whose structure mirrors that of the sentence; cf. Frege 1892, 1919. This presumably entails but is not entailed by compositionality as understood by (C); cf. Keller and Keller 2013 and Keller 2022. It also seems to entail reverse compositionality.

2.3 The Primacy of Words

Often, to say that one thing determines another is to attribute causal or explanatory priority. Although the principle of compositionality is usually not understood in this way, sometimes philosophers read it as a principle that asserts the priority of word meaning over sentence meaning, or more generally, the priority of the meanings of lexical items over the meanings of complex expressions:

(P)

Complex expressions have their meanings in virtue of their structure and the meanings of their constituents.

(P) is often thought to be in tension with the idea that each expression has the meaning it does in virtue of the way it is used within some linguistic community. The conflict is supposed to arise because (i) the use of an expression is exhausted by its employment in speech acts, and (ii) it is sentences, not words, that can be employed to make speech acts. Against this, it can be argued that referring is among the speech acts speakers routinely perform and that this speech act is done with words, not sentences. One might try to replace (i) with a stronger claim, for example, that the use of an expression is exhausted by its employment in asserting, asking, commanding, and a few of other speech acts not including referring. But even if true the stronger claim may not save the argument against (P) because, at least prima facie, one can make assertions uttering isolated words; cf. Stainton (2006). Davis (2003) develops a detailed theory of meaning that combines (P) with a version of the use theory of meaning. (For some arguments against (P), see Szabó (2019).)

2.4 The Context Principle

Speakers do not learn the meanings of the constituent expressions in isolation. Rather, speakers learn the meanings of many basic expressions by seeing them used in the context of a complete sentence. For example, one might learn the meaning of a number word such as the word ‘four’ by seeing it used in sentences such as ‘Jupiter has four moons’ rather than by confronting the meaning of the word on its own.

Considerations such as these led Frege to famously declare in section 60 of the Foundations of Arithmetic that only within a complete sentence do words have meaning. This has come to be referred to in the literature as Frege’s context principle. Frege writes that “it is enough if the sentence as whole has meaning; thereby also its parts obtain their meanings” (Frege [1884] 1950: section 60).^[10] This context principle has many interpretations. On some interpretations, the context principle conflicts with the principle of compositionality. The prima facie tension between the context principle and compositionality has been noted across times and cultures. It was, for instance, raised and addressed in the tradition of Prabhākara Mīmāṃsā in classical Indian philosophy; cf. Ollett 2020.

Read literally, Frege’s statement asserts that words have their meanings in virtue of the meaning of sentences in which they occur as constituents. This is incompatible with (P), but not with (C). Even if words are meaningful only because they occur as constituents within sentences, there could still be a function that maps the structure of a sentence and the meanings of its constituent words to the meaning of that sentence. There would remain a sense in which the meanings of the words determine the meanings of the sentences.

There is an alternative way to construe Frege’s context principle, a way that makes it a determination claim, not a primacy claim. To state it in a form that matches the generality of (C), it must be generalized to apply to all complex expressions and their constituents. On one interpretation (F\(_{\textit{all}}\)), the meaning of an expression such as ‘conquered’ is determined by the meanings of the totality of expressions in which it occurs in a constituent: ‘Caesar conquered Gaul’, ‘Cicero conquered Gaul’, ‘Caesar conquered Rome’, and so on.

(F\(_{\textit{all}}\))

The meaning of an expression is determined by the meanings of all complex expressions in which it occurs as a constituent.

According to (F\(_{\textit{all}}\)), for the word ‘conquered’ to have a different meaning one of the expressions it occurs in must have a different meaning. Like the principle of compositionality, (F\(_{\textit{all}}\)) can be interpreted as a claim about reference or meaning, locally or globally, collectively or distributively, in a language-bound manner or cross-linguistically. Compositionality is about bottom-up meaning-determination, while the context principle about top-down meaning-determination. As long as it is not understood as a causal or explanatory relation determination can be symmetric, so any version of (C) is compatible with the corresponding version of (F\(_{\textit{all}}\)).

There is a strengthening of (F\(_{\textit{all}}\)), according to which the meaning of an expression is determined not only by the meanings of all expressions in which it occurs as a constituent, but by the meaning of any one of these expressions:

(F\(_{\textit{any}}\))

The meaning of an expression is determined by the meaning of any complex expression in which it occurs as a constituent.

