Daoism

First published Sat Apr 19, 2025

Chinese Daoism is a Chinese philosophy of natural practice structured around a normative focus on dào (道 path, way). This naturalist philosophical project treated dào as a structure of natural possibility for living beings. Unlike similar Western naturalisms, e.g., pragmatism, Daoism’s foil was contemporary: the Confucian-Mohist (Ru-Mo) dialectic about human (人 rén human, social) dào. Daoism’s critique of Ru-Mo debate concerns the role of natural (天 tiān sky-nature) dào vs human dào (socially constructed guidance).

Daoism’s founding personages[1] (Laozi and Zhuangzi) did not coin their “-ism.” The two Classical texts, credited to their titled masters (子 zǐ son), emerged during the Classical period (5th to 3rd C. BC). Each reflected skeptically on the Confucian-Mohist dispute about the correct socio-political dào. Historians first coined the collective category “Daoist” (道家 dàojiā school of dào) during the Han (2nd C BC to 2nd C), There are inconclusive hints of their having shared a philosophical project in the two writings.

The philosophical project was to conceive of norms (permissibility) as metaphorical path-like structures (dàos) of natural possibility. Its signal axiom was that the structure changed constantly as new things (and dàos) emerged. All such natural dàos are guides for the behavior (行 xíng walking) [2] of things (物 wù natural kinds). We, humans and some other living things, learn behaviors in the ways we learn to walk following paths. Confucians championed human paths (人 rén 道 dào): historical social structures consisting of practices (事 shì affair, business) by named role players, a morality typified by ceremonial ritual (禮 lǐ decorum). Daoists favored wider natural (tiān) dàos of the cosmos (天地 tiāndì heaven & earth) of which all the “ten-thousand natural kinds” (物 wù things) are parts. Living things occupy the space between heaven and earth (天下 tiānxià the-world-under heaven) and have potential (可 kě permissible or possible) paths available for their behavior (xíng). These paths result from the natural distribution of existing things in the environment.

The implicit axiom of Dàoism is there are permissible paths in the natural world. Nature gives us virtuosity (德 dé virtue, excellence) in finding, learning, and following these paths of possibility. Learning from the past is a permissible natural way to acquire this virtuosity. However, it is unlikely that our current evolved social practices exhaust the permissible possibilities of learning about natural dào. We can reform social practices, but in doing so, we rely on ways of choosing among dàos guiding that reform. This is a key insight drawn from the Confucian-Mohist dispute. Mozi’s proposed reform process depended on an allegedly natural, meta-dào of measuring utility (利 lì benefit, harvest). This doesn’t make reform impossible or incoherent but initiates a regress of choosing ways while still in momentum along a way. We measure utility using existing concepts, ways of identifying utility and prefer it to other ways of improving our current social dàos.

The result is Daoism’s version of normative autonomy, one that starts from normative naturalism. It mimics mild skepticism. No matter how we learn and choose, there may be some possibilities we overlook. Its departure from Mohism lies in rejecting Mozi’s assumption that nature (tiān) dào is biased to benefit humans. Nature is neutral toward the ways of life “under the sky.” Claiming to know nature’s intent is cognitively naïve. A wholistic path structure affords us permissible/possible 4-dimensional future behaviors. That is natural Dào. It is how things have and can unfold, the “how” of our 4-dimensional past (and future). Dào is how natural kinds are born (生 shēng birth, life)—come to exist (有 yǒu have), change, evolve and eventually disappear (無 wú lack).

Western “things” (parts of the world picked out by noun phrases) are divided in China into natural kinds (物 wù), artifacts (器 qì tools, utensils), and practices (shì). Natural kinds have internal dàos (called 理 lǐ lanes-in-jade) that interacts with external road structures. Our human internal dào (lǐ) makes learning (學 xué study, practice) and practiced virtuosity possible. Individually and collectively, we learn and practice behaviors.

