1. Unity of consciousness is also an important topic in Buddhist philosophy. This entry does not cover Buddhist discussions of unity.

2. Arguments of this form can be found in P. F. Strawson (1966), Cassam (1996), Hurley (1994, 1998) and Revonsuo (2003). For critical assessment see Brook (2005).

3. One exception to this pattern of neglect was Gestalt psychology. Indeed, it has been argued that due to the influence of Gestalt psychology some positivists tried to make their systems compatible with it (Smith 1994: 23). For instance, Carnap chose to avoid any commitment to atoms of experience as the elements of his system, opting instead for ‘total experiences’. As we will see, a notion similar to his concept of irreducible experiential wholes has been revived in contemporary discussion.

4. For example: Stevenson (2000), Bayne and Chalmers (2003), Hurley (2003), Kennett and Matthews (2003), Rosenthal (2003), Radden (2003), Tye (2003), Zeki (2003), Nikolinakos (2004), Brook and Raymont (2006), LaRock (2007), Bayne (2008, 2010), Dainton (2010), Schechter (2014, 2018), Masrour (2014a, 2020), Hill (2014, 2018), Watzl (2014), Roelofs (2014), Downey (2018), and Godfrey-smith (2022).

5. See Bayne (2018) and Moreland (2018) in this connection.

6. For a detailed discussion of some of these concepts see Bayne and Chalmers (2003), Tye (2003), Hill (2018), and Dainton (2005).

7. This is closely related to the notion of binding in psychology.

8. One might hold that this sense of belonging to the same space is grounded in a more fundamental sense in which Mary experiences the objects around her as standing in spatial relations to each other and to her point of view.

9. For discussion of Kant see Brook (1994). For an interesting discussion of Broad and Husserl see Dainton (2005), chapter 6.

10. Phenomenal unity is the core notion in Dainton (2005), Bayne (2010), and Tye (2003). But this has exceptions such as Schechter (2018).

11. This corresponds to the distinction between Newtonian and Leibnizian views in Masrour (2014a).

12. As Tye endorses the no experiential parts view, his proposal is not, strictly speaking, an analysis of the unity relation. But as we saw, we can articulate this view as an analysis of the unity relation among phenomenal contents.

13. Brook (1994) argues that Kant grounds unity in the oneness of acts of synthesis and Giustina (2017) interprets Brentano in a similar fashion.

14. Note that experientialism has to be distinguished from the thesis that unity is a singularizing relation, that is, that experiences are unified only if there they together form a single entity. One could accept singularization yet hold that the single entity whose existence is a necessary condition for unity is not an experience but is something like a stream of consciousness or a momentary slice of it (a phenomenal field, as is sometimes put).

15. Proponents of EP include Lockwood (1993), Dainton (2005), Shoemaker (1996), Bayne and Chalmers (2003), Bayne (2010), and Masrour (2020).

16. James was the first champion of NEP. He endorsed it in the course of repudiating the ‘mind-stuff theory’, according to which “our mental states are composite in structure, made up of smaller states conjoined” (1890, 145). Against this view James says that, while our experience is complex, this complexity is not a matter of there being several experiences (or ‘feelings’) present in an encompassing experience. James (1909) expands this argument. Searle (2000, 54–6), and Tye (2003, 27) are other current advocates of NEP.

17. See Bayne (2010) in connection with the former view and Masrour (2020) in connection with the latter.

18. James’ argument has recently sparked a literature on the combination problem for constitutive panpsychism. For review see Lockwood (1993), Chalmers (2016), Goff (2017, chs.7&8).

19. For discussion of analogous arguments see Hurley (1998) and Bayne (2001).

20. Bayne (2010, 30–2) develops this line of response.

21. For discussion of some of the issues that might arise see Masrour (2014b), Bayne (2014), Hill (2014, 2018), and Schechter (2018, 45–6).

22. Nagel (1971) was perhaps the first philosopher to write on them and his paper continues to be influential. Nagel’s work sparked a slew of work within philosophy, including Puccetti (1973, 1981), Marks (1981), Hirsch (1991), Lockwood (1989), Hurley (1998), Tye (2003), Bayne (2008, 2010), and Schechter (2010, 2018)

23. For a review of the history of the procedure see Schechter (2018).

24. As we shall see this point has been recently contested.

25. For a review of the experimental paradigms for studying split-brain subjects see Lassonde & Ouimet (2010).

26. Trevarthen & Sperry (1973) reported integration of “crude” visual information. There is also evidence that “deep touch” information can be integrated while fine-grained tactile information is not. See also Bayne (2008).

27. Not all split-brain subjects have been tested for the presence or absence of these signs. Therefore, it remains uncertain whether these observations universally apply to all subjects who have undergone complete callosotomy. Nonetheless, for the purpose of our discussion, we will assume their general validity.

28. We say “might” because the issue depends on the modal status of the Unity Thesis. See 3.1.5 for discussion.

29. Bayne formulates the Unity Thesis in terms of a biological/animal sense of the subject of experience. But how many animals there are in a split brain does not get an obvious response. Also, and as noted earlier, if we regard the Unity Thesis as aiming to capture the intuitive sense in which unity is part of the essence of consciousness, then it is not obvious that the notion of subject that is used to formulate the thesis must be subject as animal.

30. Among neuroscientists Gazzaniga (1970); Sperry (1977); LeDoux, Wilson, & Gazzaniga (1977); Milner, Taylor, & Jones-Gotman (1990); Mark (1996); Zaidel et al. (2003); and Tononi, (2004) have endorsed this model. Among philosophers Dewitt (1975); Davis (1997); and Schechter (2018) have defended the view.