If (F\(_{\textit{any}}\)) is true, then the meaning of ‘conquered’ is wholly fixed by the fact that ‘Caesar conquered Gaul’ means what it does. (F\(_{\textit{any}}\)) is an immediate consequence of reverse compositionality. (F\(_{\textit{any}}\)) is incompatible with many standard semantic theories. For example, a simple intensional semantics assigns to each sentence the set of possible worlds where it is true. Consider a language that contains the standard logical operators, and so any sentence is a constituent of a necessarily true sentence. Since the meaning of a necessary truth is the set of all possible worlds, this set would have to determine the meanings of all sentences in the language, which is implausible. There are principles of intermediate strength between (F\(_{\textit{all}}\)) and (F\(_{\textit{any}}\)). These principles allow that the meaning of an expression may be fixed by the meanings of some set or sets of complex expressions in which it occurs.^[11]

3. Arguments for Compositionality

The simplest argument for compositionality is that it accords with the ordinary experience of language. Human beings learn simple words and grammatical structures. They often use their understanding of the words and structures in order to understand more complex structures. Although there are interesting putative counterexamples (see section 3.2), these can often be explained away through revisions of syntactic and/or semantic theories. This argument is a reasonable starting point, but its evidential value is limited. It does not fully distinguish compositionality from related principles or show that it applies in all cases. The pre-theoretic appeal of compositionality will not convince those who find some of the proposed revisions unacceptable. Moreover, this argument does not reveal the overall role compositionality should play in semantic theory. This section will explore two kinds of argument for compositionality. Empirical arguments propose that compositionality best explains some linguistic phenomenon. Methodological arguments propose that compositionality is justified by the role it plays in semantic theories.

3.1 Empirical Arguments

The empirical arguments for compositionality identify some particular observed fact in need of explanation. They offer an explanation for this fact in which compositionality is a central component. These empirical arguments are not deductively valid arguments. The arguments take the form of inferences to the best explanation. It is argued that compositionality is part of the best explanation of some observed fact. The arguments fail if a better explanation can be found for the observed fact.

3.1.1 Productivity

The most common argument for compositionality is based on productivity. The argument begins with the observation that speakers can understand a large number of complex expressions they have never before encountered. A speaker of English will understand the sentence (8) even though they have never explicitly encountered that sentence before.

(8) A book thief will steal a short book before a long book because short books better fit in large coats.

This ability to understand novel complex expressions requires explanation.

To bolster the claim that speakers do, in fact, understand complex expressions they have never heard before, philosophers often appeal to unboundedness: although humans are finite beings, they have the capacity to understand each of an infinitely large set of complex expressions. Although there are dissenters—e.g., Ziff (1974) and Pullum & Scholz (2010)—the claim that natural languages contain infinitely many complex expressions is plausible.^[12] But it is equally plausible that nobody who reads this entry the first time has ever encountered this very sentence before, and consequently, the detour through cardinality considerations seems superfluous.

Speakers cannot so easily understand novel simple expressions. A speaker who has never encountered the word ‘lugubrious’ before will need its meaning explained. The argument from productivity is that compositionality is part of the best explanation of speakers’ ability to understand novel complex expressions. The argument can be found in Frege, who claimed that

the possibility of our understanding sentences which we have never heard before rests evidently on this, that we can construct the sense of a sentence out of parts that correspond to words. (Frege [c. 1914] 1980: 79)

The details of the argument can be expanded without assuming that meanings are Fregean senses.^[13]

How can a speaker’s ability to understand novel complex expressions such as (8) be explained? It can be explained by assuming (Prod1) that (8) has constituents that are put together according to certain rules; (Prod2) that speakers know the meanings of these constituent expressions and know the rules for putting them together; and (Prod3) that if anyone can understand some expressions and the syntactic rules for deriving a complex expression out of these simpler expressions, then they can understand the complex expression. Given (Prod1), (Prod2), and (Prod3), the observed fact that speakers understand (8) would be explained.

Compositionality figures in this explanation because (Prod3) itself needs to be explained. How can speakers pass from their understanding of some more basic expressions and a syntactic rule for putting them together to form a larger expression to understanding the meaning of the complex expression? The argument from productivity assumes that (Prod3) is best explained if some form of the principle of compositionality is true, and the meaning of the complex is determined by its structure and the meaning of its constituents.