Importantly, dào, the structure of natural probability is more like a map than a formula, rule or law. It is like a GPS of life that gives us alternatives and suggests different paths we can choose from: fastest, most scenic, calmest, etc. It consists of all the hows of nature but explains only when made into a map which humans can learn to read. Modern Daoists embrace science but venerate (astro-physical) nature. Science is our best current social dào for understanding nature’s structure, certainly better than the classical Yin-Yang school’s tables of correlation. However, natural dào does not consist of commands or prohibitions, but of opportunities.

Dào permeates the space-time cosmos, is everywhere forever. It comes to have its structure of itself (自然 zìrán naturally, spontaneously, lit. self-make-so, realize from here). Chinese Daoism is holistic or monist in the sense of the whole being prior to its parts. Dào and the cosmos exist (有 yǒu have, being) and “the ten thousand things and I” are born, emerge from as natural parts of cosmic dào (Laozi Ch. 1, Zhuangzi 2:9). Dào unfolds into the future as every part self-realizes (zìrán) some possible (kě) dào guiding how it walks (行 xíng) into the future.

Early phase Daoists, Hui Shi, Shen Dao and Laozi’s Daode Jing implicitly rejected parthood, suggesting an absolute, Parmenidean, monism. Shen Dao’s version was of a fatalistic “block universe” in which nothing really happens. Priority monism characterizes the bulk of the Laozi and Zhuangzi. All the proper parts of yǒu, the ten-thousand natural kinds, have dàos which are proper parts of the larger daos. The ultimate dào is a cosmic network of possible histories of possible thing-parts. Dao is therefore constantly changing as things realize their possibilities. The unrealized paths recede into the past.

Controversies emerged within philosophical Daoism and between it and rival philosophical agendas. We elaborate on these and the implications of Daoist naturalism for linguistics, cosmology, metaphysics, knowledge and ethics in the sections below. Religious Daoism is a separate topic treated here.

1. History

We trace Daoism back to China’s Classical philosophy period, the Warring States (476–221 BC). It emerged in steps. It began with the Duke of Zhou’s (1038 BC) theory of the priority of sky-nature’s mandate over human relationships as the basis of legitimacy of leadership. The Shang had claimed authority as descendants of the “Emperor Above.” The Duke argued that their incompetence led to their natural replacement by the Zhou kings. Their ascent to the role of pathfinder, leader of the world between sky and earth was natural naming (命 mìng fate, luck, 名 míng name, status) of the leader (王 wáng king).

Confucius historicized and rehabilitated the Shang relationship-morality, but disgruntled dissidents would resort to nature as anti-social hermits or agriculturalists citing folk versions of philosophical quietism. An internal intellectual history (Zhuangzi 33) traces the trend through schools of fatalism, treating Great Dào as fixed cosmic history (Shen Dao) to Laozi’s school rejecting social constructs. Both rejected linguistic terms (名 míng names) and social practices in general as distorting our natural guiding capacity (德 dé virtue) by instilling desires for social status.

Philosophical accounts treat Zhuangzi as the mature version of Daoism. It accepted and emphasized how humans, natural social creatures, coordinated behavior using “sounds.” This makes language (言 yán speech, words) part of the “music of nature”—along with wind, birds, frogs and insects. Instead of eschewing language, the mature version emphasized the plethora of naturally possible norms (dàos) of language use.

The terms for the Daoist school (道家 dàojiā) and its teachings (道教 dàojiào) were both coined during the eclectic Han dynasty following the Qin (221–206 BC) repression. A cult worshipping The Yellow Emperor and Laozi (Huang Lao) dominated Chinese officialdom. Pairing Laozi and Zhuangzi was not automatic. Laozi’s status in the religious ideology of the time left the Zhuangzi to be studied mainly as a separate thinker in the Han Syncretic universe, sometimes as a sourcebook for dissidents until the fall of the Confucian dominated Han dynasty (206–220 BC). That relative obscurity also enveloped the other philosophical trends from the more vibrant Hundred Schools of the Classical, Warring States period, the Mohists and dialecticians (Later Mohists and School of Names).