31. Eccles (1973, 1965) and Popper & Eccles (1977) are often cited as proponents of this view. But see Schechter (2014, 349) for doubts about this interpretation.

32. Levy (1977, 1990) proposes an early version of the switch model. Among philosophers, Hurley (1998) can be read as advocating the view, but the most prominent contemporary advocate is Bayne (2008, 2010).

33. Bayne defended this option in Bayne and Chalmers 2003 but later changed his view to the switch model. See also Alter (2010).

34. Lockwood (1989) is the first explicit articulation of this model. But Trevarthen (1974) and Moor (1982) also implicitly suggest it.

35. Marks (1980) and Tye (2003) hold the former view, while Godfrey-smith (2022) combines the two-stream model with the partial unity model.

36. See Shallice (1997) for discussion.

37. See Alter (2010) for a more recent defense of this view.

38. It is also worth noting that surgical callosotomy procedures can vary in important respects. For example, some are complete and some partial. Because of this, it is unlikely that a single model will apply universally to all split-brain subjects. In fact, behavioral variance is not uncommon among split-brain subjects. So, our discussion here relies on some degree of idealization.

39. See the references cited in fn. 31.

40. Bayne (2008, 2010) develops both of these challenges in detail. But we can also find versions of some of them in Marks (1981) and Tye (2003).

41. For example, there is evidence of partial integration of sensory information among split-brains. Trevarthen & Sperry (1973) reported integration of “crude” visual information. There is also evidence that “deep touch” can be integrated while fine-grained tactile information is not.

42. This would not be implausible if, as Schechter (2010, 2018) alleges, the neural correlates of fear experience extend to cortical areas.

43. See Marks (1981) and Tye (2003) for earlier versions of this challenge and Schechter (2010, 2012, 2018) for a response.

44. This said, we should note that the claims about the normal behavior of split-brain subjects outside experimental conditions are mostly anecdotal. Schechter (2014, 2018) notes that there are not many scientific studies of split-brain subjects in every-day conditions and those that have been conducted do not reveal split-brain subjects to be fully normal. See Ferguson, Rayport & Corrie (1985) in this connection.

45. Behavioral evidence for the idea that attention is required for perceptual processing is offered in Mack & Rock, (1998); Raymond, Shapiro, & Arnell (1992). This has motivated account of consciousness according to which attention is essential for consciousness. See Posner (1994) Baars (1988, 1997), Prinz, 2000, and Dehaene & Naccache (2001).

46. Support for this claim in the case of spatial attention is provided in Gazzaniga (1987, 2000), Holtzman, Volpe, & Gazzaniga (1984), and Reuter-Lorenz & Fendrich (1990). But there is also evidence for partial independence of the attentional systems in the two hemispheres. See Arguin, Lassonde, Quattrini, Del Pesce, Foschi, et al., (2000), Corballis (1995), and Luck, Hillyard, Mangun, & Gazzaniga (1989, 1994). For discussion see Bayne (2010, 215).

47. For Bayne’s discussion of these challenges and his responses see Bayne (2010. 213–9).

48. Schechter (2018, 35–39) raises a somewhat similar concern.

49. Lockwood (1989) is the first to explicitly discuss this model. But see also Trevarthen (1974), Moor (1982) and Sperry (1984).

50. See Nagel (1971, 409–410), Bayne (2008, 2010), and Dainton (2000). Even Lockwood expresses skepticism about the cogency of the concept of partial unity (1994, 95).

51. We say “potential” because as Bayne understands it, the sense of necessity involved in the Unity Thesis, is compatible with the possibility of disunity in some conditions. Bayne calls this sense of unity the biological sense. But many are skeptical about this. So the split-brain case has often been taken to be a potential counterexample to the Unity Thesis.

52. Schechter’s main line of reasoning for the duality claim is that in some split-brains the two hemispheres interact mainly indirectly, where indirect interaction is interaction between mental states that is mediated by action and perception. Since direct interaction is the mark of the singularity of subjects (minds/thinkers) there are two subjects (minds/thinkers) in these split brains.

53. See also Hill 2018 who endorses the two-streams view but combines it with the two-subjects interpretation.

54. Bayne (2010) distinguishes between several versions of this argument and attributes them to Braude 1995.

55. Dennett and Humphrey (1998) defend the multiple subjects/centers/agents view while Bayne (2010) defends the single subject/agent/center view.

56. Bayne (2010, ch.7) offers a somewhat similar response.

57. See Andreasen (1985), Anderson and Carpenter (1993), Crow (1980), and Liddle (1987) for reviews of the negative and positive symptoms of schizophrenia.

58. Bayne (2010, ch.7), argues that thought disorder can be fully explained in terms of selective attention. This is a controversial claim (defenders include Anscombe (1987) and Gray et al. (1991); Opponents include Cutting (1985) and McKenna (1994)). But even if Bayne is wrong in assuming that selective attention can account for thought disorder, the general idea that a host of cognitive disorders might be central to the explanation of thought disorder seems to be on the right track.

59. Another argument for phenomenal disunity in schizophrenia draws on thought insertion, a rather common positive symptom of the disorder. For an in-depth discussion of the argument from thought insertion see Bayne 2010 pp 158–62.

60. Bayne (2010, ch.7) sees it as a case of disunity of narrative self-consciousness, by which he means a breakdown in one’s ability to organize one’s thought around one’s goals.