The Unity of Consciousness

First published Tue Mar 27, 2001; substantive revision Mon Apr 21, 2025

Mary is patiently waiting behind the red light in her car. The light has been extended to allow for the long line of protesters that are crossing to clear the intersection. She runs her fingers around the steering wheel, finding its warmth pleasing. Goodnight Irene is playing on the radio. “It’s a good day”, she thinks. Mary is experiencing a wide range of conscious states, including visual experiences, auditory experiences, tactile experiences, thoughts, and emotions. Despite their differences, however, there is an intuitive and multi-faceted sense in which Mary is enjoying a unified consciousness. Mary’s experiences seem to be parts of a unified whole. They are not separate and isolated from each other. Their contents can be accessed together, integrated together, and self-ascribed by the same subject. Moreover, their relation is such that it allows conscious presentations of unified objects and a single space in which Mary and these objects are located. Unity of consciousness has been taken to signify one or several of these ways in which conscious experiences are typically related to each other at each moment or during uninterrupted streams of consciousness. The topic has been a persistent subject of philosophical enquiry for an extended period that extends at least to the early modern era. After briefly reviewing its history in Western philosophy and distinguishing between various concepts of unity of consciousness, this entry focuses on contemporary analytic discussions of the phenomenal unity of consciousness.

1. Introduction

1.1 A Brief History

The unity of consciousness was a main concern of Western philosophers in what is often called the ‘classical modern era’ (roughly, 1600 to 1900), including Descartes, Leibniz, Kant, Hume, Reid, Brentano, and James.[1] Descartes employs the idea in one of his arguments for mind-body dualism, beginning with the assertion:

When I consider the mind, that is to say, myself inasmuch as I am only a thinking thing, I cannot distinguish in myself any parts, but apprehend myself to be clearly one and entire. [Descartes 1641: 196]

To this, Descartes adds that if the mind is not made of parts, it cannot be made of matter because anything material has parts. Descartes thus infers the immateriality of the mind from one sense of its unity: the idea that the mind is indivisible and has no parts.

Unity of consciousness also figures prominently in the work of Leibniz, Hume, and Reid. The idea and the indivisibility that Descartes took to be required for it, seem to have served as Leibniz’s model of a monad, the building block of all reality (see the entry on Leibniz’s philosophy of mind). With Hume, things are more complicated. It should have followed from his atomism that there is no unified consciousness, just “a bundle of different perceptions” (Hume 1739 [1962, 252]). Yet, in a famous appendix, he says that there is something he cannot render consistent with his atomism (Hume 1739 [1962, 636]). He never tells us what it is, but it may have been that consciousness strongly appears to be more than a bundle of independent ‘perceptions’. Reid also made extensive use of the unity of consciousness, among other things to run Descartes’ argument from unity to indivisibility the other way around (Reid 1785).

Kant rejects Descartes’s argument, but the notion of the unity of consciousness is central to his ‘transcendental deduction of the categories’ (see the entry on Kant’s view of the mind and consciousness of self for a fuller treatment). There, Kant seems to claim that to tie various experiences together into a single unified consciousness of the world, we must be able to apply the concepts of fundamental categories to them and this proves the legitimacy of the categories. Kant’s attempt to link the unity of consciousness to the structure of knowledge continues to capture the imaginations of contemporary philosophers.[2]

Brentano (1874 [1973]) argues that all the conscious states of a person at a time will and perhaps must be unified with one another. Arguably, this thesis is the predecessor of the contemporary Unity Thesis, according to which, necessarily all the phenomenally conscious states of a subject at a time are unified with one another. Brentano combined this thesis with another strong thesis that all mental states are conscious.

Finally, late in the 19th century, James developed a detailed treatment of synchronic (or ‘at a time’) unity of consciousness. We will discuss his view later (see also entries on David Hume, Thomas Reid, Franz Brentano, and William James).

With the prominence of logical atomism in philosophy and behaviorism in psychology, the unity of consciousness almost disappeared from research agendas early in the 20th century.[3] Logical atomists focused on the atomic elements of cognition (sense data, simple propositional judgments, protocol sentences, etc.), rather than on how these elements are tied together to form a mind. Behaviorists urged that the mind is either a myth or at least something that we cannot and do not need to study in a science of the human person.

After decades of neglect, the last third of the 20th century saw a resurgence of interest in unified consciousness among analytic philosophers. It began with influential commentaries on Kant in the 1960s (Strawson 1966; Bennett 1966, 1974), as well as discussions by Nagel and Parfit on its relation to personal identity (Nagel 1971; Parfit 1971, 1984). Towards the end of the 20th century, a number of philosophers and a few psychologists wrote on the subject, including Marks (1981), Trevarthen (1984), Lockwood 1989, 1994), Hill (1991), Brook (1994), Marcel (1994), Hurley (1994, 1998), and Shoemaker (1996). Unity of consciousness remains a very active area of research. The first two decades of the 21st century have seen many articles, volumes, and several monographs on the topic.[4] A good portion of this contemporary revival focuses on the proper metaphysical analysis of unity, the correct way to understand disorders of unity, and the relationship between unity and personal identity. But there is also a recent revival of interest in the Cartesian argument for dualism that draws on the unity of consciousness.[5]

Unity of consciousness has thus been one of the central notions in philosophy of mind for a rather long period. However, the study of historical texts on the topic and their relationship to contemporary debates is somewhat complicated by the fact that “unity of consciousness” signifies several different concepts. In what follows, we start by explaining some of these concepts and commenting on their relationship. After that, this entry focuses on the phenomenal unity of consciousness, a concept that has been at the center-stage of recent work on unity of consciousness.

1.2 Concepts of Unity of Consciousness

Several concepts of unity of consciousness have figured in contemporary analytic discussion. The list is long and the exact way to characterize the concepts is itself a substantive topic. Here is a rough characterization of some of them:[6]

  • Phenomenal unity: Two conscious states are phenomenally unified when there is something it is like for the subject to be in both conscious states simultaneously. For example, there is something that it is like for Mary to see the line of protesters as she hears Goodnight Irene.
  • Access unity: Conscious states are access unified when their contents are accessible to the same consuming systems. For example, Mary can verbally report both what she sees and what she hears or use both in reasoning.
  • Representational unity: Conscious states are representationally unified when their contents are integrated together. Mary can report what she sees and what she hears. But it does not seem that when she does so, she does it by first reporting what she sees, then what she hears and then inferring what she hears and sees. What she sees and what she hears are integrated in a manner that gives their conjunction the same form of non-inferential access that she has to what she sees (or what she hears).
  • Unity as Singularity: A consciousness state is unified in this sense when it lacks other conscious states as parts. Perhaps, and this is controversial, Mary’s conscious experiences form a unified whole, but this unified whole does not have these conscious experiences (or any other experiences, for that matter) as parts.
  • Mereological unity: Conscious states are mereologically unified when they are parts of a single conscious state. Perhaps, and this is controversial, Mary’s conscious experiences are parts of a single unified whole.
  • Subject unity: Conscious states are subject-unified when they belong to the same subject.
  • Unity of self-consciousness: Consciousness of oneself as the single subject of a multiplicity of conscious states.
  • Objectual unity: Conscious states are objectually unified when they present qualities or parts as qualities or parts of the same object.[7] For example, Mary’s visual experience presents, the shape, color and motion of the car in front of her as the shape, color and the motion of the same object. Or she hears the succession of musical notes that form Goodnight Irene as belonging to the same object (a single song in this case).
  • Spatial unity: Conscious states are spatially unified when they present their objects as located within the same space. For example, Mary experiences the steering wheel that she touches as located in the same single space as the people who she sees crossing the street. In general, in so far as her experiences have spatial content, they present objects as located in the same space.[8]
  • Attentional unity: Conscious states are attentionally unified when they compete for attentional resources. For example, there is an intuitive sense in which Mary’s attending to what she sees will take her attention away from what she hears.

The list is not exhaustive. For example, there are several other subject-related senses of unity, including introspective unity (the relation among conscious states in virtue of which they can be the objects of a single act of introspection), self-ascriptive unity (the relation among conscious states in virtue of which they can be self-ascribed by the same subject), and narrative unity (the relation among conscious states that are integrated around goals that a subject attributes to herself).

