Constructivism in Metaethics

Metaethical constructivism is the view that insofar as there are normative truths, they are not fixed by normative facts that are independent of what rational agents would agree to under some specified conditions of choice. The appeal of this view lies in the promise to explain how normative truths are objective and independent of our actual judgments, while also binding and authoritative for us.

Constructivism takes different forms. Some versions seek to explain all normative reasons or normative truths, while others are limited to moral reasons, moral obligations, or moral truths. Their relation to the traditional classifications of metaethics is problematic, particularly with respect to the realism–antirealism debate. These disputes reflect deeper divergences concerning the very definition of metaethics, the relation between normative and metaethical claims, and the methods thought to be distinctive of metaethical inquiry. In what follows, varieties of metaethical constructivism will be considered by focusing on the specific questions that constructivist theories are designed to address.

Moral constructivism has also be advanced as a normative theory of justification: it holds that the moral principles we ought to accept are those that agents would agree to, or endorse, under conditions of hypothetical or idealized rational deliberation. Constructivists, however, differ in how they conceive of such deliberation. Some follow adaptations of Kant’s categorical imperative, while others draw on contractualist approaches, or adopt the method of reflective equilibrium.

Section 1 sets out the core claims and underlying motivations of constructivism. Sections 2 and 3 examine two main varieties of metaethical constructivism while section 4 turns to hybrid theories that integrate central constructivist commitments with non-constructivist elements. Section 5 discusses the position of constructivism within the metaethical debate. Section 6 offers a critical assessment of its constitutivist strategies, and section 7 provides concluding remarks.

• 1. What is Constructivism?
• 2. Varieties of Kantian Constructivism
  • 2.1 Kant’s Constructivism
  • 2.2 Constructivism as Procedural Realism
  • 2.3 Constructivism for Finite Rational Agents
• 3. Varieties of Humean Constructivism
• 4. Hybrid Constructivist Theories
  • 4.1 Constructivism about Moral Judgements
  • 4.2 Society-Based Moral Constructivism
  • 4.3 Humean Moral Constructivism
  • 4.4 Aristotelian Ethical Constructivism
  • 4.5 Hegelian Ethical Constructivism
• 5. Constructivism’s Place in Metaethics
  • 5.1 The Constructivist Approach to Normative Discourse
  • 5.2 Constructivist Accounts of Truth
  • 5.3 Constructivism and the Realism-Antirealism Debate
• 6. The Euthyphro Question
  • 6.1 The Role of Intuitions
  • 6.2 The Status of Constitutivist Norms
  • 6.3 Constitutivism about Moral Normativity
• 7. Concluding Remarks
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. What is Constructivism?

The term ‘constructivism’ entered debates in moral theory with John Rawls’ seminal Dewey Lectures “Kantian Constructivism in Moral Theory” (Rawls 1980), wherein Rawls offered a reinterpretation of the philosopher Immanuel Kant’s ethics and of its relevance for political debates.

According to Rawls, these debates fail to effectively address the political problem of ethical disagreements because they adopt metaphysical standards of objectivity, which appeal to the independent reality and truth of values. In his view, such standards are inadequate to address disagreement in a political debate in which all the parties in the dispute claim to be defending the only true view, because they lead to a stalemate in the discussion, with each party accusing its opponent of being ‘blind’ to the moral truth.

Rawls is especially concerned with coordination problems that arise in pluralistic contexts, wherein citizens hold different and to some extent incommensurable moral views. The need for objectivity, according to Rawls, is practical: it arises in contexts in which people disagree about what to value and need to reach an agreement about what to do. He attributes to Kant the idea that we ought to approach objectivity as a practical problem and that we can fruitfully address moral disputes by reasoning about them (Rawls 1971: 34, 39–40, 49–52). Rawls thus turns to Kant in order to argue for a conception of objectivity that is not metaphysical, that is, a conception of objectivity that avoids claims to universal and fundamental moral truths that are independent of our fully rational judgments. On this conception, nobody is assumed to have a privileged access to moral truth, but all have equal standing in reasoning about what to do. To this extent, Kant’s theory is regarded as providing a metaethical alternative both to realism and skepticism about the existence and nature of moral truths.

Rawls’ account of Kantian constructivism in moral theory (1980) generated a large literature, and produced several varieties of constructivism. Some of these views depart from Rawls’ own conception of constructivism.

2. Varieties of Kantian Constructivism

Kantian constructivism is defended in a variety of ways, but its distinguishing feature is that it understands the nature of moral and normative truths based on considerations about practical reason and its relation to agency, although some focus on rational agency as such while others take into account also embodiment and social embeddedness. On this view, reasons for being moral do not spring from our interests or desires; instead, they are rooted in our nature as rational agents. Insofar as moral obligations are justified in terms of rational requirements, they are universally and necessarily binding for all rational beings. Because of its claim about the universal authority of reason and obligations, Kantian Constructivism is regarded as the most ambitious form of metaethical constructivism. In this section, we will consider three main varieties, starting with the constructivist interpretation of Kant’s ethics.

2.1 Kant’s Constructivism

John Rawls first advanced a constructivist interpretation of Kant’s account of practical reason and moral obligation (1980, 2000). On his reading, the novelty of Kant’s view commits him to constructivism, best appreciated against rival accounts of obligation (Rawls 1980, 1989, 2000). According to Kant, all previous ethical theories fail to account for the objectivity and authority of moral obligation because they fail to explain how reason plays a role in our lives because they misunderstand its practical function and mischaracterize its relation with the ends of choice (Kant G 4: 441–444; C2 5: 35–41, 153, 157). Kant’s arguments specifically address sentimentalism and ‘dogmatic rationalism’. Sentimentalism, championed by Francis Hutcheson, David Hume, and Adam Smith, holds that ethical judgments stem from sentiments and regards reason as incapable of moving us to action on its own. According to the sentimentalist, the role of reason is solely instrumental. That is, reason merely finds the means to satisfy an agent’s ends, and it is not capable of indicating which ends are worth pursuing. This claim exposes sentimentalism as a “heteronomous” doctrine, which fails to establish the objectivity of moral obligations. This is because sentimentalism treats moral obligations as conditional upon our interests, and thus as having limited authority.

Kant raises an analogous objection against dogmatic rationalism, championed by Christian Wolff and Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz, which asserts that there are moral truths accessible by rational insight (Kant G 4: 443; Rawls 2000: 50, 228). This view represents an intuitionist form of moral realism according to which reason recognizes objective values or moral ends that exist prior to and independently of our reasoning and of the kinds of agents that we are. The function of reason is to identify these moral truths without itself participating in their formation or determining their content. The question arises how such pre-fixed moral ends are authoritative over us and action guiding. The answer must be that moral truths guide us only on the condition that we have a corresponding desire to be guided by what is rational (Rawls 1980: 343–46; Rawls 1989: 510–13). By narrowing the function of reason in this way, Kant’s point is that dogmatic rationalism fails to secure the conclusion that moral obligations have unconditional authority over us (Kant G, 4: 441). This is because, for dogmatic rationalism, moral truths guide us only on the condition that we have a corresponding desire to be guided by what is rational (Rawls 1980: 343–46; Rawls 1989: 510–13).

Kant’s general diagnosis is that all such doctrines fail to capture the practical function of reason because they are heteronomous. They deny the authority and efficacy of reason, either holding that reason can only recognize objective ends that exist independently of its operations, or claiming that reason can bind agents only with the help of inclination or interest. For Kant heteronomy is a form of moral skepticism, understood as skepticism about the power of reason to establish moral truths and their authority. On this reading, then, constructivism is part of Kant’s overall argument for grounding ethics in reason, against the skeptical view that there are no normative truths (Korsgaard 1996a; Stern 2013; Wallace 2012). Skepticism is avoided only if reason is accounted as autonomous, and its authority does not derive from anything outside it. Reason is autonomous if its authority rests on its proper activity, rather than being derived from elements of the world outside of reason. Thus, the norm governing the activity of reason must be internal to reason, rather than dependent on any given value, interest, or desire. That is to say that reason is a “self-legislative activity” (Kant G 4: §2), and its legislative activity is governed by a norm, which Kant calls the ‘Categorical Imperative.’

The Categorical Imperative expresses the autonomy of reason and is its governing principle. It is not a mere decision-procedure to determine what to do, but the ‘constitutive norm’ of reason, that is, the basic standard of rationality in thinking and acting (Rawls 1989: 498–506; Rawls 2000: 166, 240–244; Korsgaard 1996a: 36–37; O’Neill 1989b: 18–19, 59n, 128, 180; Reath 2006: 221–222; Reath & Timmermann 2010; Engstrom 2009: Chapter 5; Turan 2019). The Categorical Imperative comes in different formulations that Kant regards as equivalent (G 4: 421, 429, 431, 433); ultimately, it is the requirement that in deliberating, we test our motives by considering whether the principle they express can be adopted as a universal law, a principle that applies to and binds all agents endowed with rational capacities. To this extent, Kant is committed to the “constitutivist view” that the source of the categorical force of moral obligations lies in the constitutive features of rational agency (Rawls 2000: 263–265; O’Neill 1989a, Korsgaard 1996a: 236ff). We will return to this point in section 6.3.