The Han blurred and blended Daoism with both the Yin-Yang school of Zouyan and the superstitious divination of the Book of Changes. All had an interest in understanding and finding guidance in nature, but none yielded reliable know-how. Joseph Needham (Needham 1986) famously (and controversially—see Chinese Science) argued that Daoist interest in nature was indirectly responsible for the famous advances in Chinese “Science.” Daoist inclined thinkers clearly did lead to the 20th C. surge of interest in Western science (evolution) and logic (Needham 1986; Jin 2020). Evolution was a particularly apt example of a natural dào linked to Zhuangzi’s insistence that we are a continuous part of nature’s emergent creatures, exploring and expanding into our environment. Big Bang theory would be the modern version of Shen Dao’s Great Dào.

The Lao-Zhuang pairing was revived by the “Dark Learning” school (also known as Neo-Daoism) which emerged in the wake of the Han collapse. Wang Bi (226-249) curated the received Laozi (Daode Jing). Guo Xiang later did the same with the Zhuangzi. Etymological controversy still surrounds both results (Kline 2010), but when we attribute anything to a named master (zǐ son, master), we are, in effect, attributing it to these evolved, now conventionally accepted master texts.

The slogan for the Dark Learning school’s accommodation with Han Dynastic Confucianism was “Sage within; king without.” It became the “common” interpretation: empty within (amoral), we conform to the ruling mores. This nihilistic posture mediated the introduction of Buddhism into China, matching concepts. Laozi worship adopted institutional structures from Buddhism (monks, nuns and monasteries). In the process, the interpretation of both converged into a distinctive Chinese Buddhism—Zen (禪 chán meditation) Buddhism. Its naturalist spin on Buddhist idealism eschewed the distinction between Nirvana and ordinary life (Samsara). Everyone has Buddha-nature. Meditation equals ordinary consciousness experienced in everyday behaviors, carrying water and chopping wood (Feng and Bodde 1937).

“Every-moment Zen” naturalism co-opted Buddhism’s denial of the ego and mind-body dualism, fitting it into Daoism’s practical naturalism. Skilled behavior is characterized by loss of ego, the sense that the actor and instrument become one. The emphasis on excellence in arts, behaviors, and skills linked Zen and Zhuangzi’s goal of perfecting ordinary life pursuits--including butchering cattle! (Zhuangzi 3:2)

Confucianism began to take Daoism and Buddhism (Zen especially) as amoral twins but itself adopted a related metaphysical picture grounding their ethics. Neo-Confucians report going through a youthful Zhuangzi phase before settling into Confucianism built around the metaphor of an inner-lane (lǐ), a “path-like” term used in translating “dharma” (Buddhist essence). This allowed them to rehabilitate Mencius’ moral psychology and link it to a cosmic normative path-structure. The era of compatibility of Daoism and Confucianism emerged. The more conservative accused “liberal” Confucians with lowered commitment to the authority of ancient texts of reverting to Zen or Daoism (Mad Channists).

Orthodoxy minimized Zhuangzi’s “pluralist” normativity until the modern Western contact when it became identified with science and democratic tolerance for many different ways of life. Naturalist thinkers adopted Western logic and liberalism more quickly and enthusiastically than did conservative Confucians, saw them as cures for China’s scientific and political backwardness. Conservatives preferred a formula of keeping a Confucian base and adopting Western technology only as a practical tactic. Li Zehou reverses this May 4 slogan (Li 1986).