On the face of it, these senses of the unity of consciousness are distinct from each other, but there could be substantive relations between them. A proper treatment of this issue is beyond the scope of this entry. So we will only mention a few examples. Representationalists often reduce phenomenal unity to representational unity, while mereological accounts offer to analyze phenomenal unity in mereological terms. Also, it has been argued that some specific forms of unity such as spatial unity, and attentional unity are determinate forms of phenomenal unity. (See Hill 2018.) There could also be explanatory or evidential relations between these forms of unity. Access unity, for example, is sometimes offered as grounded in, and therefore explained by, phenomenal unity and its absence is taken as evidence for the absence of phenomenal unity. We will discuss some of these relations in the following sections.

The distinction between the above concepts of unity is important for interpreting historical texts and assessing their continuity with contemporary discussions of unity of consciousness. Unity as singularity seems to be the notion of unity that Descartes relies on in his argument against materialism, while subject-related notions of unity, as well as objectual unity, spatial unity, and temporal unity figure prominently in Kant and philosophical work in the Kantian tradition. For example, the notions of objectual unity and representational unity correspond closely to two kinds of synthesis distinguished by Kant. Spatial and temporal unity are in the background of Kant’s discussion of the forms of sensibility in the Aesthetics, and arguably unity of self-consciousness and self-ascriptive unity figure in Kant’s Transcendental Deduction of the categories.[9] Attributing views about phenomenal unity, one of the senses of unity that has been central in contemporary discussion, to these historical figures is not a straightforward exegetical matter.

1.3 Phenomenal Unity

Let’s revisit the vignette that we started this entry with. Mary is waiting behind the red light in her car. She runs her fingers around the steering wheel, finding its warmth pleasing. Goodnight Irene is playing on the radio. “It’s a good day”, she thinks. Mary is having a multiplicity of different conscious states. Many of these states, perhaps even all of them, are phenomenally conscious. There is something that it is like for Mary to have each of them. But there is also something it is like for her to have all of these experiences at once—an extra element that goes beyond the sum of what it is like to have each experience individually. There is a phenomenal sense in which her experiences form a unified whole. To put this succinctly, Mary’s experiences are phenomenally unified.

As a working characterization, synchronic phenomenal unity is the type of relation between synchronous experiences that is illustrated in our vignette and has two characteristics. First, it is a relation that is phenomenally manifest in that it figures in the characterization of what it is like to be a subject at a moment, and second, it is singularizing in that when this relation obtains between a set of experiences the experiences together form a single phenomenal whole.

We call this a working characterization partly because it already borders on philosophical controversy. Some theorists reject the idea that phenomenal unity is a relation among experiences. On such views, a phenomenally unified consciousness contains only one experience and therefore phenomenal unity is not a relation among experiences. It can be, however, a relation among other items that have an intimate connection to experiences.

As noted earlier, our focus will be on recent analytic work on phenomenal unity of consciousness, which we will simply refer to as unity, unless otherwise indicated. There are multiple reasons for focusing on phenomenal unity. First, the phenomenal notion of consciousness has taken the center stage in consciousness studies. Relatedly, of the various senses of unity, phenomenal unity has received the lion’s share of attention in recent work.[10] Our focus on phenomenal unity partly reflects this trend. Second, although phenomenal unity is one concept among several other concepts of unity of consciousness, some of these concepts get their significance partly due to their connection to phenomenal unity. To see this, consider a zombie duplicate of Mary. There is a coherent sense in which notions such as subjective unity, access unity, and representational unity, can be applied to a Mary’s zombie duplicate. And admittedly, there are important explanatory projects that such notions can figure in. But there is an intuitive sense in which, in the absence of their connection to phenomenal consciousness and phenomenal unity, such notions lose some of their philosophical thickness. We thus think that phenomenal unity plays a central role in the diverse group of concepts of unity of consciousness. Admittedly, this is a substantive philosophical thesis that requires careful defense, a defense that we do not have room to provide here.

The bulk of the entry is devoted to synchronic phenomenal unity, the phenomenal unity of experiences had during the same interval of time. We will discuss two broad topics: the metaphysics of synchronic unity and disorders of unity. In the section on the metaphysics of unity we will focus on some interrelated questions about the nature of unity. The section on disorders of unity focuses on the contemporary debate over unity in split-brain subjects and a few other disorders. We will review several positions about the structure of consciousness in these conditions.

Synchronic phenomenal unity is not the only form of phenomenal unity. There is also diachronic phenomenal unity: a phenomenally manifest and singularizing relation among experiences that extends across time. The entry concludes with a brief discussion of diachronic unity and its relation to personal identity.

2. The Metaphysics of Unity

Is unity a primitive relation or can it be analyzed in more fundamental terms? If unity can be analyzed in more fundamental terms, what is the proper analysis of unity? Does a unified complex experience have experiences as parts? Is unity part of the nature of consciousness? These questions have been at the center of the contemporary discussion over the metaphysics of unity. This section briefly reviews some of this discussion.

2.1 The Nature of Unity

How should we analyze unity? Different answers to this question have been offered in recent literature. But before reviewing these answers, we should note some divergence in formulations. Some pose the question in terms of an analysis of the necessary and sufficient conditions for the unity relation. Generically, such formulations offer to fill out the right-hand side of the biconditional “E1 and E2 are phenomenally unified iff …” in more fundamental terms. But there are alternative ways to understand and articulate the question. One option is to pose the question in terms of grounding: when experiences are unified what are the fundamental personal-level facts, if any, in virtue of which they are unified? It is also possible to put the question in terms of the constitution of the unity relation.

There are significant differences between these articulations. Grounding and constitution are asymmetric metaphysical relations. When something grounds something else it is in some sense metaphysically more fundamental than what it grounds. But biconditional dependence is symmetric. On the other hand, analyses of nature in terms of grounding or constitution may not come with strict commitments about necessary and sufficient conditions. So, strictly speaking, the various participants in the debate focus on different questions in their analysis of the nature of unity. But in what follows, we will ignore these differences and assume that these accounts aim to answer the same basic question.

As we are using the term, the question about the metaphysical nature of unity is a question about its analysis in subjective terms. A primitivist, for example, holds that unity cannot be analyzed in other subjective terms and a representationalist, in contrast, offers to analyze unity in terms of facts about the contents of experiences. Thus, contemporary debates about the metaphysical nature of unity differentiate this topic from questions about the physical correlates of unity. Construed in this way, a primitivist account of the unity relation is compatible with the position that the unity relation is identical with or supervenes on a functional or psycho-neural type.

Analyses of the nature of unity can be divided into those that appeal to a primitive form of oneness or singularity as the ground for unity and those that appeal to a relation.[11] The following example illustrates the distinction. John and Mary are members of the Jacksons family. We can ask what is it in virtue of which John and Mary are family members of each other. One answer could be that they stand in this relation in virtue of the fact that they are both members of the Jackson family. This answer appeals to a form of oneness or singularity, namely, the Jackson family. A second answer is that John and Mary are family-members because they are connected via an unbroken form of parent-child relations. This answer appeal to a relation. We can call the former type of answer a oneness-first answer and the latter a relation-first answer. The same generic distinction applies to the topic at hand. Analyses of the nature of unity relation can be roughly divided into oneness-first and relation-first camps. Some accounts appeal to a primitive form of oneness. Some, on the other hand, offer to analyze unity in terms of relations.

2.1.1 Oneness-first Views

Oneness-first accounts appeal to a primitive form of oneness in their analyzes of the nature of unity. Such views come in several versions. Bayne and Chalmers (2003) offer the view that experiences are unified when they are subsumed under a single encompassing experience. Bayne later develops this into a mereological account on which experiences are unified when they are parts of an encompassing experience.

Other notable oneness-first views include Tye (2003) and Peacocke (2014). Tye analyzes unity in terms of the unity of phenomenal content, where phenomenal contents are unified in virtue of being parts of a single encompassing content.[12] Peacocke (2014) defends a oneness-first account on which experiences are unified in virtue of belonging to the same single subject. Many historical figures have also been interpreted in oneness-first fashions.[13]

A good representative of recent oneness-first views is Bayne’s mereological account. On Bayne’s view, the unity of a set of experience is a matter of them being parts of a total experience. Bayne’s view has been criticized on several grounds, some of which are, arguably, generalizable to other oneness-first accounts.

A key target of this criticism is Bayne’s commitment to the thesis that experiences are unified only if they jointly constitute a single encompassing experience. We can call this thesis experientialism.[14] Some have criticized experientialism on introspective grounds. Hill 2014, for example, argues that no matter how much he tries, he cannot find an experience that encompasses all the experiences that he has at any moment. Bayne responds to this argument by denying that we cannot find such an experience under introspection. Another criticism is that experientialism is in tension with the principle that experiences must be partly individuated in terms of their objects. If we accept this principle, experientialism would be true only if there is a single object that somehow encompasses all the experiences that exist in a unified stream of consciousness at each moment. And it is unlikely that we can find such an object.