Scholars are divided about the constructivist interpretation of Kant’s theory of practical reason, even though nobody denies that, for Kant, the laws of the mind are laws of reason (compare Guyer 2013 and Engstrom 2013). The most general source of reservations is that constructivism builds upon the critique of realism, but Kant’s claims about objective moral knowledge seem best vindicated by moral realism (Schmidt and Santos 2017). Some doubt that moral realism is Kant’s own intended target, hence suggesting that Kant’s constructivism does not build upon a critique of moral realism (Stern 2012a: 7–68, 2012b; Schmidt & Santos 2017). A related contested issue is whether Kantian constructivism radically departs from perfectionism or entails it (Pollock 2017, forthcoming; cf. Zylberman forthcoming; Reath forthcoming). It should be noted, however, that in this dispute, constructivism is generally taken to be a form of antirealism (Ameriks 2003: 268, 274; Wood 2008: 108, 337, 374–375; Thorpe 2019; Vesper 2020; Rodriguez 2022), while Rawls introduced Kant’s constructivism as a distinct alternative to both realism and antirealism, where the latter includes subjectivism and relativism (Rawls 1980; O’Neill 1989a: 1; Engstrom 2013: 138ff; Bernstein 2025).

According to realist interpreters, Kant’s defense of the autonomy of reason takes place within a realist foundationalist project grounded on the absolute value of humanity (Wood 1999: 157, 114; Rauscher 2002; Langton 2007; Johnson 2007; Hills 2008; Krasnoff 1999; Kain 2006a, Kain 2006b; Irwin 2009; Galvin 2011; Lyons 2020; Scholten 2020). First, critics point out that Kant’s defense provides a transcendental argument, an argument that highlights the conditions under which it is possible for something to be the case. The value of humanity is the condition of the possibility of all valuing. The issue revolves around the nature of transcendental arguments, and whether they commit us to moral realism (Stern 2000; Larmore 2008: 121; Watkins & Fitzpatrick 2002; Fitzpatrick 2005; Tiffany 2006; Brum, Stern, & Werner 2017), something that constructivists deny. Realist critics also dispute the force and the scope of the argument for the autonomy of practical reason, a debate that partly stems from differing assessments of the constitutivist strategies, which will be discussed in sections 6.2 and 6.3.

Second, realist critics hold that Kant’s claim in the Critique of Practical Reason that we are immediately conscious of the moral law as a “fact of reason”, (C2 5:46–48) represents a realist foundation of morality (Ameriks 2003: 263–282; Kleingeld 2010: 55–72). By contrast, constructivist interpreters tend to downplay the role of the fact of reason in Kant’s general argument for the objectivity of moral obligations (O’Neill 2002: 81–97; Łuków 1993: 204–221). Rawls takes the fact of reason to show that Kant develops “not only a constructivist conception of practical reason, but a coherentist account of its authentication” (Rawls 1999: 524; Rawls 2000: 268–273). In his view, the fact of reason indicates that the deliverances of practical reason cohere with our moral experience. This congruence is an integral part of Kant’s vindication of ethical objectivity, but it is no commitment to realism. Rather, it simply confirms that there is no discrepancy between the requirements of practical reason (which are expressed by the Categorical Imperative) and our ordinary experience of morality (Rawls 1980: 340; Rawls 1989: 523–524; Rawls 2000: 253–272, 268, 273; Kant C2, 5: 15). For Rawls, the realist notion of objectivity is “unnecessary for objectivity” (1980: 570). However, his argument in support of a coherentist conception of practical reason is found too weak to capture Kant’s view of moral obligations as objective rational requirements (Larmore 2008: 83–84; Stern 2012a: 7–40). As an alternative to these readings, some interpreters argue that Kant is constructivist about the authority of moral obligations and practical laws for finite agents, but not about the contents of such laws, which apply to all rational agents as such (Engstrom 2009, 2013; Sensen 2013). For others, Kant is a constructivist about a limited set of general substantive moral principles – and as a constititutivist about moral authority (Reath 2022). According to Schafer, Kant’s constitutivism is more appropriately interpreted as ‘reason-first’ rather than ‘agent-first’ (Schafer 2019, 179). On this reading, the constitutive basis of normativity is located not in the rational agent, but in rational activity as such. This thesis is broadly shared within Kantian scholarship (cf. Reath forthcoming). What remains contentious, however, is Schafer’s proposed shift in focus from ‘autonomy’ to ‘understanding’ in explicating rational activity (Schafer 2023, cf. O’Neill 1989, 2015; Sensen forthcoming).

Constructivist interpreters have largely deemphasized the metaphysical implications of Kant’s ethics in order to highlight his recognition of the limits of finite agency and to foreground the rational basis of morality as a fundamentally cooperative enterprise. Kant embarks on the project of vindicating reasoning, starting from very modest considerations about rational agency. Such starting points are not sufficient “to sustain or revive classical philosophical ambitions to build vast metaphysical structures on reason alone” (O’Neill 2015: 3; C1: A xiii; cf. Schneewind 1970). The constructivist interpretation of Kant’s ethics highlights the cooperative nature of the standards of reasoning:

“Kant’s repeated use of metaphors of construction and collaboration in his discussion of reasoning make it natural to speak of his approach and method as constructivist, and of his aim as the construction of reason’s authority, and thereby of a basis for offering others reasons for truth claims and moral claims, reasons for favouring some rather than other practical and political aims.” (O’Neill 2015: 4)

Ultimately, the standards of reasoning are justified by a practical cooperative function: “it must exhibit patterns that others could discern, and thus it must be law-like” (O’Neill 2015: 4).

2.2 Constructivism as Procedural Realism

The antimetaphysical orientation of constructivism is central to leading defenses of metaethical constructivism. Christine Korsgaard characterizes Kantian constructivism as a form of “procedural realism” – the view that “there are answers to moral questions because there are correct procedures for arriving at them”; and she contrasts procedural realism with “substantive realism” – the view that

there are correct procedures for answering moral questions because there are moral truths or facts, which exist independently of those procedures, and which those procedures track. (Korsgaard 1996a: 36–37, see also Korsgaard 1983: 183)

Substantive realism holds that moral judgments have objective criteria of correctness only if they represent facts about the world. Constructivism, by contrast, claims that such criteria arise from objective standards of reasoning about practical matters. Thus, reasons against deception and manipulation are generated through practical reasoning rather than discovered by empirical investigation, grasped by the intellect, or revealed by some god. What makes this view Kantian is that practical reasoning has a single criterion – the Categorical Imperative – through which moral obligations, as requirements of reason, are objectively grounded.

Korsgaard’s defense of constructivism parallels Kant’s case for the autonomy of practical reason, as reconstructed by Rawls. She argues that substantive realism cannot answer the skeptic who denies that there are reasons to be moral, since realism merely presupposes objective standards without justifying them. Hence it fails to explain the authority of moral obligations (Korsgaard 1996a; Korsgaard 2008: 30–31, 55–57, 67–68; Stern 2012a; Brady 2002). Realists claim that reasons must be anchored in normative facts, yet such facts cannot explain how they bind or motivate rational agents. If it is a normative fact that deception is wrong, how does that fact compel us to refrain from deceiving? This is not just a psychological question about motivation, but a normative question about authority.

For Korsgaard, humans are reflective agents, able to step back from their thoughts and desires and question their legitimacy (1996a: 10–11, 17, 93). Reflection suspends the authority of given attitudes and allows agents to ask what there is reason to do or believe. Because they are reflective, humans form ideals of the persons they aspire to be and can guide themselves accordingly. Their capacity for self-governance lies in endorsing universal standards, and the proper form of such governance is self-legislation (Korsgaard 1996a: 36, 91, 231–232; Korsgaard 2008: 3).

Rational agents are guided by universal principles they have legislated. This does not mean, however, that individuals arbitrarily determine the moral law; otherwise, evil people would not be bound by it (Korsgaard 1996a: 234–235; O’Neill 2003c; Reath 2006: 92–170, 112–113; Korsgaard 2008: 207–229). Rather, the moral law obliges only insofar as it is self-legislated: agents can act autonomously on moral requirements only if they legislate them. Universal principles ensure that action expresses integrity rather than unreflective preferences or desires, since they are constitutive of rational agency. By contrast, agents who act mindlessly or compulsively lack this integrity. Still, rational agents may permissibly act on desires that endure reflective scrutiny.

A canonical objection to grounding morality solely in rationality is that it neglects the special bonds with loved ones, and thus fails to capture integrity and morality (Williams 1981: chs. 1–2). To address this, Korsgaard introduces “practical identities,” roles that serve as sources of special obligations (Korsgaard 1996a: 101, §3.3.1; 2009: 20). For example, Camille values herself under the descriptions of artist, French citizen, and Auguste’s lover. These identities guide her choices, sustain her integrity, and generate special obligations to pupils, compatriots, and friends. Yet such roles bind us only when reflectively endorsed (Korsgaard 1996a: §3.3.1; 2009: 22). Reflective endorsement requires testing loyalties against the principle of universality, which commits us to morality. Thus, to value ourselves under particular descriptions, we must also value humanity in ourselves and others (Korsgaard 2008: Lecture 6, 25–26).