Occasionally, the fact that natural languages are learnable is also used to argue for compositionality. This is not a wholly independent argument: one reason it is remarkable that one can learn a natural language is that once one has learnt it, one’s understanding is productive. If one could not understand expressions one has never encountered before without detailed empirical study, then it might be that the language was learned by rote memorization. That said, compositionality may explain the fact that natural languages are learnable by constraining the space of hypotheses about the meanings of the complex expressions of the language; cf. Del Pinal 2015.

3.1.2 Systematicity

Another argument for compositionality is based on systematicity, the fact that there are definite and predictable patterns among the sentences a speaker understands. In particular, the observed datum is that speakers can generally understand grammatical recombinations of sentences they already understand. A speaker who understands the sentences ‘the dog is asleep’ and ‘the cat is awake’ can generally understand the sentences ‘the dog is awake’ and ‘the cat is asleep’.

Like the argument from productivity, the argument from systematicity seeks to explain how speakers can go from their understanding of some portion of the language to their understanding of novel sentences. The portion of the language that a speaker is assumed to understand is a set of sentences. The novel expressions are those that result from permuting the basic vocabulary.

The explanation is meant to run as follows: (Sys1) A speaker who understands some complex expressions understands the rules that generate it and knows the meanings of its constituents; (Sys2) speakers who understands the rules that generate a complex expression can apply it to other expressions they understand; and (Sys3) if a speaker understands the meanings of some constituent expressions and understands a rule for putting them together, then the speaker can understand the complex expression that results from putting the basic expressions together. A speaker who understands ‘the dog is asleep’ and ‘the cat is awake’ can also understand the constituents ‘the dog’, ‘the cat’, ‘is asleep’, and ‘is awake’ and the rule for combining noun phrases and verb phrases. The speaker who understands these words and the rule for combining noun phrases and verb phrases is able to understand ‘the dog is awake’ and ‘the cat is asleep’.

Again, compositionality is meant to explain assumption (Sys3). Speakers are able to know the meanings of complex expressions from their knowledge of the meanings of basic expressions and their knowledge of the rules for putting these expressions together because the meanings of the complex expressions are determined by the meaning of the complex expressions.

The argument from systematicity exhibits some important differences from the argument from productivity. One difference is in the plausibility of the purported fact to be explained. There are many examples where speakers are able to understand recombinations of expressions that they already understand. However, it is unclear how far to generalize this claim. Do all who understand ‘within an hour’ and ‘without a watch’ also understand ‘within a watch’ and ‘without an hour’? And do all who understand ‘halfway closed’ and ‘firmly believed’ also understand ‘halfway believed’ and ‘firmly closed’? As Johnson (2004) argues, the claim that natural languages are systematic presupposes a natural non-overlapping linguistic categorization of all the expressions. The claim that in understanding a sentence one must be able to understand its constituents is related to reverse compositionality; cf. section 1.4.2; Fodor & Lepore 2001: 59; Pagin 2003: 292.^[14]

The arguments also differ because the systematicity argument aims to explain a speaker’s ability to understand novel sentences in terms of their existing ability to understand whole sentences. It may be that in understanding the reconfigurations of the already understood sentences, speakers appeal not only to the meanings of the parts of the sentence but also to the meanings of the whole sentences. So, the speaker may use their understanding of the whole sentences ‘the dog is asleep’ and ‘the cat is awake’ (and all of their constituents) to understand the novel sentence ‘the dog is awake’. This is compatible with the possibility that it is not merely the structure and meanings of the constituents that determine the meaning of the complex expression, but also the meanings of various other complex expressions. This is not to say that the latter explanation is better, but only that the assumption that the speaker has more knowledge makes available explanations that are not available in the argument from productivity.

3.1.3 Challenges to the Empirical Arguments

There are many challenges to these empirical arguments in the literature. One of the most prominent challenges purports to offer a better explanation of the fact that speakers can know the meaning of a complex expression by knowing the rule for constructing the expression and knowing the meanings of its constituents.