A second concern about Bayne’s view is its substantiality, especially given the fact that proponents of this view do not offer an analysis of mereology. If we accept unrestricted mereology, there will always be another entity of which two experiences are parts. For example, there is an entity that has my smell experience and your auditory experiences as parts. Since these two experiences are not phenomenally unified with each other, this would obviously be the wrong analysis. But rather than providing a mereological account, Bayne appeals to our intuitive grasp of a phenomenal field. But this threatens the substantiality of the account. For, our intuitive grasp of a phenomenal field is too close to our intuitive grasp of phenomenal unity.

One concern here is whether the same generic problem threatens most other oneness-first accounts of the nature of unity or not. These accounts appeal to some form of primitive oneness. But if the oneness that they appeal to is too close to the unity relation that they aim to analyze, they might fail to positively contribute to our understanding of the phenomenon that they aim to explain. The concern thus is, as is sometimes put, whether oneness-first accounts are sufficiently ampliative.

2.1.2 Relation-first Views

Perhaps the first contemporary relation-first account of unity is Dainton 2005, who argues that co-consciousness (Dainton’s label for phenomenal unity), is a primitive unanalyzable relation. Dainton’s account has been criticized as violating Occam’s razor. According to this criticism, Occam’s razor demands that we accept primitivist accounts only in those circumstances where they provide better explanations than their rivals and it is not clear that Dainton’s primitivist view satisfies this demand (Hill 2018).

But not all relation-first views are primitivist. Masrour’s (2014a,b, 2020) connectivity view, Watzl’s (2014) analysis in terms of foreground-background relations in attentional structure, and Roelofs’ (2014) proposal to analyze unity it in terms of attentional and/or causal proximity are all examples of views that attempt to offer a non-primitivist analysis of unity in relational terms.

2.1.3 Does Unity Have a Uniform Nature?

The views that we have discussed so far aim to offer a uniform analysis of phenomenal unity. But Hill (2018) has recently argued that this is wrong-headed. On Hill’s view, our intuitions about unity track several distinct relations such as introspective unity, representational unity, binding unity, access unity, and attentional unity. These relations are bound together by resemblance, not by sameness of nature. Hill thus embraces a disjunctive account on which whenever two conscious experiences are unified, they stand in either one of these relations. He calls the resulting view the multiple relations theory.

To defend the multiple relations theory, Hill needs to show that there is no general relation of unity. But he does not directly argue for this claim. Instead, his arguments are directed against specific analyses of unity such as Bayne’s mereological thesis and Tye’s phenomenal content view. But it is unclear how these arguments entitle Hill to the sweeping conclusion that no general account of unity can be given.

2.1.4 Unity and Experiential Parts

The views that we have offered so far presuppose that unity is a relation among experiences. But this assumption is controversial. Some theorists, as early as James, have defended the view that a unified consciousness consist only of a single experience and does not include experiences as parts (James 1890). James thus adopts a no-experiential-parts (NEP) account of unity. On this view, it is wrong to say that Mary has an auditory experience of the music and a distinct visual experience of the protesters. Rather, Mary has a single experience that has auditory and visual contents. Several contemporary theorists disagree with James. They hold that unified consciousness can have experiences as parts (EP). We will discuss the debate between the proponents of EP and NEP in the next section. But before doing so, a brief discussion of the potential relationship between this debate and the debate over the nature of unity is in order.

Tye 2003 has argued that many contemporary analyzes of unity are problematic because they are committed to EP. Obviously, the plausibility of Tye’s argument depends partly on whether EP should be rejected. But is the debate over the nature of the unity deeply dependent on the debate between EP and NEP? Arguably, the answer is negative. Let us assume that NEP is correct. If so, what we ordinarily call Mary’s auditory and visual experiences are not distinct experiences. Let us call them experience-slices instead. We can then get NEP-compatible versions of the many of the aforementioned accounts of the nature of unity by re-articulating them in terms of experience-slices. For example, the NEP-compatible version of Bayne’s mereological view would tell us that experience-slices are unified in virtue of the fact that they are parts of a single encompassing experience, while the NEP-compatible version of Dainton’s view would be the view that experience-slices are unified in virtue of the fact that they stand in a primitive co-consciousness relation with each other. Thus, it seems that even if Tye is right and NEP is correct, the debate over the nature of unity does not disappear, it gets rearticulated in terms of a debate over whether and how unity can be understood in terms of relations between experience-slices. If this is correct, then the debate about the nature of unity is immune to Tye’s objection.

2.2 Experiential Parts or No Experiential Parts

The vignette that we used earlier to introduce phenomenal unity sketched the complex content of Mary’s consciousness at a moment: seeing the protesters, hearing the music, feeling the warmth of the steering wheel, etc. How many experiences was Mary enjoying at that moment? In general, how is a unified but complex conscious experience structured at each moment? As noted in the previous section, two incompatible answers to this question have some currency, namely the experiential-parts view (EP) and the no-experiential-parts view (NEP).

On EP, a unified stream of consciousness includes simpler experiences as parts or something like parts. On this view, Mary’s unified consciousness had several experiences as parts, including visual, auditory, tactile, and mood experiences. These simpler experiences were phenomenally unified parts of Mary’s consciousness. In general, EP holds that a unified consciousness can include several experiences as phenomenally unified parts.[15] On NEP, in contrast, Mary’s experience did not have distinct experiences as parts. Rather, she had a single experience with a complex content. In general, NEP holds that a unified conscious experience necessarily consists of a single conscious experience that typically has a complex content.[16]

Part of what is at stake in this dispute is how to individuate experiences. There are several individuating schemes that would support EP. For example, both tripartite individuation and object-centered schemes support EP. The former scheme individuates experiences in terms of phenomenal properties, times, and subjects of experience, while the latter individuates experiences in terms of their objects, times and subjects.[17]

2.2.1 Arguments Against EP

If NEP is true, we should reject the individuation schemes that yield EP. But why should we accept NEP? One of the arguments in favor of NEP is due to James who describes it in his oft-cited example of the twelve-word sentence:

Take a sentence of a dozen words, take twelve men, and to each one word. Then stand the men in a row or jam them in a bunch and let each think of his word as intently as he will; nowhere will there be a consciousness of the whole sentence. (James 1890: 160)

There are two ways to understand James’ worry. On the first way, what proponents of EP need is a way of combining experiences that (a) does not simply conjoin them into an experiential aggregate, and (b) preserves their identity as distinct experiences, and this, James thinks, is impossible. As James sees it, when experiences a and b are fused to form another experience c, a and b are superseded by c, not included in it. The experiences have therefore been replaced by c, which somehow connects their contents. As James puts it, contrasting the unified consciousness of the whole alphabet with the several states involved in consciousness of each letter taken singly:

It is safer … to treat the consciousness of the alphabet as a twenty-seventh fact, the substitute and not the sum of the twenty-six simpler consciousnesses. (1909: 189)

A second way to understand James’ worry puts the emphasis on the fact that his example involves distinct subjects of experience. On this reading, we cannot combine different conscious experiences because such a combination would require combining different subjects to get a new subject and it is impossible to combine subjects.

On reflection, there are multiple ways for the proponents of EP to resist James’ argument. One way to see this is to contrast EP with another view that James’ argument has been taken to threaten. That view is constitutive panpsychism. On this view, consciousness is part and parcel of the fabric of the world. Even some fundamental physical particles have conscious experiences. Moreover, macro-experiences, that is, the experiences of middle-sized subjects like human beings and animals, are constituted by micro-experiences, that is, experiences of fundamental particles from which the macro-subjects emerge. It has been argued that James’ argument poses a threat to constitutive panpsychism because it shows that the idea that micro-experiences can combine to form macro-experience is problematic. This issue is often discussed under the label “combination problem”.[18]

Arguably, James’ argument threatens constitutive panpsychism more than it threatens EP. This is because there are substantive differences between constitutive panpsychism and EP. For one thing, although EP is committed to the thesis that complex experiences have parts, it is not committed to the further thesis that complex experiences are composed from their parts, that is, they somehow emerge from, or are grounded in relations among, their experiential parts. Proponents of EP may thus reply to James by pointing out that they never intended to give a compositional account of unified conscious states in terms of their parts. EP might be true even if there is no way for experiential parts to combine to form complex experiences.