Korsgaard (1996a) offers a transcendental argument that what we ought to do is justified by the norms constitutive of rational agency. Valuing humanity – understood as the capacity for rationality – is the condition of valuing anything at all (1996a: 121–123; 1998: 60–62). In deliberation we confer value on our ends, thereby attributing value to ourselves. Hence, the value of objects depends on the rational capacity of evaluators, and ‘humanity’ names an unconditional value. We must value humanity in ourselves and others on pain of incoherence. Practical identities alone cannot sustain integrity when they conflict with this requirement: a Mafioso, for example, cannot justify his conduct on universal principles and thus fails as a rational agent. Integrity, necessary for agency, requires commitment to morality grounded in reason.

Some critics argue that Korsgaard’s argument tacitly rests on a realist premise regarding the value of humanity, and thus it is not a complete alternative to moral realism (Watkins & Fitzpatrick 2002; Fitzpatrick 2005; Ridge 2005; Stieb 2006; Kain 2006a, Kain 2006b; Papish 2011; O’Shea 2015; Schafer 2015a), nor does it offer a distinctive reply to skeptical challenges to ethical objectivity. Others find Korsgaard’s argument vulnerable to the objection of ‘regress on conditions’, which shows that it is not logically necessary that the condition of a thing’s value be valuable itself (Rabinowicz & Rønnow- Rasmussen 2000; Kerstein 2001; Ridge 2005; Coleman 2006). If so, humanity may be the condition of the possibility of value and yet lack value itself.

Korsgaard replies that “there need be no such regress if there are principles that are constitutive of the very rational activities that we trying to perform” (2008: 5, 1996b: 164–67, 2009). Indeed, some of these objections overlook the distinction between substantive realism and constitutivism (or structural realism, Nozick 1981:545–551); nevertheless, the question of the realist implications of constitutivist strategies resurfaces.

For Korsgaard, the principles of practical rationality are constitutive of rational agency, in the sense that they are standards arising from and justified by the nature of the object in question (i.e., the rational agent). More specifically, unless the object conforms to the standard, it ceases to be the kind of object that it is (‘constitution requirement’). If the function of the house is to serve as a habitable shelter, then it must conform to the standard of being a habitable shelter. A thing that does not serve this purpose is not a house. Secondly, some objects make themselves into the kind of objects that they are by conforming to their constitutive standards (‘self-constitution requirement’). Rational agents make things happen, that is, they are efficacious. They exert their efficacy in a specific way, i.e., autonomously. Autonomous agents must conform to the categorical imperative, and in order to be efficacious, they must conform to the hypothetical imperative. It is by conforming to these principles, Korsgaard argues, that one makes oneself into an agent.

Her more recent works point toward a new direction in the debate about constructivism, which combines Aristotelian and Kantian features (Korsgaard 2008, 2009). However, in her view, Kantian constitutivism uniquely captures the requirement of self-constitution, a feature absent from the Aristotelian conception of virtue as excellence of character (Korsgaard 2019). The Kantian idea of self-constitution is thus indispensable for any adequate account of rational – and thereby moral – agency.

Korsgaard’s constitutivist strategy of grounding moral normativity in the constitutive features of agency raises worries that will be discussed in sections 6.2–6.3.

2.3 Constructivism for Finite Rational Agents

Onora O’Neill defines metaethical constructivism as a third alternative between realism and subjectivism (O’Neill 1989b: 279). She departs from the versions of Kantian constructivism discussed above because she makes no appeal to transcendental arguments and rejects the idealized conceptions of rational agency that are at play in other versions of Kantian constructivism. In her view, “finite rational beings” should not be construed as “beings whose rationality is finite”, but as “finite beings who are rational”. Finitude does not entail any limitation on strategic reasoning, even though there is no way to establish that finite rational agents have access to all sorts of reasoning that infinite or disembodied rational agents may have. The key thesis is that instrumental principles are not the only principles of rationality, and more importantly, they never operate in isolation (O’Neill 1989b: 74).

According to O’Neill, this more austere constructivism is closer to Kant’s own theory than other varieties (O’Neill 1989a; O’Neill 2015). In her view, Kant’s constructivism is motivated by the vivid awareness of interdependency, finitude, and mutual vulnerability. Humans are prone to mistakenly rely on claims that are not warranted, and thus they need to check and criticize the unjustified and arbitrary assumptions they make in reasoning (O’Neill 1989b). O’Neill shares Kant’s claim that

reasoning is fundamentally practical: it aims to provide standards or norms that thought, action and communication can (but often fail) to meet. (O’Neill 2015: 2)

Second, she shares Kant’s view that reasoning is necessary because humans are finite and interdependent beings. Third, she agrees that the principles of reason are not given by intuition or introspection but must be discerned through the exercise of rational powers. Finally, she accepts Kant’s claim that norms of reasoning must be universal if they are to fulfil their function.

The difference lies in how universality is justified. For O’Neill, universality is required because reasoning must be shared among a plurality of finite, interdependent agents whose action and communication are not antecedently coordinated (by instinct, providence, or law). The requirement of universality – or followability – thus sets minimal constraints on what counts as reasoning (O’Neill 2015: 3). From this it follows that no plurality of agents can coherently adopt principles that destroy or undermine the agency of any of its members (O’Neill 1989a: 10; see also 1989b, 2015). Hence practical reasoning justifies the prohibition of harming, coercing, and deceiving others.

This is not to suggest that the requirement of followability can resolve all moral questions or fully determine duties. O’Neill holds that many issues demand further substantive argument. Still, her account promises to vindicate reason’s capacity – and authority – to distinguish genuine justification from mere rationalization. While ‘contractualism’ is often linked to metaethical constructivism (Rawls 1971; Scanlon 1998; Hill 1989, 2001; Milo 1995), and many regard construction itself as a hypothetical procedure akin to contract (see e.g., Darwall, Gibbard, & Railton 1997: 13; Hill 2001, 2002; Walden 2012; cf. O’Neill 2003a,b; Street 2010: 365), offers a sharp account of the difference between Kantian constructivism and contractualism in terms of their scope, audience, and ambitions. Kantian constructivism holds that practical reasoning yields unconditionally authoritative moral claims, whereas contractualism does not.

O’Neill agrees with Kant that only reason itself can verify the credentials of its own claims. The process of identifying the principles of reason is avowedly circular, yet this circularity is not problematic, since the process of verification is reflexive: it involves reason critiquing the claims of reason itself. More specifically, the critique of reason uncovers a basic principle of reasoning: we should rely only on principles that other rational agents can share. The authority of reason is thus conferred through public communication among free, rational agents, and lies in the fact that the principles governing our thought are neither self-serving nor self-defeating. We learn what these principles require by submitting our claims to free and critical debate, the practice that constitutes “the public use of reason” (O’Neill 1989b: 70–71, 206).

Since the critique of reason is a continuous, progressive, and reflexive process, reason has a history that coincides with the development of practices of tolerance and mutual recognition (O’Neill 1999: 174, 2002). Such practices establish the authority of reason. This ‘developmental’ view of practical reason and its autonomy accounts for change and progress, and provides a significant explanatory advantage over rival views that neglect the historical and dialectical dimension of truth and reason (O’Neill 1989b: 70–71; Arruda 2016). This requires the constructivist to provide an account of truth and objective knowledge as altering in time. O’Neill’s defense of the virtuous circularity of constructivism identifies a solution to a problem that affects constructivism in general.

Extending O’Neill’s approach, recent forms of Kantian constructivism emphasize embodiment and social embeddedness rather than ‘rational agency as such’. Some point to the constitutive role of moral sensibility and practical attitudes in the account of rational agency (Bagnoli 2013, 2017, forthcoming; Mudd forthcoming). While this line of inquiry sharpens the distinction between constructivist and contractualist reasoning (O’Neill 2003a, O’Neill 2003b), others advances a naturalistic and social account, according to which agency is an emergent property – like those found in biology or economics – arising from the complex interactions among agents, and the normativity of a specific contractualist procedure is sustained (Walden 2012, 2018a, 2018b; cf. Smith 2020, 2023).

Finally, Dover and Gingerich (2024) defend a form of constructivism inspired by Simone de Beauvoir, which bears striking affinities with Kantian constructivism, but grounds the ‘existential imperative to will freedom’ in contingent features of our embodied subjectivity.

3. Varieties of Humean Constructivism

Humean constructivism builds on the Kantian insight that normative truths are not simply “out there”, but denies that they are deliverances of practical reasoning (Bagnoli 2002: 131; Street 2008a, 2010, 2012; Velleman 2009; Lenman 2010, 2012). The case for Humean constructivism rests on the alleged inadequacy of competing views: “it is what we are forced to by the untenability of realism plus the failure of Kantian versions of metaethical constructivism” (Street 2010: 371). Humean constructivists abandon the claim that moral obligations are requirements of practical reason. Thus, Humeans maintain that an ideally coherent Caligula who values maximizing suffering is conceivable. Such a person would have reasons for torturing people for fun, because the value of humanity is not a constitutive norm of reasoning (Street 2010: 371; Street 2009, 2012).