Here is an alternative explanation: the claim that the complex expression has a certain meaning is computable from the claim that it results from applying a certain rule to certain constituent expressions and from the claim that the constituents have certain meanings. One claim is computable from a set of claims when there is an effective procedure deriving a claim from the set of claims. The explanation of systematicity would require this: the claim that ‘the dog is asleep’ means that the dog is asleep is computable from the claims (for example) that ‘the dog is asleep’ results from combining ‘the dog’ and ‘is asleep’, that ‘the dog’ means the dog, and that ‘is asleep’ means is asleep. This explanation does not require compositionality, because the computation may appeal to factors other than the structure and the meanings of ‘the dog’ and ‘is asleep’. For example, the computation of the claim that ‘the dog is asleep’ means that the dog is asleep might appeal to the expressions ‘the dog’ and ‘is asleep’ themselves and not merely to their meanings; cf. Schiffer 1987, 1991, Pagin 2012, Dever 2005.

A more recent challenge comes from large language models (LLMs). LLMs produce coherent strings of text similar to those produced by natural speakers by repeatedly predicting the next word from an input string of text. The models associate a long vector with each basic expression (or “tokens”) and derives a series of vectors for strings of vectors in terms of the vectors of the basic expressions making up the string. The final derived vector gives rise to a probability distribution for the next word. The values of the vectors are set by training on a large body of text, cf. (Wolfram 2023). The training data include far more sentences than any normal human being is exposed to. However, LLMs can produce and process novel sentences on the basis of this training data. The question is whether LLMs encode anything like a recursive syntax or compositional semantics for these languages. If they do not, then this poses a problem for the arguments for compositionality appealing to productivity and systematicity, because then LLMs would be examples of systems that display competence with novel sentences and the ability to recombine existing sentences without compositionally processing them. Because of the size of the vectors associated with words and the complexity of the computations, separating out elements of the representation is challenging. This project is the subject of ongoing research. See Lake and Baroni 2018 and Dankers et al. 2022.

A final challenge to the empirical arguments is that they do not conclusively establish compositionality as a universal claim. General considerations of productivity and systematicity cannot rule out isolated exceptions to compositionality. Suppose someone suggests that the complex expression e is a counterexample to (C). The fact that speakers tend to understand all sorts of complex expressions they have never heard before does not mean that they would understand e on the first encounter. Similarly, the fact that speakers can generally understand a new sentence by reconfiguring words in a sentence they already understand does not entail that they would understand e. Even if in general humans understand complex expressions they have never heard before in virtue of their knowledge of the expressions’ structures and the meanings of the constituents, speakers might understand e in some other way.

3.2 Methodology

A popular reason for believing in compositionality is that it works. According to this argument, compositionality has been a high-level empirical hypothesis that is not directly related to observation. Rather, linguists have adopted various versions of the principle of compositionality as a working hypothesis and developed semantic theories on their basis.

Compositionality is a powerful working hypothesis, but it is well known that it can’t be an empirical hypothesis all by itself. (Partee 2004: 14)

In some cases, broad frameworks such as Montague semantics have been motivated, in part, by the appeal to various versions of the principle of compositionality. The resulting theories have provided intuitively satisfactory explanations for a wide range of linguistic data, such as the validity or invalidity of inferences or contrasts in acceptability between minimal pairs. Moreover, when certain phenomena appeared to conflict with compositionality, it was usually shown that this is not so: reasonably elegant and comparatively natural compositional theories were just around the corner; cf. section 3.2. Finally, compositionality (or its specific implementations) has also been invoked to motivate narrower interventions in syntactic or semantic theory (e.g. Partee 1975, 511-513).

There are two components to the argument from methodology. The first component is a concession, that compositionality is not directly testable. This concession is motivated by various trivialization arguments that have been introduced. The second component is that the success of semantic theories does provide indirect evidence for compositionality.

3.2.1 The Empirical Significance of Compositionality

Compositionality alone has few direct empirical implications. To substantively constrain semantic theorizing, compositionality must be paired with auxiliary hypotheses about syntax and semantics.

Janssen (1983) proved that one can turn any meaning assignment on a recursively enumerable set of expressions into a compositional one, if one can replace the syntactic operations with different ones. This shows that for compositionality to remain substantive, the semantic theory must be paired with some auxiliary hypotheses about the syntactic structure of complex expressions; cf. Westerståhl 1998.^[15]

From the side of semantics, Zadrozny (1994) showed that starting with an assignment of meanings to the expressions of a language, one can generate a new compositional assignment of meanings that encode the original meanings. Given a set S of strings generated from an arbitrary alphabet via concatenation and a meaning function m which assigns the members of an arbitrary set M to the members of S, one can construct a new meaning function \(\mu\) such that for all \(s, t \in S \mu(s{.}t) = \mu(s)(\mu(t))\) and \(\mu(s)(s) = m(s)\). Zadrozny’s argument shows that compositionality alone does not constrain the meanings of the complex expressions provided that the meanings of the simpler expressions can be replaced with new “meanings” from which the old are uniformly recoverable.^[16] (Cf. Kazmi and Pelletier (1998), Westerståhl (1998), Dever (1999).)