But even those who accept the compositional version of EP can resist James’ argument. This is clearer under the second reading of the argument. On this reading, the argument has two premises: (a) combining experiences in a manner that gives rise to complex experiences involves getting new subjects by combining distinct subjects, and (b) it is impossible to combine distinct subjects to get a new subject. But it is not clear why the proponents of constitutive EP should be committed to (a). For, they can simply hold that a complex experiential state and all the component experiences that constitute it have the same single subject. So, the type of combination that EP presupposes, does not require new subjects.

EP’s response to the first reading of James’ argument is not as obvious. But this reading seems to turn James’ point into an acute question than an argument. For, it is unclear why it is impossible to combine distinct experiences in a manner that preserves their distinctness. In fact, some have argued that the type of relation that can do this job might be phenomenal unity. So, an argument against EP should tell us that phenomenal unity among distinct experiences is impossible. But under the first reading, James’ argument does not give us an independent reason for this claim.

It is this independent reason that a second objection to EP, sometimes called the phenomenal bloat objection, aims to provide. There are several versions of this argument. Here, we will rehearse the version in Tye 2003. Tye’s argument, put roughly, is as follows. Let us assume, with EP, that experiences, \(E_1, \ldots, E_n\) are parts of a complex unified consciousness. Let us call the phenomenal unity relation between these experiences \(R_1\). \(R_1\) should itself be an experience, otherwise it would not make a difference to the phenomenal character of the complex conscious state, as phenomenal unity should. But then this experience must itself stand in a phenomenal unity relation with \(E_1, \ldots, E_n\). Call this relation \(R_2\). We can apply the same line of reasoning about \(R_1\) to \(R_2\), generating the need for \(R_3\), and so on ad infinitum. Therefore, EP results in an infinity of experiences. So, we have a reductio against EP.[19]

There are multiple ways to resist this argument. Perhaps the most promising line of response is to reject the premise that if phenomenal unity relations make a difference to the phenomenal character of a complex experience, then they are themselves experiences. This is because the proper way of thinking about phenomenal unity might be that unity is a matter of the manner of having experiences. Manners of having experiences are not strictly speaking experiences, but they make a difference to the phenomenal character of experience.[20]

2.3 The Unity Thesis

It is not uncommon to hold that, in some sense, unity belongs to the nature or essence of consciousness. Kant is sometimes interpreted in this way (Brook 1994), but some contemporary theorists also allude to the idea (Searle 2000, 562; Bayne 2010, 15; Masrour 2020, 215). Here, we review two ways in which this idea has been articulated.

Bayne 2010 articulates the relationship between unity and the nature of consciousness in terms of the Unity Thesis (see also Bayne and Chalmers 2003). According to this thesis, necessarily, all of the synchronous conscious experiences of a subject at a time are unified with each other. For Bayne, the relevant notion of a subject is a biological notion according to which a subject is an animal of some sort. But if we think of the Unity Thesis as one way to articulate the intuition that unity belongs to the nature or essence of consciousness then whether the thesis has to be formulated in terms of a biological notion of a subject becomes a substantive question. Bayne understands the sense of necessity here in parallel lines; the Unity Thesis is true as a “biological necessity”, where a biological necessity is to be understood in terms of an organism’s design specifications. Thus, it is part of the biological design specification of human beings that their synchronous conscious experiences are unified with each other.

Bayne motivates the Unity Thesis on introspective grounds. Introspection tells us that our conscious experiences at each moment are unified with each other. This, Bayne argues, provides strong support for the thesis, though admittedly does not entail it.

The Unity Thesis has been criticized in several respects. One common criticism is that the thesis has many counterexamples. For example, subjects who undergo callosotomy operations (split-brain subjects) do not have a unified stream of conscious experience (Tye 2003; Hill 2014, 2018; Masrour 2014b). Bayne has given a two-pronged response. He argues against the idea that split-brain patients have disunified consciousness (Bayne 2008, 2010). But he also adds to this that even if we assume that split-brain subjects have disunified consciousness, they will not pose a counterexample for the unity thesis because the thesis is necessary only in the biological sense. We will review the debate over the structure of consciousness in split-brains in section 3.1.

Additionally, it has been argued that the Unity Thesis does not properly articulate the essential relationship between consciousness and unity. Masrour (2020), for example, argues that a proper specification of this relation should not include a reference to the subjects of experience. He offers to articulate the relation in terms of a thesis that he dubs pure extrinsic unity. According to this thesis, necessarily any experience is unified with a numerically distinct experience with which it does not stand in part–whole relations.

The introspective support for the Unity Thesis has also been questioned. Firstly, introspection might be constrained by informational bottlenecks that may not apply to phenomenal consciousness. Secondly, introspection might lack sensitivity to disunity, that is, in those cases that our conscious experience is disunified, we may not be able to introspectively tell that it is so. Lastly, introspection could itself be a mechanism for unifying otherwise disunified experiences. Whether these observations undermine the epistemic significance of introspection is not a straightforward matter.[21]

3. Disorders of Unity

Several disorders have been historically discussed as potential cases in which unity of consciousness breaks within a subject. These cases can be roughly divided into three categories. The first category contains cases where consciousness seems to split within one brain and body. The much-discussed split-brain cases resulting from callosotomies (surgical operations in which the corpus callosum that connects the two hemispheres is cut) are the best-known examples of this category. Dissociative identity disorder also falls into this category. The second category includes potential cases in which unity of consciousness, to dramatize a bit, appears shattered or fragmented. Schizophrenia is a prominent member of this group. Finally, there are cases in which the array of phenomena encompassed by unified consciousness becomes unusually restricted; hemi-neglect and anosognosia are two notable examples. In what follows, we review some of the cases in the first two categories, devoting the bulk of the discussion to split-brain cases. As we shall see, whether split-brains count as failures of phenomenal unity is a complex and controversial issue. We will not review the third category as, arguably, although they are disorders of consciousness, the case that the members of this category count as disorders of unity of consciousness is very weak.

3.1 Split-Brains

No medical procedure to do with consciousness has received as much philosophical attention in recent times as callosotomies, more commonly known as split-brain operations. The peculiar outcomes observed in controlled conditions following these operations played an important role in renewing interest in the unity of consciousness within cognitive science and philosophy.[22]

During callosotomies, the corpus callosum, a large bundle of approximately 200 million neurons that facilitates communication between the hemispheres, is partially or fully severed. These operations, predominantly conducted in the 1960s but still performed in modified forms, serve as a final resort to control severe forms of epilepsy by preventing seizures from spreading across different lobes of the cerebral cortex.[23] Individuals who have undergone partial or complete callosotomy are commonly referred to as split-brain subjects. But for the most part, the evidence pertaining to divided consciousness comes only from full callosal sections.

In their everyday lives, split-brain subjects exhibit little noticeable effect from the operation. Surprisingly, their conscious life remains seemingly unified.[24] This persistence of unity is intriguing, but what makes it even more fascinating is that, under specific laboratory conditions, these patients demonstrate behavior that is suggestive of two independent centers of consciousness, each associated with one of the cerebral hemispheres.

To understand this, we should note that the human brain normally lateralizes the task of processing sensory and motor information between its two hemispheres. For example, the visual pathways are structured in such a manner that stimuli from each side of the visual field are sent to the contralateral hemisphere: visual stimuli from the right visual field (RVF) are primarily processed by the left hemisphere, while stimuli from the left visual field (LVF) are processed by the right hemisphere. In an intact brain, the corpus callosum enables communication between the two hemispheres, so the lateralization of the connections does not disrupt the bilateral integration of information. But in split-brain subjects, callosotomy disrupts the transfer of information between the two hemispheres, and this disruption can be behaviorally manifested in special experimental settings.

To illustrate, imagine presenting the word “TAXABLE” on a screen in front of a split-brain patient in a manner that “TAX” only appears in the subject’s LVF and “ABLE” only appears in their RVF. When asked to verbalize what word is being shown, the verbal response, typically controlled by the left hemisphere, will be “ABLE.” However, if the patient is instructed to write down what they see using their left hand, which is predominantly controlled by the right hemisphere, they typically write “TAX.” Thus, LVF stimuli are available only to the right hemisphere for report and control of action, while RVF stimuli are available only to the left hemisphere. Visual information, therefore, does not seem to be fully access unified in split-brain subjects. The same observation applies to other sensory modalities that exhibit significant lateralization, such as touch.[25]

The failure of access unity has led some researchers to the conclusion that split-brain subjects enjoy two separate streams of conscious experience at each moment. But whether this two-streams model accurately represents the structure of consciousness in split-brain subjects remains a highly debated question.