In contrast to Kantian constructivism, Humean constructivists abandon the claim that moral obligations are requirements of practical reason.While Korsgaard holds that proper reflection leads everyone to the same substantive moral principles prescribing particular actions, Humeans deny that by reflection we can identify any specific moral content. The constitutive norms of practical reason may favor morality, but do not require it (Street 2012; Velleman 2009: 150–154; Lenman 2010: 192). Thus, Humeans maintain that an ideally coherent Caligula whose aim is to maximize people’s suffering is conceivable. Such a person would have reasons for making people suffer, which is just to say that the value of humanity is not a constitutive norm of reasoning (Street 2010: 371; Street 2009, 2012; Morton 2018; Gill 2025).

Humean constructivism also rejects the Kantian claim that there are universal rational norms that bind all rational agents. For instance, Street argues that “the substantive content of a given agent’s reasons is a function of his or her particular, contingently given, evaluative starting points” (Street 2010; see also Lenman 2010: 180–181). Consequently, “truth and falsity in the normative domain must always be relativized to a particular practical point of view” (Street 2008a: 224). Agreement among various practical standpoints is possible but it is not guaranteed by facts about the nature of reason or the principles of reason that are authoritative for all rational agents. Humeans hold that there is nothing alarming about the sort of relativism that their position implies (Street 2008a: 245). Even though moral norms are not necessary requirements of reason, there is a sense in which they are not contingent because they play a large role in our lives. Furthermore, by analogy with attitudes such as love, which is both contingent and compelling, Street argues that the fact that moral commitments are contingent does not weaken their normative force. The latter claim has been disputed on the ground that the driving force of love should be distinguished from its normative authority (Bratman 2012).

Critics argue that Street’s Humean constructivism fails to capture the diachronic complexity of moral reasons (Jaeger 2015; Guardo 2019), to account for moral improvement and prudential learning, and to explain the social dimension and key functions of moral evaluation (LeBar 2023). In cases of conflicting judgments, it also appears implausibly committed to denying that there is any reason to choose among the available options (Levy 2019). More broadly, Street’s account of practical reason underestimates the pervasive role of reasoning and its central function in fostering agreement and coordination within social life (Bagnoli 2019); this is a weakness in contrast to many other varieties of constructivism that have emphasized the coordinating function of morality (Gauthier 1986; Copp 2005; Brennan, Goodwin and Southwood 2013; O’Neill 1989, 2015).

These objections suggest that Street’s individualist, means–ends conception of coherence cannot secure diachronic or interpersonal justification, thereby opening the way for alternative constructivist strategies that foreground the social and temporal dimensions of normativity.

To address this problem, one might expect Humean constructivists to appeal to artificial virtues or reduce them to social conventions, thereby aligning with conventionalism – the view that moral claims rest on social agreement and are grounded in the actual practices of groups within particular traditions, a view often illustrated through the metaphor of construction (Wong 2008).

If Street’s difficulties are to be overcome, however, Humean constructivism must address, above all, the challenge of securing objectivity. While constructivism might recognize objective mind-independent normative truths, these are not mind-independent in the sense of being available to every agent regardless of whether such reasons can be derived, logically or instrumentally, from that agent’s evaluative perspective combined with the non-normative facts. In contrast to Kantian constitutivism, which defends objectivity in terms of the activity of the will, Street instead exploits the notion of valuing as a philosophical term encompassing a wide range of attitudes and experiential states (2016a: 174, 177ff).

Street (2016b) argues that the objectivity of ethics can be vindicated, without metaphysical or epistemological mystery, if there is a universal problem faced by every agent for which morality provides the universal and best (or only) solution. The particular solution she explores is an ethics of compassion, which dispenses with moral concepts such as right, wrong, and obligation (2016b: 166), in contrast to the forms of moral constructivism discussed in sections 4.1–4.2. Drawing on the Buddhist tradition, she conceives the ethical standpoint as “the standpoint of pure awareness,” which addresses the problem of attachment and loss: “when one occupies this standpoint, one is identifying with a universal point of view on the world that transcends any particular, finite point of view; in doing so, one is identifying with a point of view that is not itself vulnerable to loss” (Street 2016a: 186). This standpoint is ethical because it is “that of pure subject – the maximally thin point of view of the ‘one who is aware’” (Street 2016a: 187, cf. Street 2016b, Street 2017).

This move addresses some of the issues noted above, but it faces difficulties in its impersonal characterization of the ethical standpoint and its tension with the first-person perspective, on pain of alienation (cf. Williams 1981, 1985; Nagel 1986; Wallace 2013). A similar issue arises for Salazar (2021), whose constructivist theory also draws on Buddhist ethics. She recognizes strong affinities with Kantian constructivism but proposes a dual source of normativity. This duality, she argues, rectifies some of the difficulties of autonomy-based morality by redirecting attention on the suffering of others, thereby challenging the individualistic conception of the self as separate and impermeable to others (2021: 175–176).

Other strategies to enhance Humean constructivism leads to hybrid theories because they incorporate elements external to this tradition; these will be examined in section 4.3. In section 5, we will consider how these varieties of constructivism relate to antirealism and expressivism, and in sections 6.2–6.3 we will discuss the features of Humean constitutivist strategies.

4. Hybrid Constructivist Theories

The debate over the viability of Kantian and Humean constructivism has given rise to a range of hybrid theories, so called because they incorporate non-constructivist elements drawn from diverse philosophical traditions, particularly in their accounts of moral normativity and moral rationality, thereby shifting the place of constructivism in the traditional metaethical map. In this section, we examine forms of constructivism limited to moral principles of right and wrong but combined with non-constructivist accounts of reasons (4.1), or grounded in a realist metaphysics (4.2). Section 4.3 considers objectivist developments of Humean constructivism addressing the quest for objectivity articulated in section 3. Section 4.3. turns to Aristotelian constructivism, which extends beyond moral normativity, but rejects Kantian and Humean formalist accounts, and aligns with a modest variety of normative realism. Section 4.5 discusses Hegelian constructivism, which sharpens some key elements of O’Neill’s developmental conception of practical reason, but points to actual ontological structures underlying it.

4.1 Constructivism about Moral Judgements

Thomas Scanlon defends a restricted constructivist account of justification for a specific class of moral judgments of right and wrong (1998: 11–12, ch. 4, §7.2; 2008; 2014: 94–98). Unlike Korsgaard and O’Neill, he rejects Kantian constructivism as a general metaethical view about all normative truths. Moral questions, he argues, cannot be settled by appealing to the bare structure of rationality; they require substantive argument (2003b: 14–15; 2014: 90–104) – a point many Kantians would concede. His aim is to explain the truth of claims about right and wrong in terms of their being entailed from the standpoint of a contractual situation.

The contractualist test holds that an act is wrong if it would be prohibited by any set of principles that no one could reasonably reject as a basis for informed, unforced, general agreement. This test of rejectability specifies the content of moral principles and explains why it is rational to adopt them. The correctness of principles depends on a hypothetical agreement among individuals, defined by their motivations and reasoning. There are no correct moral principles independently of such agreement: rightness is constituted by what reasonable agents, under specified conditions, would not reject (1998: 380 n.48). The test allows for disagreement – over standards for assessing conduct or the reasons supporting them – without entailing relativism, since not all answers are equally valid.

Scanlon objects that constructivist accounts of general normativity fall prey to bootstrapping: they attempt to justify the normativity of reasons by procedures that already presuppose it (2014: 96–104; Wallace 2012). Unlike Korsgaard or Street, he denies that truths about reasons are constructed. We reach conclusions about reasons through normative reasoning (e.g., reflective equilibrium), but such reasoning requires substantive judgments as inputs; hence, not all facts about reasons can be constructed (2014: 102–103). To this extent, he defends ‘primitivism’ about reasons (1998: 17, 21; 2013): reasons are mind-dependent features of the world, existing in virtue of considerations standing in a “favoring relation” to mental states such as intentions. While this is a form of non-naturalism, it differs sharply from Moorean or robust realism, which grounds reasons in mind-independent facts (2014: 14; cf. Enoch 2011a: 112–113; Smith 2023). For Scanlon, truths about reasons do not require metaphysical guarantees beyond what sound normative reasoning secures. There is no “external” question about their existence, any more than there is about mathematical facts (2014: 16–26). In this respect, his view bears affinities with Carnap’s (1956).

4.2 Society-Based Moral Constructivism

Society-based constructivism, developed by David Copp, holds that there are true moral standards produced by a decision procedure that takes into account the needs and values of a society, together with facts about its circumstances (Copp 1995, 2007). Moral truth thus depends on what it would be rational for societies to choose.

Copp’s view shares several features with Kantian constructivism. First, it maintains that societies require their members to endorse a suitable moral code in order to sustain cooperation, thereby conceiving of morality as a cooperative enterprise and grounding the need for objective moral standards in practical considerations. Second, it explains moral truth in procedural terms, denying the existence of moral facts independent of such procedures (Rawls 1980: 307). Third, it insists that any adequate metaethics must account for the normativity and practical relevance of moral claims (Copp 2007: 4–7), holding that moral obligations bind us regardless of our motivational states.