Horwich (1997) offers an argument that compositionality does not constrain the meanings of the basic expressions, either. He considers the view that the meanings of complex expressions are phrase structure trees with the meanings of the constituent lexical items assigned to their terminal nodes. The meanings of complexes are straightforwardly determined from the meanings of the simple expressions together with their syntactic mode of composition. This shows that if the semantic theory is lax enough with the meanings assigned to the complex expressions, any assignment of meanings to basic expressions is compatible with the principle of compositionality.^[17]

These results show that for compositionality to be a substantive constraint on natural language theorizing, it must be paired with background constraints on syntax, the semantics of the basic lexical items, and the semantics of composites (cf. Dever 2008).^[18]

3.2.2 Compositionality as Hypothesis

The principle of compositionality has been a successful working hypothesis in linguistics. Does this give evidence to believe it? This depends on the role that compositionality plays in the success of linguistic theory. A high-level methodological hypothesis might be adopted for a subject matter for reasons of methodological simplicity or to commence an investigation. It may thereby lead to a successful theory without playing any role in that success. If this were the case, then there might be no reason to believe the principle of compositionality. Of course, this is compatible with using the principle as an instrumental hypothesis in semantics.

On the other hand, it may be that investigation reveals that compositionality is an important part of the explanation of various phenomena under the scope of the theory. These phenomena might include observations about productivity and systematicity, discussed in section 2.2.1. If this were the case, then these empirical arguments for compositionality would each individually provide the principle with some indirect empirical evidence.^[19]

4. Arguments Against Compositionality

The most prominent arguments against compositionality come from apparent counterexamples. Putative counterexamples to (C) are complex expressions whose meaning appears to depend not only on the meanings of their constituents and on their structure but on some third factor as well. The third factor might be the context in which the sentence is used (§3.2.1 and §3.2.4), its linguistic environment (§3.2.3), auxiliary conventions (§3.2.2), or someone’s beliefs about what the expression means (§3.2.5).

In each case, compositionality is not the only hypothesis generating the counterexample. The counterexamples depend on auxiliary hypotheses about syntactic structure and about the meanings of the constituent expressions. In many cases, compositionality can be maintained by revising some of these auxiliary hypotheses. The choice between revising compositionality and revising an auxiliary hypothesis will depend on complicated theoretical constraints.

4.1 How Compositionality Might Fail

Before surveying the putative counterexamples to compositionality from the semantics literature, consider a simple non-linguistic case where speakers’ understanding is productive and systematic despite apparent lack of compositionality in the system of representations. Specifically, consider the Algebraic notation for chess.^[20] Here are the basics. The rows of the chessboard are represented by the numerals \(\b{1},\b{2}, \ldots ,\b{8}\); the columns are represented by the lower-case letters \(\ba, \bb, \ldots ,\bh\). The squares are identified by column and row; for example \(\b{b5}\) is at the intersection of the second column from the left and the fifth row from the top. Upper-case letters represent the pieces: \(\bK\) stands for king, \(\bQ\) for queen, \(\bR\) for rook, \(\bB\) for bishop, and \(\bN\) for knight. Moves are typically represented by a triplet consisting of an upper-case letter standing for the piece that makes the move and a sign standing for the square where the piece moves. Moves made by pawns lack the upper-case letter from the beginning. When more than one piece of the same type could reach the same square, the sign for the square of departure is placed immediately in front of the sign for the square of arrival. Finally, there are symbols for special moves such as castling, for check, and for making commentaries about moves.

Someone who understands the Algebraic notation can follow descriptions of particular chess games and, in particular, can tell which move is represented by particular lines within such a description. Nonetheless, in isolation, the line \(\b{Nb5}\) is not be enough to figure out what this move is supposed to be. It must be a move to \(\b{b5}\) made by a knight. However, the square from which it moves is unspecified. All this can be determined by following the description of the game from the beginning, assuming that one knows what the initial configurations of figures are on the chessboard, that white moves first, and that afterwards black and white move one after the other. But staring at \(\b{Nb5}\) itself will not help.