Yan Fu (1854–1921) seemed most drawn to the theory of evolution, which is a paradigm natural dào. He translated and popularized Western classics of science, logic and political liberalism (J.S. Mill, Adam Smith, T.H. Huxley, Montesquieu, Spencer). The enthusiasm for science reflects his conception of Daoism norm naturalism and science as the study of natural dào. This modern embrace of logic contrasts with the resistance to both the Buddhist and Jesuit logic, which Chinese intellectuals saw as attempting to justify non-naturalism (Kurtz 2011). Tied to natural science and pragmatic social-political thought, non-Confucian Chinese intellectuals had no difficulty in embracing logic and science as fully coherent with their historical naturalism.

Jin Yuelin (1895–1964) concentrated even more on formal logic combining it with his interpretation of Daoist dào as naturally possible course or process (Jin 2020). He completed the project of conceiving of Daoism as a philosophical research paradigm rather than the purely historical project of interpretation of Daoist texts. His students included Hao Wang and Yin Haiguang whose student Chen Guying has followed this conception of Daoism as an ethical stance which aligns it more with environmental ethics, Nietzsche’s perspectivism, creativity, open-mindedness and social-political tolerance and freedom (Chen et al. 2018). He advocated Daoist philosophy replacing Confucianism as the distinctive philosophical project of modern China.

Some modern logicians who embrace paraconsistent logic also associate that with Daoism (Priest and Garfield 2021; Tanaka 2004). That has plausibility but not because Daoism is contradictory. The ancient discussion did not revolve around semantic, epistemic Western conceptions of “true belief.” The target of learning and practice was know-how. The issues in contention were the social know-how of traditional social practices vs. proposals for reform guided by natural, cosmic dào. Its “logic” was navigating reality. The natural world guides how the region “under the sky” walks; in walking the world of living things changes its own natural dào (Zhuangzi 2:6).

2. The Dào Metaphor

The key feature of Daoist philosophical naturalism is the leading role played by the metaphor of walking a physical ‘path’ (道 dào). It contrasts with the similarly key Western focus on the contrast of laws and acts. See Mark Johnson (Lakoff and Johnson 1980; Johnson 1992) on the role of bodily metaphor, Donald Munro (1988), Chong Kim Chong (2006) and Edward Slingerland (2003) on Chinese metaphorical reasoning and Shelly Kagan (1992) on normative focal points).

A millennium before their classical era, the oldest Chinese classics told of the Duke of Zhou explaining the importance of virtuosity (德 dé virtue) in discerning the course of sky-nature (天 tiān Heaven) to the young prince of Zhou. His family’s mandate (命 mìng fated role) is guiding the social world (天下 tiānxià world under the sky) on a path that avoids natural disaster. He contrasts the precarious nature of his family’s claim to leadership with the Shang king’s human relations claim of being the living descendants of an “emperor above.” The presumed “permanence” of the Shang claim to authority led the Shang rulers to become careless and lead the world into natural disasters. Thus, constant sky-nature chooses a leading family with greater leadership virtuosity, better natural pathfinders.

This conception of social leadership eschewed rather than relied on supernatural, rational authority to create and publish syntactic laws. This chain of authority regress, the syntactic inference structure and the strong deontic modal force all make Western norm naturalism more of an intellectual challenge. The battery of historical Western arguments against ethical naturalism flow from logical structures linking normative laws to acts: “you can’t deduce ‘ought’ conclusions from ‘is’ premises.” China’s focus on path-like normativity made it less about “ought’s” and “duties” than openings, possibilities, and permissions (可 kě) and role responsibility for realization (然 rán making-so). That left the status of punishment in disrepute among the classical masters (albeit, extremely common and cruel in Ancient China). Still, it made norm naturalism both easy and intuitive.

Nature simply gives us possible/permissible openings for behaviors (可道 kědào), it’s up to us to choose and realize those possibilities. Our doing so is natural (自然 zìrán self-so). This ancient launch of this normative dialectic foreshadows the enduring Confucian-Daoist divide in Chinese thought. Both shared the path and virtuosity metaphor but the Ru-Mo focus on human paths and a distinctive human virtuosity, humanity (仁 rén benevolence). Confucians modeled behavior on sages, parents’ behavior, older siblings, and teachers. Confucius historicized the Shang afterlife hierarchy of guiding authority, turning it sideways from a spiritual afterlife to the natural history of past practice. Veneration of ancestors implies emulating their remembered behavior, yielding the Confucian stress on rituals and conventional mores. Daoist paths resemble more the paths of water (Laozi 8 & 78).