Unlike Kantian constructivism, however, Copp’s account does not commit to a specific conception of autonomy. Finally, he defends society-based constructivism as both realist and naturalistic: realist in treating moral propositions as truth-evaluable and some moral properties as instantiated, and naturalistic in claiming that these properties are natural ones (Copp 1995; 2013).

4.3 Humean Moral Constructivism

Recent developments in Humean constructivism have produced hybrid theories that borrow from different traditions, and whose metaethical standing diverges significantly, partly in response to the shortcomings highlighted in section 3 regarding the quest for moral objectivity.

First, James Lenman (2012, 2024) develops a hybrid account that combines constructivism, treated as a first-order account of the justification of moral reasons, with an expressivist semantics of ethical judgment. Although Humean in orientation, his view converges with Kantian constructivism in affirming the unifying role of reason in agency and in offering a normative procedure embodying ideals of equality and freedom – what he calls “a form of expressivism articulated in reason.” Unlike Street (2008), Lenman rejects immoralism, insisting that cases such as torture for fun must be ruled out not by brute preference but by co-deliberation within a diachronic community of selves. This requires a modest principle of agency-unification: to deliberate normatively at all, agents must integrate their commitments across time, though without invoking any essentialist conception of the self. On this view, failures such as Caligula’s reflect political collapse rather than reflective defect.

For Lenman, constructivism addresses expressivism’s central challenge – explaining moral objectivity – but only by substantive normative means, so it cannot serve as a metaethics on its own. Expressivism provides the metaethical underpinning, while constructivism supplies the normative procedure. Together they vindicate objectivity without metaphysical costs and preserve the practical significance of moral judgment without reductive naturalism (2012: 217–18). In this case, constructivism, ensures the advantages of Blackburn’s quasi-realism (1993): normative discipline transforms passions into judgments governed by stability, coherence, and commonality, which, if it succeeds, can be truth-apt and objective (Lenman 2012: 220; cf. Street 2011). Yet a fundamental difficulty remains: the nature of desire is either an evaluative notion or a merely psychological one – an ambiguity that must be resolved if Humean constructivism is to advance (Scanlon 1998: 7–8, ch. 1).

A second attempt to articulate the quest for objectivity in Humean terms, proposed by Julia Driver (2017), extends the individual standpoint through general rules grounded in the practical perspective of social creatures, thereby accommodating the possibility of moral failure, self-correction, and practices of social alignment. It purports to improve over Street’s constructivism and Kantian transcendental arguments by explaining the pressure toward generality as a natural phenomenon rooted in human sociability. However, the strategy presupposes an indeterminate account of “human nature”, which is problematic (Driver 2017: 176). Second, its generalizing resources, grounded in sympathy, may fall short of securing a stable relation between morality and the self (Driver 2017: 180–81). Third, the key question is whether the Humean appeal to generality can vindicate its normative significance, particularly in cases of moral disagreement where the demand for correction requires justification (Korsgaard 2008: 278–79). The Humean approach is thus hard pressed to explain how social animals with capacities such as sympathy become bound by norms of sympathy, or why they have reason to endorse the general point of view.

Finally, Dale Dorsey (2018) proposes ‘perfectionist’ constructivism inspired by Hume’s esthetics. This view holds that individual attitudes are constructed out of humanity’s shared evaluative nature. Like its Kantian counterpart, the perfectionist variety of Humean constructivism holds that some moral reasons apply universally but denies that obligations are grounded solely in rationality (Dorsey 2018: 591). The immoralist’s error lies not in incoherence but in being socially dysfunctional and self-defeating, undermining our shared self-understanding as socially productive beings. A qualified agreement by those whose sentiments are “in a sound state” counts as “evidence that human nature issues a particular verdict in a given case” (Dorsey 2018: 585). This formulation is problematic for three reasons: it is circular in presupposing a common core that should itself be constructed; it rests on the questionable assumption that actual practices converge, ignoring both the difficulty of achieving convergence and the possibility that it may result from irrelevant factors; and it excludes the prospect of divergent yet equally valid moralities, which should at least remain conceptually open even if ultimately rejected on practical grounds. The perfectionist strategy aligns Humean constructivism more closely with moral realism by positing a subject matter independent of the agent’s construction.

Despite these refinements aimed at capturing the social significance of moral and practical reasoning, it remains doubtful whether these hybrid views have substantially advanced beyond Street’s position.

4.4 Aristotelian Ethical Constructivism

Aristotelian constructivism holds that our true normative judgments represent a normative reality, but this reality is not independent of the exercise of moral and practical judgment (LeBar 2008: 182; 2013a,b). Like the Kantian varieties of constructivism, Aristotelian constructivism appeals to constitutive features of practical reason:

practical truth is constructed, not discovered, because it is activity in accordance with the norms of practical rationality, which are themselves constitutive of agency. (LeBar 2008: 191)

Unlike Kantian models, however, it rejects formal and procedural principles in favor of a substantive account of the good life, rooted in eudaimonism. Rational agents set the standard of practical rationality through the exercise of intellectual and moral virtues (Aristotle, NE II.6; cf. Berryman 2019). The negative case for Aristotelian constructivism targets the Kantian view of practical reasoning as law-like, governed by universality. Critics argue that Kantians struggle to apply universal principles to concrete cases (Höffe 1993; LeBar 2013b; Millgram 2005: ch. 6). Aristotelians claim an advantage here: their account allows practical reasoning to adapt to particulars and offers a framework for norms of successful judgment, an area where Kantian ethics is seen as deficient (Millgram 2005: ch. 6). Kantian ethics is often criticized for either rigorism or empty formalism, and though constructivists such as O’Neill (1975) and Herman (1993) attempt to address the role of circumstances, Aristotelians contend these efforts remain inadequate (LeBar 2013b).

To identify the substantive standards of practical reasoning, Aristotelian constructivism starts with a study of the complexity of our rational animal nature, which excludes that the principles constitutive of human rationality can be merely formal. In contrast to Kantian self-legislation, Aristotelian constructivism emphasizes the interplay between rational and animal nature, focusing especially on training and shaping the affective and sensitive aspects of our nature. In particular, it emphasizes the transformative effects of reflection on passions and desires, and the possibility of developing a ‘second nature’, thanks to complex processes such as habituation and education (LeBar 2008: 197). Practical rationality does not merely direct affective responses toward adequate objects but also structurally transforms our animal sensibility into character. Aristotelian constructivism rests on two central concepts: the good life (eudaimonia) and practical wisdom (phronesis), whose contents are progressively defined through their mutual interaction (LeBar 2023: 479). While general standards exist, in particular cases it is phronesis that determines them. There are no independent facts that establish what a good life is apart from the judgment of the wise. Such judgments are substantive rather than formal, and particular rather than universal.

4.5 Hegelian Ethical Constructivism

Hegel-inspired ethical constructivism affirms the primacy of social processes over individual agency, though they diverge on how to conceive this priority, producing different positions toward realism. Some interpret Hegel as claiming that moral normativity is “invented” (Pippin 2008), while others insist that human nature is always already shaped by ethical order (Laitinen 2020; Thompson 2020). To stress antirelativist commitments, one strand retains a qualified normative realism, weakened or historically mediated (Rockmore 2016; Werner 2017; Gladhill & Stein 2020; Ostritsch 2020; Laitinen 2016, 2020). Others treat the social nature of constructions as neutral but objectivist (Westphal2003, 2016, 2017), while some, following Korsgaard, argue that constructivism destabilizes the realism/skepticism dichotomy (Wretzler 2020).

In stark contrast to formalist and transcendent aspirations, Neo-Hegelians emphasize actuality: reason unfolds through concrete forms while leaving space for alternative or thwarted paths (Ng 2009; Moyland 2011; Yeomans 2012; Redding 2020). This yields a robust account of practical reason that affirms its historicity and embeds autonomy in complex social processes (Bildung). On this view, the constraints of practical cognition are socially grounded, arising from the norms of a community of rational agents at a given historical moment. Rational agency is thus not reducible to self-relation but requires recognition and engagement with others. Autonomy cannot be simply assumed but must be situated within a sociopolitical reality, prompting inquiry into its ontological constitution. Self-determination and choice become possible only within such contexts, and the authority of reasons varies across social formations. Constructivism thus becomes a theory of social agency, foregrounding autonomy as lived within institutions.

The Hegelian notion of ‘sublation’ (Aufhebung) designates a process of preservation and transformation. It implies that social constructions, though indispensable for rational agency, are not ultimate normative standards but concrete frameworks within which reasoning unfolds, shaping practical truth through structural, epistemic, and contextual functions. Ethical life thus preserves past commitments that continue to shape collective and individual identities.

A strength of this model is its fallibilism: norms may obscure objective contents, yet practices remain open to critique and correction. Here moral sensibility – especially the experience of suffering – plays an epistemic role in detecting injustice and empowering ethical and political contestation (Ostritsch 2020; Laitinen 2020). By focusing on concrete formations, this variety of constructivism highlights how agents discern the limits of their historical realities, illuminating responsibility, social roles, and historically conditioned alienation missed by individualist accounts of reflective endorsement.