The first moral of the example is that one can have a productive and systematic understanding of representations even if one does not understand complex representations merely by understanding their simple components and the way those components are combined. The reason this could happen is that all who understand the system know certain things (e.g., the initial configuration of pieces and the order of moves) from which they can figure out the missing information (e.g., which figure is moving and from where).

The second moral is that given certain assumptions about meaning in chess notation we can have productive and systematic understanding of representations even if the system itself is not compositional. The assumptions in question are that (a) the description in the first paragraph of this section fully determines what the simple expressions of chess notation mean and also how they can be combined to form complex expressions, and that (b) the meaning of a line within a chess notation determines a move. These assumptions are auxiliary hypotheses.

The third moral is that one can maintain compositionality by rejecting the auxiliary hypotheses such as (a) and (b). One can reject (a) by arguing that the meaning of \(\bN\) in \(\b{Nb5}\) contains an indexical component, it picks out a particular knight moving from a particular square. One can also reject (b) by arguing that the meaning of \(\b{Nb5}\) is nothing more than the meaning of ‘some knight moves from somewhere to square \(\b{b5}\)’—utterances of \(\b{Nb5}\) might carry extra information but that is of no concern for the semantics of the notation. Both moves would save compositionality at a trade-off. To make rejecting (a) worthwhile, one would have to explain how the meaning of \(\bN\) depends on context. To rejecting (b) worthwhile, one would have to explain how the move can be determined from the meaning of the utterance of \(\b{Nb5}\) combined with the background information; cf. Pickel and Rabern 2022.

4.2 How Compositionality Allegedly Fails

This section discusses several famous putative counterexamples to the compositionality of English from the semantics literature. The list is by no means exhaustive. (For a more systematic survey of how compositionality problems are typically solved in formal semantics, see Zimmerman 2012.) For each putative counterexample, there are possible responses considered below.

4.2.1 Possessives

An utterance of ‘Mary’s horse’ can refer to a horse that belongs to Mary, a horse that she is riding, a horse that she has placed a bet on, and so on. ‘Mary’s portrait’ can be used to refer to a portrait that belongs to Mary or to a portrait in which she is the subject. Thus, the complex expressions ‘Mary’s horse’ and ‘Mary’s portrait’ appear to be context sensitive. But, the context sensitivity does not seem to trace to the constituents ‘Mary’, ‘horse’, or ‘portrait’. These are a putative counterexample to the compositionality of occasion meaning. This counterexample can be accepted or background assumptions can be revised. One way to preserve the compositionality of occasion meaning would be to take the possessive construction as contributing a context-sensitive constituent. See (Partee 1997).

4.2.2 Idioms

Idioms pose a more complicated challenge to compositionality. Idioms include complex expressions with conventionalized meanings. For example, in English, the sentence ‘Mary kicked the bucket’ can mean that Mary died. There is no obvious way to derive this meaning from the meanings of the parts. Thus, idioms seem to be isolated exceptions to compositionality. Jackendoff (1997) estimates the number of English idioms to be around twenty-five thousand.

Defenders of compositionality sometimes argue that the syntactic complexity of these expressions is only apparent, and hence, they can be viewed as lexical items. That is, the expression ‘kicked the bucket’ might be taken as a single atomic expression of English that means died (in addition to being a complex expression of English that means ‘kicks the bucket’). But unless there are clear non-semantic grounds for singling out idioms, the move is question-begging. Such criteria have been proposed, but they tend to be rather controversial; cf. Nunberg, Sag, and Wasow 1994. Another approach to defending compositionality is to argue that the idiomatic meaning of these expressions is metaphorical. That is, even if the idiomatic meaning is conventionalized, it remains metaphorical. It may be that different responses are appropriate for different idioms.

4.2.3 Cross-sentential anaphora

Consider the following minimal pair from Barbara Partee:

(9)

I dropped ten marbles and found all but one of them. It is probably under the sofa.

(10)

I dropped ten marbles and found nine of them. It is probably under the sofa.

Sentence (9) is unproblematic, and sentence (10) is markedly odd. This difference is plausibly a matter of meaning, and so (9) and (10) cannot be synonyms. Nonetheless, the first sentences are at least truth-conditionally equivalent. If necessary equivalence is sufficient for synonymy, then this is an apparent counterexample to compositionality.