Few experiences are more universal for bipedal humans than identifying, choosing and walking on path-like natural structures. Confucius and Mencius, like the Daoists opposed punishment (Analects 13:3, Mencius IA:7). The authoritarian, Xunzi stands out here in recommending punishment (刑 xíng corporeal cutting, mutilating), reasoning mainly from traditional precedent, with slight nods to deterrence and proportionality of desert.

Western metaethical debates swirl around grammatical entities: laws (rules, principles), duties (obligations, ought), facts, truths, properties, and beliefs. These are hardly visible in Classical Chinese reasoning about nature and normativity. That is a rarely noted insight hiding behind the slogan that dào is not in words. Normativity is not about some authority’s actual or possible commands. What we collectively know and teach about permissible ways of behaving (kědào), convention and tradition, changes over time. Nature thus teaches us this axiom of Daoism—guiding dàos can themselves be guided (Laozi 1). We can follow a natural path of changing what we teach and learn about kědào. We also find such meta-paths in nature.

Mature Daoism begins with Zhuangzi’s response to the Later Mohist’s discovery of a reductio of careless early Daoist formulation of the insight that paths do not consist of words. It seemed to eschew language. The Later Mohists toyed with similar reductios of rejecting learning and of dissing (not-that-ing) not-that judgments. Zhuangzi accepted the logical force of those, then followed them to their logical conclusion. Natural dào includes as parts all the human dàos, those of communities, languages and social practices. Confucianism was a natural dào, but one among many.

Language and logic fit smoothly into Daoist nature. We can view things logically through a Daoist lens and we can say what we see. “Daoism cannot be understood rationally” logically expresses lack of (rational, communicable) understanding of Daoism. It is a permitted formula only for an irrational solipsist. While mature Daoism rejected Shen Dao’s fatalism, dào is a structure of both nomic and normative modality. Zhuangzi likens our commitment to a dào to walking or galloping momentum along a path (Zhuangzi 2:2). Metaphorically, the structure of what guides us is relativistic in the way physics is.

The law and dào metaphors have wide scope—they answer both practical normative and nomic questions. Dàos guide behaviors in an ongoing way. Properly followed, they tell you how to do what a law might simply tell you to do. Although dàos have a nomic causal role—dào gives rise to 10,000 natural kinds (Laozi 34, 39–40)—its “how” is a natural structure, not necessarily an explanation available to human understanding. There is a dào of the cosmos, but Daoism offers us no assurance we can comprehend or understand it. Science may be the best human dào for learning about nomic dào, but still leaves us saying “things happened some-‘how.’”

Dào is not a force, cause, or substance. It is the shape along which causal processes unfold. That shape comes from how past natural processes arranged things. Power may come from knowing-dào, knowing how to follow it. As the processes play out, things emerge and change. We may or may not be able to formulate a verbal description, but the process evolves naturally (自然 “of itself”).

The myriad natural-kinds have possible paths—ways the future may go for them. Those potential histories become actual when things “naturally” (自然 zìrán self-so, spontaneously) follow, realize or make-so one of their possible behaviors (Jin 2020). The parts of existing reality, the environment of which we are a part, are all composed of energy (氣 qì material energy, breath, stuff). Evolution is a causal dào mechanism that fills out this Daoist naturalist view; it does not conflict with it. Nature (including our own) unfolds to provide us with the capacities to exploit our environment.