The view that ethical norms are social artifacts leans toward antirealism but struggles to vindicate their truth-claims. Purely social constructivism, lacking ontological grounding, faces two objections: relativism, since reasons bound to sociohistorical contexts risk losing critical force, and reification, since reasons embedded in practices may appear immune to scrutiny (Thompson 2020). Hegelian approaches reply by positing a social ontology: human beings are essentially social, and their relations constitute reality itself, historically reshaped in diverse forms (Redding 2020; Thompson 2020). On this account, objectivity is internal to concrete social formations rather than the contingent product of convention. Its strength lies in avoiding relativism while grounding normativity socially; its weakness is reliance on agents to apprehend reasons expressive of the systemic totality of their social world. Whether this confidence is justified, and how it avoids reification, remains an open question.

5. Constructivism’s Place in Metaethics

Constructivism has become a central position in both practical philosophy and metaethics, appealing for its attempt to secure moral objectivity while avoiding the epistemological and ontological burdens of nonnaturalist realism (Darwall, Gibbard, & Railton 1992; Shafer-Landau 2003, ch. 4). Yet this aim is not unique to constructivism: naturalist realism also promises objectivity without nonnaturalist commitments, and antirealist theories likewise defend objectivity on non-ontological grounds (Hare 1952; Gibbard 1990; Wright 1992). What distinguishes constructivism is its potential to reconcile the key features of normative truths – their objectivity, their intelligibility, and their practical authority (Scanlon 2014: 91).

5.1 The Constructivist Approach to Normative Discourse

Thus far, constructivists have not developed a distinctive account of the meaning or logical behavior of moral and normative terms. In the absence of a constructivist semantics, some suggest that constructivism is best seen as “a family of substantive moral theories” (Darwall et al. 1992: 140; Hussain & Shah 2006, 2013; Enoch 2009; Hussain 2012). On this view, constructivism is not a metaethical theory, since by treating normative concepts as solutions to practical problems it remains within the normative domain (Ridge 2012). This objection, however, assumes a sharp boundary between normative ethics and metaethics. Constructivists reject this, aiming instead to clarify the reasons that make moral principles ones no one could reasonably reject (Scanlon 1998: 246–247; 2003a: 429–435). The dispute thus turns on what counts as metaethics. Some constructivists even regard the semantic focus of traditional metaethics as misguided, diverting attention from the real issue – the nature of normativity itself (Korsgaard 1996a; 2003: 122 fn.49; Street 2008a: 239), and hence call for a break with the “platitudes” of metaethics (Korsgaard 2003: 105).

Still, some constructivists pursue also a semantic task from within a broader understanding of metaethics. Some argue that identifying the constitutive norms of valuing provides the basis for an inferentialist semantics, whereby normative terms are explained through the kinds of inferences – such as those about means and ends – required to count as employing them at all (Street 2010: 239–242). This commits constructivists to showing that their proposal improves on rival accounts (cf. Jaeger 2015). Others articulate a pragmatist variety of constructivism about normative discourse (Richardson 1994, 1995, 1998, 2008, 2013, 2018; Elgyin 1997; Misak 2000; Schwartz 2017). Müller (2020) defends a theory of reasoning as requiring reason judgments, where reason judgments are not representational yet still truth apt, analysing the nature of these judgments in functionalist terms as guiding reasoning in a certain way (cf. Frugé 2021; Silverstein 2022).

5.2 Constructivist Accounts of Truth

Constructivists must deny the correspondence theory of truth, the view that truth is correspondence to a fact. At the same time, they can allow that normative judgments are truth-apt. This view is hospitable to the constructivist claim that moral and normative truths may alter over time, as a result of ongoing rational deliberation and revision (Richardson 2013; LeBar 2013b; O’Neill 1992, 2015; Laitinen 2016). Some attempts to deal with semantic issues bring to light a resemblance between constructivism and pragmatism, which rejects the idea that truth is correspondence to a mind-independent world, stressing instead that truth is tied to inquiry responsive to argument and evidence: it is the state of belief that, after full inquiry, would not be improved or defeated, although we me not know when we have reached such a belief. Human inquiry is fallible and provisional, but truth is tied to the ideal of inquiry’s completion (Misak 2000, cf. Richardson 1998). Like pragmatism, constructivism appeals to the practical point of view to account for truth, in contrast to standard forms of realism about truth (Proulx 2016; Elgin 1997; Richardson 2013; Schwartz 2017). Some critics are skeptical about the possibility of developing a constructivist account of truth (Hussain 2012: 189ff; Dorsey 2012). Schwartz and Velasco (2019) develop a semantic account of metanormative constructivism, where moral claims are true if endorsed by idealized agents through practical reasoning. Their framework clarifies how constructivism can treat moral judgments as truth-apt and normatively authoritative without appealing to independent moral facts.

5.3 Constructivism and the Realism-Antirealism Debate

The varieties of constructivism occupy different positions in the realism–antirealism debate. Kantian constructivism has been cast as a third option between realism and subjectivism (Rawls 1980), or between realism and relativism (O’Neill 1989a; Korsgaard 1996a: 36). Some interpret constructivism as realist (Copp 2013; LeBar 2013, 2023), others as antirealist (Lenman 2010, 2024), while still others defend hybrid views, such as “prioritism,” which combines realism about reasons with constructivism about moral judgments (Scanlon 1998, 2014, 2003b: 18). Street (2006, 2008a, 2009, 2012) places constructivism on the antirealist side, even embracing a form of relativism. This diversity suggests it is a mistake to assess constructivism’s significance solely in terms of the realism–antirealism debate (Korsgaard 2008: 312, 325 n.49; Copp 2013; Engstrom 2013: 138ff).

Part of the difficulty lies in divergent definitions of realism (Sayre-McCord 2015; Joyce 2015; Miller 2014; LeBar 2023; Smith 2018). Realists generally hold that (a) moral discourse is cognitivist, (b) there are moral properties such as rightness, (c) some moral properties are instantiated, and (d) moral predicates express properties. Disagreement arises over whether realism requires the stronger claim that (e) moral properties are mind-independent. Further divisions concern naturalism, which holds that (f) moral properties are metaphysically on a par with non-moral properties and (g) moral assertions express ordinary beliefs about their instantiation. Constructivists generally accept (nonreductive) naturalism but some reject (e): they hold that normative properties depend on human sensibility or rational agency rather than being mind-independent. Like realist naturalism and antirealism, constructivism is committed to metaphysical parsimony, distinguishing it from Moorean and robust moral realism (Enoch 2011a).

Korsgaard highlights a shared assumption of both realism and antirealism, which constructivists reject: that the function of concepts in truth-apt judgments is representational, such that normative truths must refer to something “out there.” Constructivists instead claim that normative concepts serve a practical function: they articulate solutions to practical problems rather than represent moral facts (Korsgaard 2008: 302ff). Thus, equity, for example, does not name a property but proposes a way of distributing goods. Constructivism therefore differs from substantive realism, which grounds truth in a mind-independent normative reality, and from antirealism, which denies normative truth altogether: practical judgments can be true or false without representing independent normative facts (Korsgaard 2003: 325 n.49).

This characterization, however, does not neatly capture constructivism’s place. First, Korsgaard equates realism with mind-independence, but many define it more broadly to include views where normative truths depend on mental states (Sayre-McCord 1988; Copp 2007: 7; LeBar 2023). Second, some antirealists allow that moral judgments are truth-apt but treat truth as a deflationary semantic notion (Ridge 2012; Lenman & Shemmer 2012b). Constructivism thus marks a middle ground between forms of realism committed to mind-independent truths and forms of antirealism that deny normative truth altogether. In this sense, it resembles “sophisticated subjectivism” (Wiggins 1993; McDowell 1985), though Kantian constructivism grounds normative truth in rational agency rather than sensibility.

Some forms of Humean constructivism align closely with expressivism, which treats normative language as guiding action rather than representing facts (Chrisman 2010; Meyers 2012; Ridge 2012; Tiberius 2012). Lenman (2012) argues that this link helps constructivism address the problem of identifying the mental states expressed by normative judgments. Yet many constructivists deny that expressivism can capture the authority of normativity, reducing moral discourse to mere “emotional expletives” (Korsgaard 2003: 105) or to normative states (Street 2010: 239–242; Korsgaard 2003, 2008, 2009; LeBar 2023). For Korsgaard in particular, the problem of normative authority must be addressed from the first-person perspective, something both realism and expressivism fail to achieve (1996a; 2008: 30–31, 55–57, 67–68, 234). Other constructivists doubt that expressivism can capture the social dimension of moral evaluation (LeBar 2023: 472, 479), and endorse a modest variety of realism. Some hybrid theories endorse explicitly moral (Copp 1995) or normative realism (Rockmore 2016; Werner 2017; Gladhill & Stein 2020; Ostritsch 2020; Laitinen 2016, 2020) or align to it (Driver 2017; Dorsey 2018), while others combine constructivism with expressivism (Lenman 2012), or reject the realism/antirealist dichotomy (Westphal2003, 2016, 2017, Wretzler 2020).