One reason for this is that the empirical profile of split-brain subjects encompasses more than just the failure of access unity. Firstly, anecdotal evidence suggests that split-brain subjects rarely show behavioral signs of access unity failure in everyday contexts, and when present, such signs are minor. Secondly, even in experimental settings, split-brain subjects can display signs of partial integration between the two hemispheres. The simplest form of this integration is the integration of emotional experience. But there is even evidence of some sensory integration.[26] Thirdly, although in experimental conditions the split hemispheres typically guide disconnected behaviors that conflict with each other, split-brain subjects are not usually conscious of this conflict. The behavioral profile of split-brain subjects is therefore intricate, and this has led some to adopt alternative models of the split-brain consciousness.[27]

We review these models and the status of the debate below. Before discussing the models however, it is worth distinguishing between two questions about split-brains. The first question concerns the structure of conscious experience in split-brain patients, roughly, whether split-brain subjects possess two separate streams of consciousness or enjoy a single unified stream. The second question is whether split-brains pose a counterexample to the Unity Thesis. These questions are interconnected: if split-brain subjects preserve their identity as single subjects while exhibiting disunified streams of consciousness then the Unity Thesis might have a counterexample.[28] However, the issue of whether split-brain patients preserve their identity as single subjects is not resolved solely by answering the structural question.[29] In the following discussion, we will start with the structural question and end with its implications for the Unity Thesis.

3.1.1 Models of Consciousness in Split-Brain Subjects

Views about the structure of consciousness in split-brain subjects can be divided into three categories: two-stream views, single-stream views, and partial-stream views. As we saw, on two-stream models, split-brain subjects have two synchronous and separate streams of conscious experience each hosted by one of the hemispheres. This view was common among early researchers in the field and remains one of the main models of the structure of consciousness in split-brains. [30]

According to single-stream views, split-brain subjects experience a single unified stream of consciousness at any given moment. This view comes in three flavors. On one version of the view, only one of the hemispheres, typically the hemisphere associated with language, hosts this single stream. This view has been attributed to some early researchers and goes along with the cognitivist thesis that consciousness requires linguistic capacities. But the view does not seem to have many contemporary advocates.[31] On a second version of the single-stream view, split-brain subjects possess one unified stream of consciousness hosted by a single hemisphere at any given moment. But the hosting hemisphere can switch. This view is often called the switch-model.[32] On the third version of the single-stream view, split-brain subjects enjoy a single phenomenally unified stream of consciousness, hosted by both hemispheres. Proponents of this view argue that the empirical data from split-brain studies only supports the failure of access unity, and access disunity is compatible with phenomenal unity.[33]

On partial-stream views, split-brain subjects have a partially unified stream of consciousness that spans both hemispheres. A partially unified stream of consciousness contains experiences that are not unified with each other but are linked by being unified with a third experience.

As we shall soon see, partial-stream views provide an attractive explanation of the complex empirical profile of split-brain subjects. However, such views entail that phenomenal unity is not a transitive relation, and this has led to some degree of skepticism.[34]

The above views can be combined to create hybrid versions. A common hybrid option is that split-brain subjects have two-streams of consciousness in experimental contexts, but they enjoy either a fully unified or a partially unified in everyday contexts.[35]

Although there are at least five core and several hybrid options that have been adopted for modeling split-brain consciousness, two of the core one-stream options, namely the “one conscious hemisphere” and “access disunity without phenomenal disunity” ones, do not seem to have advocates among contemporary theorists. The “one conscious hemisphere” view lost support not only because of the unpopularity of the idea that linguistic capacities are necessary for conscious experience, but also due to evidence suggesting that both hemispheres are conscious as well. [36]

In earlier work, Bayne and Chalmers defended the “phenomenal unity without access unity” account. Drawing on Sperling’s influential experiments, they argued that access unity is susceptible to informational bottlenecks that do not affect phenomenal unity. Therefore, rather than appealing to failures of phenomenal unity, we can explain failures of access unity in terms of informational limitations that restrict access unity.[37] However, Bayne later abandoned this model in favor of the “switch model”. One reason for this was that, despite the complex relationship between access unity and phenomenal unity, access disunity remains the strongest behavioral evidence for phenomenal disunity. Thus, disregarding access disunity as evidence for phenomenal disunity threatens to jeopardize the empirical basis of the ongoing debate.

Contemporary discussion has thus mostly revolved around the two-streams, the partial-stream, the switch model, and a few hybrid versions that combine these core options. In what follows, we present a closer review of the status of the debate regarding these models.[38]

3.1.2 The Two-streams Model and its Variants

Under the orthodox version of the two-stream model, split-brain consciousness consists of two fully disunified streams hosted by the two hemispheres, both inside and outside experimental conditions.[39] We call this model the pure two-stream model to contrast it with hybrid models that apply the two-stream model to a limited set of conditions. Proponents of the pure model defend it on multiple grounds: (a) the observed behavioral pattern among split-brain subjects that is indicative of access disunity, (b) the lack of sufficient neural connectivity between the two hemispheres, and (c) the implausibility of the alternative models or the lack of evidential support for them. We can think of these as together constituting an abductive argument for the pure two-stream model. Given diminished inter-hemispheric neural connectivity and the implausibility of alternative models, the two-stream model is the best explanation for the behavior of split-brain subjects.

This said, both the pure two-stream model and the arguments in its support have also received serious criticism. Opponents argue that the two-stream model has difficulty explaining three aspects of the intricate profile of split-brain subjects. First, there is evidence of partial inter-hemispheric integration among split-brains. Second, the behavior exhibited by split-brain subjects in everyday life is, more or less, unified. And third, there are no signs of awareness of inter-hemispheric conflict among split-brain subjects. We review the first two of these challenges below.[40]

As an example of partial integration and why it might be troubling for the two-stream model, consider an extended version of our earlier example in which a split-brain subject has a visual experience, E1, of “Tax”, hosted by the right hemisphere, and another visual experience, E2, of “able”, hosted by the left hemisphere. Let’s add to this that the subject also has a fear experience that is access unified with both E1 and E2. This would constitute a case of partial integration because, although E1 and E2 are not integrated with each other, both are integrated with the fear experience. Partial integration is not rare among split-brain subjects. In fact, partial integration is to be expected because callosotomy does not sever the sub-cortical connections between the two hemispheres, and it is commonly held that the neural correlates of affective experience are sub-cortical.

But partial integration is not in itself sufficient for ruling out the two-stream model. To rule out the two-stream model, one needs to see partial integration as evidence for partial unity and this is what the opponents of the two-stream model try to establish. They argue that many cases of partial integration are in fact cases of partial unity and this is a reason to reject the two-stream model. In our toy example, E1 and E2 are not unified, but there is a single fear experience, E3, that is unified with E1 and E2. Since this is incompatible with the two-stream model, we should reject this model.

Proponents of the two-stream model have responded in a variety of ways. Schechter (2018), for example, questions the partial integration of affective experience by arguing that the neural correlates of emotional experience are not confined to sub-cortical areas. However, given the difficulty in settling disputes about the neural correlates of conscious experience, this remains an open issue. Moreover, it is questionable whether all the evidence indicative of partial integration can be explained away in a similar fashion.[41]

A second response to the partial integration argument appeals to what is sometimes dubbed the duplication gambit. On this strategy, we should understand our example as a case where there are two fear experiences, E3* and E3** with the same fear content, where E3* is unified with E1 and E3** is unified with E2. On this interpretation, there is no single fear experience that is shared between the two-streams. Generally, partial integration does not entail partial unity, as it can be explained by duplication.[42] Those who adopt this strategy argue that the behavioral data for partial integration can be accommodated by the two-streams model.

But it has been argued that the duplication gambit is incompatible with the most plausible ways to individuate experience. Bayne (2008, 2010), for example, rejects this option on the grounds that it is incompatible with the tripartite conception of experience. On this conception, experiences should be individuated by their subjects, contents, and times of occurrence. This conception implies that a single subject cannot have numerically distinct synchronous experiences with the same content. It will not do, Bayne argues, to individuate experiences partly by appealing to their neural correlates. For, accepting such a view would sever the connection between introspection, and the phenomenal character of experience.[43]

A second challenge for the two-stream model is the seemingly unified behavior of split-brain subjects outside experimental conditions (Bayne 2008, 2010; Godfrey Smith 2022; Lycan 2022). If, as the pure two-streams model contends, split-brain subjects enjoy two independent streams of consciousness at all times, then we should expect to see behavioral signs of disunity in everyday contexts, but we do not see such signs, at least not as frequently as we might expect.[44] How can the two-stream model accommodate this fact?