One response would deny that the first sentences of (9) and (10) are fully synonymous. What is interesting about this example is that it is not immediately clear how a more fine-grained account of meaning will account for the contrast between these sentences. The difference is obviously due to the fact that ‘one’ occurs in the first sentence of (9), which is available as a proper antecedent for ‘it’ and that there is nothing in the first sentence of (10) that could play a similar role. Some authors have suggested that the right way to approach this problem is to opt for a dynamic conception of meaning, one that can encode anaphoric possibilities for subsequent sentences (Kamp 1981; Heim 1982; Groenendijk & Stokhof 1990, 1991; Zeevat 1989; and Chierchia 1995). See entries on anaphora, dynamic semantics, and discourse representation theory.

4.2.4 Context Sensitivity

Let’s call expressions whose occasion meaning sometimes deviates from their standing meaning context-dependent. The scope of context-dependent lexical items is a matter of controversy. Semantic minimalists hold that there are only a handful of context-dependent expressions: the personal and demonstrative pronouns, a few adverbs (e.g., ‘here’, ‘now’, ‘next’), and a few adjectives (e.g. ‘actual’, ‘present‘, ‘local’); cf. Borg 2004 and Cappelen and Lepore 2005 . Radical contextualists hold that essentially all lexical items are context-dependent; e.g., Searle (1980). Many theorists are somewhere in the middle.

Radical contextualism is sometimes seen as a challenge to compositionality, more precisely, to (C\(_{\textit{occ}}\)); cf. Cohen 1986, Lahav 1989, Fodor 2001. An effective argument from context-dependence against (C\(_{\textit{occ}}\)) would need to show that there is at least one complex expression in L whose occasion meaning varies with context, while the occasion meanings of its constituents all remain the same. Suppose a Japanese maple leaf, turned brown, has been painted green. Consider someone pointing at this leaf uttering (11):

(11)

This leaf is green.

The utterance could be true on one occasion (when the speaker is sorting leaves for decoration) and false on another (when the speaker is identifying the species of tree the leaf belongs to). The meanings of the words are the same on both occasions and so is their syntactic composition. But the meaning of (11) on these two occasions—what (11) says when uttered in these occasions—is different. As Charles Travis, the inventor of this example puts it: “…words may have all the stipulated features while saying something true, but also while saying something false” (Travis 1994: 171–172; see also Travis 1996 and Lahav 1989).

There are many possible responses to this challenge to the compositionality of occasion meaning. One is to deny the relevant intuition. Perhaps the leaf really is green if it is painted green and (11) is uttered truly in both situations. Nonetheless, one might be sometimes reluctant to make such a true utterance for fear of being misleading. One might be taken to falsely suggest that the leaf is green under the paint or that it is not painted at all (cf. Sainsbury 2001 and Berg 2002). The second option would be to hold that the context sensitivity of this example can be traced to the context sensitivity of a constituent expression, ‘green’ (Dancy 2003, Szabó 2010, Lasersohn 2012, Recanati 2012, and Borg 2016).^[21] A third option would be that the compositionally determined occasion meaning falls short of determining a truth condition or proposition, but only propositional constraints (Bach 1994, Soames 2005, Buchanan 2010, Harris 2020).

4.2.5 Propositional attitudes

A final and widely known objection to compositionality comes from the observation that even if \(e\) and \(e'\) are synonyms, the truth-values of sentences where they occur embedded within the clausal complement of a mental attitude verb often appear to differ. So, despite the fact that ‘biblioklepts’ and ‘book thieves’ are synonyms, apparently (12) may be true and (13) false:

(12)

Carla believes that biblioklepts steal.

(13)

Carla believes that book thieves steal.

This pair apparently violates compositionality; cf. Pelletier (1994).

There is a sizable literature on the semantics of propositional attitude reports (see entry). Some think that considerations like this show that there are no genuine synonyms in natural languages. If so, compositionality is trivialized. Some deny the intuition that (12) and (13) may differ in truth-conditions and seek explanations for the contrary appearance in terms of implicature.^[22] Still others abandon compositionality but still provide recursive semantic clauses.^[23] Finally, some preserve compositionality by postulating a hidden indexical associated with ‘believe’ (Richard 1990, Crimmins & Perry 1989, and Crimmins 1992).