6. The Euthyphro Question

Constructivism explains practical truths through the constitutive activity of reasoning captured by the notion of “construction.” It provides “a potentially devastating argument against realism” (Shafer-Landau 2003: 49), showing an explanatory power that realism lacks (Shafer-Landau 2003: 51). But all these comparative advantages are nulled by an Euthyphro-style dilemma: if reasoning is unconstrained, its results are arbitrary; if constrained, the constraints are not constructed and entail realism (Shafer-Landau 2003: 42). Thus, constructivism appears either arbitrary or collapses into realism.

This objection can be formulated and motivated in at least two ways, which will be examined in sections 6.1–6.2, while section 6.3 will discuss the viability of constitutivism as an account of moral normativity.

6.1 The Role of Intuitions

The first objection is that constructivism relies on an “unconstructed,” and thus unjustified, set of normative constraints. Kantian constructivism, for example, seems grounded in the value of moral impartiality, which demands equal respect for persons (Scanlon 1998: 22–33, 287–290; Rawls 1993: 38–54). The worry is that constructivism risks vacuity, since “its test yields results only by presupposing moral views which can only be established independently of it” (Raz 2003: 358; Hare 1983; Brink 1987, 1989; Timmons 2003; Cohen 2003). Moreover, as Timmons argues, there is “no non-question-begging feature to which the constructivist can help herself in breaking symmetry among the various competing sets of constructed principles” (2003: §3).

Kant is keenly aware of the air of paradox surrounding the claim that the moral concepts, such as good and evil, are not determined prior to engaging in practical reasoning, but only as a result of engaging in practical reasoning. This is known as the ‘paradox of the method’ (Kant C2, 5: 62 ff.). As Rawls explains it,

The difficulty is that Kant appears to know in advance of critical reflection how a constructivist doctrine might look, but this makes it impossible to undertake such reflection in good faith. In reply to this quite proper worry, we interpret constructivism as a view about how the structure and content of the soundest moral doctrine would look once it is laid out after due critical reflection. (Rawls 2000: 274)

Practical reasoning, then, is not a matter of discovering values independent of its verdicts. For Kantian constructivists, it yields a form of self-conscious practical knowledge, intelligible only through accounts that treat cognition as self-conscious activity (Rawls 2000: 148, 218; Engstrom 2013; Bagnoli 2013b; Jezzi 2016 [Other Internet Resources]). Its novelty lies in explaining objective moral knowledge without presupposing an independent moral reality, but instead grounding it in reason’s own activity.

Debate persists about the role of intuitions in justification. For Scanlon (1998), appeal to intuitions is unavoidable: justification proceeds by testing the fit between theoretical assumptions and intuitive moral judgments, which serve as initial data without constituting independent truths. Others, such as O’Neill (1989b), deny intuitions any justificatory role. Still, most constructivists agree that metaethics must remain broadly congruent with common understandings of rationality and morality (Smith 2013). In this respect, constructivism distinguishes itself from projectivist or error theories (Blackburn 1993; Mackie 1977), which regard evaluative discourse as systematically mistaken (Bagnoli 2002; Street 2011; Lillehammer 2011).

6.2 The Status of Constitutivist Norms

A second formulation of the objection that constructivism avoids arbitrariness by tacitly relying on unconstructed elements targets the constitutivist strategy. How are constitutive norms justified? The objection holds that they are either arbitrary or realist, depending on normative features of reality that are unconstructed (Fitzpatrick 2013; Stern 2013; Baiasu 2016; Bratu & Dittmeyer 2016; cf. Bachman 2018).

In providing an account of rational justification, both realists and constructivists rely on unconstructed elements. Normative or non-naturalist realists take normativity as primitive: certain facts simply are reasons, and “there won’t be any illuminating explanation” of what makes this true (Shafer-Landau 2003: 47–48). Reductive naturalists, by contrast, identify normative facts with natural facts, accessible through empirical methods – for instance, facts about agents’ responses under idealized conditions (Smith 2012, 2013).

Constructivism, while compatible with non-reductive naturalism (Korsgaard 1996; Walden 2012), does not reduce moral properties to natural ones but seeks to explain the standards of practical reason (O’Neill 1989b; Korsgaard 2003, 2009; Street 2010; Velleman 2009). Unlike (naturalist and normative) realism, however, constructivism an external foundation of normative standards. Internality is construed in two ways. According to Korsgaard,

“Constitutive standards are opposed to external standards, which mention desiderata for an object that are not essential to its being the kind of thing that it is” (Korsgaard 2008: 8).

A more modest interpretation insists on the role of internal standards in practical reasoning, which is “avowedly circular”:

If the standards of practical reasoning are fundamental to all human reasoning, then any vindication of these standards is either circular (since it uses those very standards) or a failure (since it is not a vindication in terms of the standards that are said to be fundamental). (O’Neill 1989b: 29)

The latter interpretation stands in contrast to the traditional “first principles philosophy”, which derives moral truths from principles that have the status of axioms (cf. Schneewind 1970). The shared constructivist conviction is that appeal to standards constitutive of agency explains with ease why such standards are normative (Korsgaard 2008: 8). They are normative because in the very activity of reasoning we are committing ourselves to being guided by them. In forming our intentions and beliefs, we are answerable to criteria of correctness that are internal to and constitutive of the very exercise of rationality (Korsgaard 2008: 13–15, 110–126, 207–229).

The place of constitutivism – and correspondingly of constitutivist constructivism – within the traditional metaethical landscape remains contested. Some regard constitutivism as broadly realist, on the grounds that moral judgments express beliefs that can be true, though not in the robust realist sense (Smith 2013, 2018, 2020, 2023). Others interpret it as compatible with expressivism (Silverstein 2016; Ridge 2018). Varieties of Humean and Aristotelian constitutivism or constructivism are often mind-dependent (Street 2010, cf. 2016b; LeBar 2023), while others are mind-independent, appealing either to natural objects (Smith 2023) or to practical laws (O’Neill 1989; LeBar 2023: 471). Some versions are idealized (Smith 2013, 2020, 2023; Street 2016a), while others are non-idealized (O’Neill 1987, 1989; Walden 2018a, 2018b; Bagnoli forthcoming). Appeals to idealized rationality are often charged with circularity, since they offer no independent, non–question-begging reason for those very standards. For some, idealization is a normative matter; for others, it concerns facts about the psychology of idealized agents, which are themselves conceived as natural objects (Smith 2023). Further disagreement arises over the definition of idealized agency: for some, it includes features such as self-control and resistance to intra- and interpersonal conflict (Smith 2023: 101; cf. Lindeman 2019, Coleman 2023), while for others it involves the dissolution of the self (Salazar 2021; cf. Street 2016a). All forms of constitutivism are at least compatible with non-reductive naturalism, though some take a reductive naturalist form, and others may even commit to essentialism. Some constitutivist accounts support moral objectivity – either in a robust form that coheres with first-person deliberation (O’Neill 1989; Korsgaard 2009; O’Hagan 2014) or in an absolutist form (Smith 2023) – while others are relativistic (Street 2008, 2010). Certain versions adopt a moral rationalist framework, according to which moral requirements entail corresponding reasons for action, are knowable a priori, and are grounded in practical reason. For some, however, this capacity is reduced to facts about the psychology of ideal agents (Smith 2023: 103–104). In the next section, we will limit the discussion to the constitutivist strategies relevant to constructivism because constitutivism can be defended as a theory independent of (meta-ethical and moral) constructivism, as the general view that the view that we can justify fundamental normative claims by showing that agents become committed to these claims merely in virtue of acting (see Katsafanas 2019; cf. Ferrero 2021).

6.3 Constitutivism about Moral Normativity

The constructivist use of constitutivist strategies in defending moral normativity offers at least three advantages. First, it sidesteps the internalist/externalist distinction by directly linking rationality with agency. Second, it resolves the problem of authority by dispensing with the need for external facts to legitimate claims of normative force. Third, it vindicates a priori moral and practical knowledge – providing rational justification for moral verdicts – while remaining consistent with a minimalist or constructivist metaphysics of the moral domain (Walden 2018; Katsafanas 2018; Schroeter, Jones, & Schroeter 2018: 8; Ferrero 2021).

An outstanding question is whether the constitutivist strategy suffices to account for moral obligation. Constructivists are devided about this claim. Korsgaard (2009) holds that the principles governing action are “constitutive standards” of agency, that is, standards arising from the nature of agency itself, which explain the normativity of moral obligations. The marks of agency are autonomy and efficacy, and the categorical and hypothetical imperatives are norms grounded on these two properties. These norms are “constitutive” of rational agency in that (i) they determine what a rational agent is (the “constitution requirement”), and (ii) they empower an agent to realize her identity as the particular person she is, by guiding her conduct according to those standards (the “self-constitution requirement”). According to Korsgaard (2019), Kantian constructivism is uniquely positioned to vindicate the self- constitution requirement while Humean and Aristotelian theories fail to meet it. Yet the Kantian claims about the rational authority of morality are found puzzling (Brink 1992).