On the face of it, there are several options for the two-stream model here. One option is to argue that in everyday contexts the two hemispheres can gain access to the same information (for example, by movement) and, as a result, the two hemispheres often host experiences with the same contents. In other words, the two streams duplicate some of each other’s experiences. This option, therefore, gives rise to the same questions and issues that the duplication response to partial integration gives rise to.

A second option would be to abandon the pure two-streams view in favor of a hybrid version. A somewhat popular version of this move is to hold that split-brain subjects are disunified in cognitively demanding conditions, whether they are experimental conditions or everyday contexts, yet enjoy a single unified stream of consciousness hosted by both hemispheres in non-demanding everyday conditions (Hurley 1998, Tye 2003, Downey 2018, Godfrey Smith 2022). Another option would be to combine the two-streams view with a partial unity account (Godfrey-Smith 2020, ch. 6).

The hybrid views give rise to interesting questions about the vehicles of consciousness and their relationship to phenomenal structure. Given that split-brain subjects remain partially neurally split in all conditions, how could their consciousness switch from a two-stream structure in experimental conditions to a unified or partially unified single stream that expands over both hemispheres in non-experimental conditions?

One response has been to appeal to a form of vehicle externalism on which reafferent sensorimotor feedback can extend beyond the brain and unify the two hemispheres. A view like this was originally proposed in Hurley (1998) and recently developed and defended in Downey (2018), and Godfrey-Smith (2020). Godfrey-Smith links this issue with animal consciousness. As he notes, lateralization of cognitive abilities is very common in animals. Moreover, in many animal brains, direct inter-hemispheric connections are sparse. Extensive and direct connections between the two hemispheres are confined to placental mammals. Inter-hemispheric connectivity diminishes when we move to non-placental mammals, shrinks further more among birds, and reaches minimal levels in reptiles and fish. Despite this, most animals exhibit unified agency and unified mindedness. This, Godfrey-Smith argues, lends support to an externalist account of mental and experiential unity.

This form of vehicle externalism invites counter-responses that are familiar from the debate over the extended mind (see the entry on externalism about the mind). Opponents typically argue that sensory and action systems form a boundary around the mind and interaction across this boundary do not count as a form of integration that can unify a mind (Schechter 2018, Bayne 2010).

3.1.3 The Switch Model

On the switch model, split-brain subjects have a single unified stream of consciousness that alternates between the hemispheres, depending on which hemisphere wins the competition for focal attention. Proponents of this model have cited multiple sources of evidence in its support. There is, for example, some empirical data indicating extinction: one hemisphere can become unconscious when the other takes control or is primed for action. Additionally, evidence for the view that focal attention is necessary for consciousness[45], combined with the observation that the two hemispheres can compete for focal attentional in a winner-takes-all manner[46] indirectly supports the switch model. Bayne, the key contemporary proponent of the switch model, further argues for its validity based on the Unity Thesis. If the synchronous conscious experiences of a subject are necessarily unified, and split-brain patients maintain their identity as single subjects, then split-brain subjects must have a single unified stream of conscious experience at each moment and the switch model is arguably the best way to explain this result.

However, the switch model faces several challenges, some of which are similar to those encountered by the two-stream model. One challenge is explaining the unified behavior of split-brain subjects in everyday contexts. Bayne suggests three possible explanations: (a) a single conscious hemisphere predominantly controls behavior in everyday life, (b) rapid inter-hemispheric switches might create the illusion of unified behavior guided by rich experience, or (c) split-brain subjects may rely on non-focal attention in everyday contexts, allowing for a unified conscious stream across both hemispheres.

A second challenge for the switch model is the evidence of inter-hemispheric integration. Note that like the two-streams model, the switch model accepts that the two hemispheres are, for the most part, informationally isolated. Thus, evidence of partial integration would be challenging for this view too. In response, it has been argued that the available empirical evidence for partial integration is inconclusive and subject to alternative interpretations, including unconscious integration, priming effects, and non-synchronous conscious integration.

A third challenge is that split-brain subjects rarely exhibit signs of interhemispheric conflict. If consciousness switches from one hemisphere to another and the two hemispheres can host representations with conflicting contents, we expect to observe signs that one or both of the hemispheres are conscious of this conflict. But we do not observe such signs. In response, Bayne suggests exploring parallels with cases of cognitive deficits where subjects are unaware of their impairments, but he admits that this remains the most serious challenge for the switch model.[47]

The switch model’s appeal to the idea that the two hemispheres compete for focal attention has also come under pressure. Hill (2018) cites evidence that competition for focal attention often has a center-surround structure, but such competition patterns are often intra-hemispheric. For example, focal attention to a spatial region in LVF reduces focal attention to surrounding areas in LVF; it does not have much impact on the distribution of attention to RVF. The switch model’s appeal to interhemispheric competition for attention, Hill concludes, is empirically implausible.

On reflection, the switch model is structurally similar to the two-stream model. On both models, the two hemispheres host informationally disunified representations. The main difference between the two models comes down to whether both hemispheres are conscious at any point in time or only one of them is. This observation has several implications. First, as we have seen before, the two views share some of their main challenges. Second, structurally similar options are available for the two models in response to these challenges. Consider, for example, the idea that the unified behavior of split-brains in everyday contexts can be explained in terms of a single hemisphere taking control of the subject’s behavior. On the switch model, this is the only conscious hemisphere in those occasions. However, the two-streamers can adopt a structurally similar strategy: they can say that one of the split-brain patient’s conscious streams takes over control of action because it wins the competition for focal attention, but since attention is not necessary for consciousness, the losing hemisphere is still conscious. Setting aside the issue of whether focal attention is necessary for consciousness, this two-stream response is structurally similar to the switch model’s. It thus seems that settling the dispute between the two views is a matter of determining the relationship between attention and consciousness on the one hand and the empirical plausibility of the idea that the two hemispheres compete for attention on the other.[48]

3.1.4 The Partial Unity Model

As we saw in the preceding discussion, evidence for partial integration and the seemingly unified behavior of split-brain subjects in everyday conditions put some pressure on both the two-stream and the switch models. As we also saw, proponents of these models propose to dissolve these challenges in a variety of ways. But another way to accommodate these challenges is to appeal to the partial-stream model. On this model, split-brain subjects enjoy a single but partially unified stream of consciousness. A partially unified stream of consciousness contains experiences that are not unified with each other but are nevertheless connected by being unified with a third experience.[49]

On the pure version of the partial-stream model, split-brain subjects are partially unified in both experimental and everyday conditions. This model can provide a straightforward explanation of partial integration in split-brain subjects. Furthermore, the gradeability of partial unity enables the model to explain the differences in split-brain behavior between experimental and non-experimental settings in terms of fluctuations in degrees of partial unity across different contexts. While a comprehensive account would require understanding the mechanisms underlying partial integration and its variations in different contexts, the partial unity model seems to provide a more promising explanation of the empirical profile of split-brain patients.

Despite its explanatory advantages, however, partial unity has not been a popular choice among theorists. One reason for this has been a degree of a priori skepticism about the view, grounded in the alleged inconceivability of partial unity.[50] There are several versions of this objection in the literature. A simple version is based on the premise that we cannot imagine what it is like to have a partially unified consciousness. But as opponents of the partial unity model themselves admit, this sort of inconceivability is hardly a guide to impossibility.

A more promising version of the argument is that partial unity is inconceivable in that “there is nothing that would even count as successfully imagining what it is like to have a partially unified consciousness” (Schechter 2014). But even this version of the argument can be resisted. As Schechter (2014) points out, it is not easy to see why this argument would not equally target the dual-stream account. Suppose that the fact that there is nothing that would count as successfully imagining what it is like to have a partially unified consciousness is grounded in the fact there is no single subjective point of view from which we can imagine what it is like to have a partially unified consciousness. If so, the dual-stream model is equally threatened by the argument. For, there is no single subjective point of view from which we can imagine what it is like to have two separate streams of consciousness. But it is unacceptable, Schechter argues, to reject all contenders but the single stream view on purely a priori grounds. So, the argument is problematic.