Humean Constitutivism is more modest (Street 2006), in that is acknowledges only the principle of logical consistency. The differences among these two constitutivist strategies can be illustrated by comparing their respective diagnoses of the immoralist (Street 2010: 371; cf. Street 2016a). Humean constructivists admits ideally coherent eccentrics, like Caligula who “aims solely to maximize the suffering of others”; for such agents, there are reasons for torturing others (Street 2009). Kantian constructivists deny that there might be reasons for maximizing the suffering of others but provide different arguments in support of this claim. Some argue that Caligula’s incoherence can be shown by spelling out the norms that are constitutive of valuing. Such constitutive norms entail valuing humanity, and this proves that Caligula is mistaken by his own lights, even though he may never fully realize this, due to poor reflection, ignorance of the non-normative facts or some other limitation (Korsgaard 1996a: 121–123; cf. Street 2016a). A different Kantian argument establishes that an internally coherent Caligula is conceivable, that is, he can be thought without contradiction, but his case is blocked by general facts about moral sensibility and interdependency, and coordination requirements (Engstrom 2009: 243). Ultimately, there are no reasons to inflict maximal suffering. Crucially, unlike in realism, this conclusion does not depend on the existence of moral truths that precede or stand independent of practical reasoning (Street 2016a).

By itself, consistency is too thin to account for the kind of constraints that rational agents need to impose on the dynamic process of goal management (Gibbard 1999; Smith 1999). To account for these normative constraints, some add a broad principle of coherence, which demands a unified account of the agent’s goals, and thus goes beyond strict logical consistency (Shemmer 2012; Lenman 2012). Others argue for additional but related principles, which regulate attention and disregard (James 2007, 2012), benevolence and non-interference (Smith 2013: 322, 328). For Kantians, however, that the normativity of instrumental principles of rationality rests on the normativity of non-instrumental principles (O’Neill 1989b: 73–74; Korsgaard 1997, 2008: esp. 67–69), expressing respect for others as having equal standing (Bagnoli 2013b).

Disagreement persists over the scope and role of constitutivism in Kantian ethics (Bagnoli and Bacin forthcoming). Some view it as a response to skepticism about practical reason (O’Neill 1989; Korsgaard 1983, 2019; Engstrom 2009; Bagnoli 2013a), while others argue it misfits Kant’s project (Gobsch 2019; Saemi 2016; Tenenbaum 2016). Critics contend that the categorical imperative, as a constitutive standard, is too thin to yield determinate moral obligations (Nozick 1981: 545–551; Cohen 1996; Bratman 1998; Gibbard 1999: 149, 152–153; Fitzpatrick 2005; Scanlon 2007). In fact, most Kantians deny that moral obligations can be derived from universal features of bare rationality alone, and also deny that appeal to constitutive norms of rationality is sufficient to provide a complete system of moral duties (O’Neill 1989; Sensen 2013, 2017; Timmons 2017; Bagnoli 2021).

Constitutivism faces serious challenges that threaten to undermine the constructivist project in all its forms. The first concerns the status of constitutive standards. These standards are meant to be both normative and, at least in part, descriptive of the very activity they govern (Korsgaard 2008: 9). Critics argue, however, that it is unclear whether – and how – such standards can be violated (Cohen 1996: 177). For an agent to count as subject to norms, she must also be capable of violating them. Suppose, for instance, that there is a norm prohibiting deception: to say that a rational agent is guided by this norm is to say that she can fail to comply with it. Yet if the norm is constitutive of reasoning itself, how could it be broken in the very act of reasoning? If constitutive norms are in principle inviolable, then constitutivism seems to entail that both immoralism and irrationality are impossible (Lavin 2004; cf. Cokelet 2008).

A related objection concerns the very possibility of bad action (Katsafanas 2018). Korsgaard responds that in order to count as acting at all, we must at least be attempting to follow the principles of practical reason, though we may fail to do so adequately or fully (Korsgaard 2009: 45–49, 159–176; Pauer-Studer 2018). For example, one may adopt the moral end of benevolence yet pursue it without grace or understanding, thereby provoking resentment rather than eliciting gratitude. Thus, a mistaken judgment about what self-defense requires mischaracterizes the very nature of self-defense. The issue is whether such defective approximations constitute transgressions of normative requirements, rather than mere failures of what is expected of agents. Addressing this requires a more radical strategy: a constitutivist metaphysics of capacities that explains error as an imperfection of action (Fix 2020) and charts different modes of alienation from constitutive norms (Tenenbaum 2019). Herman suggests that in defective instances of action, constitutive norms are not misapplied but misrepresented (Herman 2007: 171–172, 245–246).

A second objection is that the constitutivist strategy depends on the claim that agency is inescapable, whereas critics argue that agency is no less optional than any other activity (Enoch 2006; Tiffany 2012; Leffler 2016, 2019, 2024a,b). Constitutivists cannot simply appeal to the constitutive role of agency to explain why its rules bind, for inescapability by itself provides no normative force (Kolodny 2005). On this view, the authority of rational requirements is illusory: they merely track antecedent reasons rather than generate new ones. Constitutivists reply that the objector overlooks the inescapability of agency itself. While it is possible to disengage from any particular activity, some form of agency always remains operative (Ferrero 2010a; Velleman 2009: 138–141; James 2012). In this sense, agency is not optional. Enoch counters that even if some form of activity is always present, this does not entail that the norms constituting such activity yield normative reasons for any particular agent (Enoch 2011b). The constitutivist rejoinder is that the very question of whether there are reasons to be agents can only arise within agency itself (Velleman 2009: 204–206). One does not need a reason to be an agent rather than not, and thus Enoch’s challenge is not a genuine or live question (Rosati 2016: 201 n.71; Silverstein 2015: 1136–1138). For Ferrero (2019) the appeal to inescapability works best as a defensive move but fails to sustain robust moral normativity.

These replies are effective at least against some versions of the shmagency objection (Arruda 2017; Paakkunainen 2018). Whether agents have conclusive reasons to be agents, however, might depend on the particular version of constitutivism. For most constitutivists, this involves grounding authoritative norms in the teleological structure of agency (Korsgaard 2009; Engstrom 2009). For others, the constitutivist project can be salvaged only if it is supplemented with a reductive metanormative account of reasons for action, which links reasons to sound or successful practical reasoning (Silverstein 2016).

A third objection is that treating moral obligations as rational requirements does not resolve the question of their normative authority (Broome 2005; Kolodny 2005), unless such requirements are shown to be either intrinsically normative or valuable independently of their contingent benefits. Meeting this challenge thus depends on vindicating the intrinsically normative character of rationality itself (Williams 1981, 1985, 1994). This debate is rooted in a fundamental disagreement about the scope and powers of practical reason.

Finally, other worries arise from Bratman (2012)’s charge that constructivism overconstrains deliberation, producing tension between reflective and prereflective judgments, especially when loyalties or attachments conflict with impartial duties. This is a problem even when for the modest Humean constitutivism that recognizes only a formal requirement of consistency. If the input judgments include attitudes such as love and caring, which are not necessarily responsive to intersubjective pressures, agents may end up endorsing reflective judgments that are not aligned with their unreflective judgments. This may be taken as a variety of alienation (Tenenbaum 2019, Mudd forthcoming, Sensen forthcoming).

This debate indicates the importance of the temporal dimensions of rational agency (James 2012; Ferrero 2009, 2010b; Smith 2013: 315ff). Recent varieties of constructivism take into account the predicaments of contingency (Street 2012), the possibility normative revisions (Baldwin 2013, Richardson 2018), moral progress (Arruda 2016), and concrete forms of normativity (Gledhill and Stein 2020, cf. Bagnoli 2022, §4). It is noteworthy that the growing attention to the temporal dimension of rational agency has been paralleled by an increased focus on the social dimension of moral evaluation. Early Humean and Kantian accounts – especially Street (2006, 2008, 2010) and Korsgaard (1996) – have often been criticized for offering an overly self-centered conception of morality that fails to take its interpersonal character seriously (Cohen 1996; Williams 1996; Meyr 2019). More recent approaches address this shortcoming by emphasizing the social dimension of moral life (Walden 2012, 2018a; cf. Smith 2020, 2023). The foregoing discussion highlights reflective equilibrium as a method of moral justification aimed at achieving coherence among our considered moral judgments, moral principles, and background theories. The method is iterative: when conflicts arise, either principles or judgments are revised until a state of mutual support is achieved. Although originally developed by Rawls, this methodological tool has been adopted by constitutivists as diverse as Smith (2010: 134, 136–137, 2013, 2020, 2023) and LeBar (2023), as well as by others (Baldwin 2013; Werner 2017; Walden 2018).

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Acknowledgments

I would like to thank Caroline Arruda, Christine M. Korsgaard, Luca Ferrero, Jeremy Fix, Jacob Librizzi, Elijah Millgram, Thomas Pendlebury, Tim Scanlon, Karl Schafer, Michael Smith, Oliver Sensen, Ariel Zylberman, and especially David Copp and Connie Rosati, the Editors and Referees of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, for their comments on earlier drafts.