There is a second reason to be skeptical about the inconceivability argument against partial unity. Arguably, a subject with a partially unified consciousness does not enjoy a full perspective that encompasses all of their experiences at a moment. This may explain why it is impossible to fully project oneself into the perspective of a partially unified subject. For, any perspective that would reflect the subjective point of view of such a subject would be either partial in that it would not encompass the totality of the experiences that the subject has, or it would represent it incorrectly in that it would occupy a perspective that a subject with partial unity cannot have. Thus, it seems that we can explain the inconceivability of partial unity in a manner that undercuts the force of the inconceivability argument against it.

Although Schechter thinks that partial unity cannot be rejected on a priori grounds, she has argued that there are empirical reason against partial unity. Schechter’s argument, put roughly, is as follows. Take two split-brain experiences, E1 and E2, that are not unified with each other but are unified with the phenomenal content C3. In a situation like this, we would have two subjective perspectives, P1 and P2, where P1 encompasses E1 and C3 while P2 encompasses E2 and C3. A partial unity characterization of such a situation would be that there is a single experience, E3, with the content C3, that is shared between P1 and P2. Now suppose we have independent reasons to hold that P1 and P2 are perspectives of distinct subjects, S1 and S2. If so, Schechter argues, we should reject the partial unity characterization of the situation. For on such a characterization, E3 would belong to two numerically distinct subjects, which conflicts with the maxim that we should partially individuate experiences in terms of their subjects. So, our empirical grounds for positing the existence of two subjects in the split-brain case are grounds to reject the partial unity model.

Schechter’s rejection of partial unity raises interesting questions about the relationship between the individuation of experience and that of subjects of experience. Suppose that subjects of experience are grounded in physical facts/events. Then it seems conceivable that two otherwise distinct subjects might share some of their physical correlates and it does not seem incoherent that the shared physical correlates might be sufficient grounds for the emergence of an experience. This gives us a way to imagine how two distinct subjects might share one experience. Thus, Schechter’s argument against partial unity is not as straightforward as it might seem. Ultimately, the question of whether partial unity provides a satisfactory account of split-brain patients depends on deep and difficult issues concerning the individuation of experiences and their subjects, which are too close to the deep questions about unity that the debate revolves around.

3.1.5 Split-Brains and the Unity Thesis

Earlier we distinguished between questions about the structure of consciousness in split-brain subjects and whether split-brain poses a counterexample to the Unity Thesis. We have covered the former issue. Here we will turn to the latter.

As we saw, whether the two-streams model is the correct structural model of split-brain subjects is still an open question. If the two-streams model does not correctly depict the structure of split-brain consciousness in any contexts, then the question about the unity thesis does not even get off the ground. But even if it turns out that split-brain subjects enjoy two streams in some contexts, whether we have a counterexample to the Unity Thesis remains a substantive issue. This is because it is not obvious how many subjects are contained within a split-brain. Therefore, some theorists who disagree about the structural question might agree about whether the split-brain phenomenon poses a counterexample to the Unity Thesis.

On Bayne’s view, for example, split-brain subjects preserve their identity as single subjects. However, Bayne maintains that the switch model offers the best account of split-brain consciousness. He therefore does not consider split-brains to be potential counterexamples to the Unity Thesis.[51] Schechter, on the other hand, defends the two-stream model. But on her view, split-brains typically host two minds or subjects,[52] although she combines this with the thesis that split-brains are a single person. So, if we accept Schechter’s account of the split-brain consciousness, whether split-brains pose a counterexample to the Unity Thesis depends on whether the notion of the subject that is used in the Unity Thesis corresponds to Schechter’s notion of subject or her notion of a person.[53]

3.2 Other Disorders of Unity

As noted earlier, one way to categorize potential disorders of unity is to divide them into three groups. In the first group, the clinical profile is largely similar to split-brain cases, that is, empirical evidence indicates a splitting of consciousness into several separate centers, although whether this is indicative of a break in phenomenal unity is controversial. The second group consists in cases where the clinical profile is so severe that it indicates a radical fragmentation or shattering of the unity of consciousness, rather than a split into several centers. Finally, there are cases where the scope of unified consciousness seems to have dramatically reduced. Here, we review dissociative identity disorder as a representative of the first category and schizophrenia as a representative of the second.

3.2.1 Dissociative Identity Disorder

A candidate phenomenon in the first group of disorders is what used to be called multiple personality disorder, now, more neutrally, dissociative identity disorder (DID). Those who suffer from DID show two or more distinct identities or personalities, usually referred to as the patients’ alters. Different alters typically differ in their desires, intentions, goals, and character traits.

DID’s behavioral manifestations can come in two forms. In one form, the alters seem to ‘take turns’ in being active and each alter only recalls the periods in which it was active. In the other both alters are present at the same time. Here, for example, the alter in control of speech reports the thoughts and orders of another ‘person’ inside her, with whom she does not identify. This form of DID is called the co-conscious form in the literature.

Since late 19th century, DID has been regarded as a disorder of the unity of consciousness, where consciousness breaks into fragments corresponding to the different alters (See Binet 1890 [1977a,b] and Wilkes 1989). But it is not always clear whether the early theorists saw the condition as a fragmentation of phenomenal unity. Among recent theorists, Braude (1995) endorses the phenomenal disunity interpretation of DID. (See also Brook 2015.)

Why should we regard DID as a case of phenomenal disunity? One argument for the view is that multiple alters correspond to different subjects/agents/centers of consciousness and thus, there must be multiple disunified streams of consciousness in a DID patient.[54]

This argument can be resisted in several ways. Firstly, it is not completely clear that the alters should be regarded as different subjects/agents/centers of consciousness as opposed to different states of a single subject/agent/center of consciousness.[55] So the first premise of the argument can be denied.

But even if we accept this premise, it is not clear why it follows that DID patients have multiple streams of consciousness. Take the diachronic version of DID and let us accept that a DID patient diachronically switches from one subject of experience to another. Still, it might be that these different subjects are partially overlapping in the sense that they share some of their experiences. This is not an unreasonable position given that the multiple personalities of a DID patients share their sensory motor capacities. For example, a DID patient who switches from being an adult to a child usually preserves her perceptual experience during the switch. But if so, it is more reasonable to hold that DID patients have a diachronically unified stream of consciousness that switches from one subject to another.

A second argument, implicit in the discussion, is that if DID patients had a unified stream of consciousness, they would not exhibit the symptoms that they typically do. For example, a diachronically switching DID patient would not exhibit their typical pattern of amnesia if they had a continuous stream of consciousness. Similarly, the dominant alter in a co-conscious DID patient would not report that there is a person with different thoughts and desires inside them if the DID patient had a single stream of consciousness at every moment.

But it is unclear why we should accept that phenomenal disunity is a necessary component of any explanation of these DID symptoms. Take the co-conscious DID patient. One might hold that such patients are, in relevant respects, similar to subjects suffering from hallucinations. We do not usually conclude that a subject who hallucinates hearing another subject talking about them suffers from phenomenal disunity. Why should we then assume that phenomenal disunity should be assumed in an explanation of the symptoms of a co-conscious DID patient?[56] This is a somewhat under-explored issue.

Suppose we reject the phenomenal disunity account of DID based on the above observations. There is still a strong intuitive sense in which DID involves a split in the unity of consciousness. If so, in what sense is consciousness disunified in this disorder? Some have argued that DID patients suffer from disruptions in the unity of self-consciousness. If this is correct, then DID would be a case in which phenomenal unity and unity of self-consciousness come apart.

3.2.2 Schizophrenia

Schizophrenia is a disorder in which the general capacity for regulating thought is seriously disrupted. Schizophrenic symptoms are usually divided into positive and negative ones. Positive signs include formal thought disorders, and disorders of thought content. Formal thought disorders are disruptions in the structure and form of thinking exemplified by illogical thinking, loose associations, incoherence, derailment and tangentiality. Disorders of thought content, broadly construed, include conditions such as delusional thinking, sensory hallucinations, and thought insertion. Negative signs involve deficits in affect and thought, such as anhedonia (loosing the ability to experience pleasure) and avolition (lack of motivation).[57]In some particularly severe forms of schizophrenia, the patient is unable to put together perceptions, thoughts and motives into simple plans of action or act on such plans if formed, even plans to obtain sustenance, to tend to bodily needs, to escape painful irritants, and so on.

Theorists as early as Kraepelin (1896) have held that a breakdown in unity of consciousness is one of the chief aspects of schizophrenia, although what such theorists mean by unity of consciousness is not always clear. Among contemporary theorists, Brook (2015) explicitly describes schizophrenia as a condition of fragmentation of experience, which is naturally interpreted as a case of fragmentation of phenomenal consciousness.

But why should we take schizophrenia as a phenomenon in which the phenomenal unity of consciousness is fragmented? It is not easy to find explicit arguments for this claim in the literature. But one could identify two implicit arguments in the discussions of the topic. These arguments are analogous in form to the arguments that we discussed in the case of dissociative identity disorder (DID).

The first argument is explanatory. What explains, or is at least a part of what explains, a schizophrenic patient’s thought disorder, especially formal thought disorder, is a fragmentation of her phenomenal experience. The second argument builds on the intuitive sense in which the unity of a schizophrenic subject seems to be shattered. How could schizophrenic patients have a phenomenally unified consciousness when they are not a unified subject? We can call this the argument from subjective disunity.

Despite their intuitive pull, it is not hard to resist these arguments. To start with the first, it makes sense to assume that phenomenal unity might be a necessary condition for certain forms of integration of intentional states. But it is far from clear that phenomenal unity is sufficient for this form of integration. There is a host of other cognitive capacities that might be required for such integration: memory, selective attention, certain forms of emotion regulation, and certain forms of reasoning. And although, on some views, some of these integrative capacities are necessary for unity of consciousness, it would be a stretch to hold that all of them are. If so, a schizophrenic patient’s thought disorders can be explained in terms of such cognitive deficits and without any assumptions about phenomenal disunity.[58]

This response to the explanatory argument also sheds light on how the argument from subjective disunity can be resisted. Let us suppose, as the response to the explanatory argument does, that some integrative cognitive capacities can break down despite phenomenal unity. Let us also suppose that break down in these integrative capacities is sufficient for subjective-disunity. It then logically follows that subjective disunity is not sufficient for phenomenal disunity. But this logical implication, also provides an explanation for why subjective disunity is compatible with phenomenal unity. So, the argument from subject-disunity to phenomenal disunity also fails.

It is thus unclear that schizophrenia is an example of a shattering of the phenomenal unity of consciousness.[59] But this brings up a similar question as the one that we asked about DID. For, there is still a strong intuitive sense in which schizophrenic patients exhibit a fragmentation in the unity of consciousness. If this is not phenomenal disunity, in what sense is consciousness disunified in this disorder? This is an interesting question that requires extensive discussion. But one answer can be similar to the one that we gave for DID: schizophrenia can be regarded as a disruption in the unity of some form of self-consciousness, perhaps a form of self-consciousness that requires integrating one’s beliefs, emotions, intentions, and actions into a coherent and meaningful narrative.[60]

Other disorders that some have interpreted as disorders of unity of consciousness include simultagnosia, anasognosia, dyexecutive disorder, and Balint’s syndrome. Like DID and schizophrenia, whether there is phenomenal disunity in these conditions is a substantive and controversial issue. (For discussion see Bayne 2010 (ch. 7), and Brooke 2015.)

4. Unity Across Time

Unified consciousness at a given time (synchronic unity) has been our main topic so far. We now turn, more briefly, to unified consciousness over time (diachronic unity). As was noted as long ago as Kant, unity across time was deemed to be required even for such rudimentary mental operations as counting (1781: A103); indeed, some form of unity across time is crucial for virtually all cognition of any complexity. Now, unification in consciousness might not be the only way to unite earlier cognitive states (earlier thoughts, earlier experiences) with current ones, but it is certainly a central way and the one best known to us.

4.1 Retention and Memory

It is common to think that diachronically unified consciousness requires retention of earlier experienced contents as one experienced them. What the retention crucial to diachronic unity consists in is a matter of some interest. It is tempting to assume that it is a kind of memory. However, as Husserl already told us, there is reason to be skeptical of this approach. There is a difference between experiencing a succession from time 1 to time 2 and merely remembering experiencing what happened at time 1 while experiencing something at time 2. Dainton captures Husserl’s point by noting the difference between “immediate and represented experience—remembering or imagining hearing a tone is not the same as directly experiencing the tone” (Dainton 2005: 155; Dainton cites Husserl 1928).

Kelly (2005) raises a similar question. Suppose that one is listening to a melody. It has five notes and the final note is just being played. If one simply recollected the earlier notes, one should experience a chord, not five notes spread out and related to one another in time. Somehow, the earlier notes come ‘date-stamped’ but still available to be integrated with the current experience in a single, temporally-extended, unified experience. Whatever this process is like, it is clearly vital to our kind of unified consciousness. Without it, one could not hear any sequence as a sequence or so much as read a simple sentence. Though some theorists call this across-time process unity of consciousness, a more distinctive name for it would be the continuity of consciousness.

This sort of continuity of consciousness can span very short durations (such as the ‘specious present’). Even a seemingly simple, current experience is in fact a continuous experience of more than one instant, and must be if one is to hear a sound or perceive (as opposed to remember) any temporally stretched phenomenon. How can one have a unified conscious experience (not just a memory) of duration?

Here again, the debate that we mentioned earlier over whether a unified conscious experience is one experience or an assembly of many experiences rears its head. Dainton (2005: chs. 5–7) takes a continuous, unified experience to include co-conscious experiences as parts. Tye (2003: ch. 4) urges instead that a diachronically unified experience has multiple contents but no experiences as parts.

4.2 Unity and Personal Identity

In the history of European philosophy at least since Locke, diachronic unified consciousness has been closely linked to personal identity in the philosopher’s sense, i.e., continuing to be a single person, one and the same person, across time. (The point of the restriction to philosophy is that clinical psychologists use the term quite differently, as the name for certain aspects of personality and ‘self-conception’.) Whatever may be true of the kind of diachronic unity we just discussed, the kind of diachronic unity associated with personal identity might be a kind of memory, specifically, a kind of autobiographical memory. At least since Locke, philosophers have argued that as far back as unified consciousness via the right kind of autobiographical memory extends, there extends the person, one and the same person over all this time. The right kind of autobiographical memory is memory of the having, feeling, or doing of earlier experiences, emotions, actions, and so on. As Locke has it, being the same person just is having the ‘same consciousness’. We must be careful here. There is lots of autobiographical memory that is not memory from the point of view of experiencing. A person can remember that so-and-so happened to her without remembering the event, the experience of it, or anything else ‘from the inside’, to use Shoemaker’s useful metaphor again. Memory theorists’ standard categories are not fine-grained enough for our purposes here.

Some have urged that memory-carried diachronic unity is not sufficient for being one person over time. Kant, for example, argued for a dissociation here, in his famous critique of the third paralogism. In Kant’s view, continuity sufficient to “retain the thought of the previous subject and so hand it over to the subsequent subject” (1781: A363), continuity sufficient therefore for diachronic unity of consciousness, is quite compatible with the ‘retained thoughts’ being passed from one subject to another, compatible therefore with an utter absence of personal identity. If so, diachronic unity is not sufficient for personal identity (Brook 1994: ch. 8). (Note: Locke and Kant may be less far apart than this brief discussion would suggest. We are merely using them to illustrate the two positions, not discussing either of them fully.)

Phenomena relevant to identity in things other than persons can be a matter of degree. This is well illustrated by the famous ship of Theseus. Suppose that over the years, a certain ship was rebuilt, board by board, until every bit of it has been replaced. Is the ship at the end of the process the ship that started the process? Now suppose that we take all those rotten, replaced boards and reassemble them into a ship. Is this ship the original ship? It seems that there is no determinate answer to these questions. Say what you like, and what you like may vary depending on whether you are an insurance adjuster or a history buff. Many philosophers have insisted that such indeterminacy can never be the case for persons. Identity in persons is always completely unambiguous, not something that could ever be a matter of degree (Bishop Joseph Butler [1736] is a well-known example).

Brain bisection cases in which, some urge, unified consciousness splits in two may be relevant here (Parfit 1971, 1984). As Parfit argues, the possibility of persons (or at any rate minds) splitting and re-fusing puts real pressure on intuitions about our specialness. Perhaps the continuity of persons can be just as tangled and just as much a matter of degree as the continuity of any other middle-sized object.

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Acknowledgments

As of the 2025 revision, Farid Masrour has taken over responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry. The latest revision of this entry has benefited from helpful comments by Elizabeth Schechter. While most of the entry is new, a little material from the previous version remains in §1.1 and §3, along with most of §4.

Copyright © 2025 by
Farid Masrour <masrour@wisc.edu>
Andrew Brook
Paul Raymont

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