Daoist normativity is more like navigation than obedience, loyalty, or purification. Its defining deontic modality is more like permitting, inviting, affording than the law metaphor’s obligating, requiring or forbidding. Epistemic normativity centers on learning and knowing how to, not believing and knowing-that. These normative stances contribute to Daoism’s pragmatic take on language use. Knowing an apple is something we do; we have learned how to distinguish apples from non-apples. We know-how to identify apples in our visual field—not how to have the phenomenal subjectivity, but how to bring apples to attentional consciousness. We acquire this ability along with learning how to pronounce and use the words in our local dialect and how to combine those skills in speaking and understanding each other.

The continuity with animate life makes Daoist normativity sensitive to environmental ethics, but not by being committed to animal rights, duties, or free will. Animals have their possible dàos, learn behaviors that help them choose and effectively pursue possibilities in their range of options. Daoism regards animals as choosing their paths, being better and worse at pursuing them, becoming better by learning, having social cooperation, and even rudimentary communication. It is not committed to anything like Western free will when it credits animals with role responsibility, e.g., of a mother pig, or a bee scout, and judging some members of a species normatively better than others.

Natural normative guidance is an external, empirical conception of norms. Norms evolve as all things practice, learn and improve at following their dàos. This adaptation includes their recognizing clues about the structure of their environment’s dàos. Within the Chinese philosophical framework, the divide between nature and nurture is more significant than the distinction between subjective phenomenal appearance and reality. The contrast between natural dào and social, human dào drives the Chinese epistemic dialectic. Our social learning accumulates over generations. Communities’ mores and conceptions of reality blend cooperative conformity with efficient learning, reform and evolution. Daoists would appreciate how twenty-first century science keeps discovering other parts of life on earth that have counterparts of choices, better and worse outcomes, and cultures that accumulate guidance.

Humans are distinctive in having more deliberate teaching (than, e.g., even meercats) and differ still more in their capacity to use rich, flexible languages in this teaching and learning. Learning and use in language communities magnifies the range of a plethora of other learned social practices. The distinctive important thing about humans is a magnified capacity for accumulation of know-how by adapting and evolving languages as tools used in collecting, sharing, organizing, and transmitting guidance.

When we use language, especially in learning how to choose or interpret dàos, we can draw attention to signs in situations that incline us toward a choice. In the West, we call those external signs reasons and with the discovery of the proof, the Greeks developed an elaborate theory of reasons. It yields a capacity to ask for and give reasons in premise-conclusion form. Modern Daoists have no reason to resist folding this Western scheme of responding to reality into the terminology of dào and lǐ. It embellishes rather than contradicts Daoism’s notion of human moral normativity. Reasons are the perceptible signs of dào, dàos of choosing and realizing dàos. Daoism’s natural normativity is continuous with other natural creatures’ know-how. The distinctive human capacity for logic embellishes nature’s process of choosing and following dàos.

The Daoist remembers that while language processing is an advanced tool of knowing how, nature distributes know-how throughout the body (體 tí body-part). Knowing how to make a knife out of stone involves muscle memory more than it does a capacity to recite any string of words aloud. Even knowing how to use language involves more than our cognitive faculty. Our tongues, larynx, eyes and hands also know how to speak our language.

Zhuangzi’s take-down of intuitionist Confucianism focuses on the guiding organ (心 xīn heart, mind) and recruits this corporate conception of how know-how spreads throughout the body. It rejects internal authority; It authorizes no Confucian homunculus as the decision maker for humans. No single organ is a zhēn (真 natural, authentic, true) ruler. We indeed choose, but we do not find any sign of authority (Zhuangzi 2:3). He does allow that the heart plays a role in the decision process but is itself shaped by past bodily decisions (learning and practice). The heart is neither incorrigible nor authorized to rule over the other organs of the body.

Larger parts composed of parts that are humans also choose paths for the group (ditto for other social animals). A family, a village, and a state can learn diverse ways of acting together, can practice and improve these ways and evolve different communal paths. This corporate conception of the body makes Daoist perspectival relativism different from individualist egoism. “Common” norms that emerge can persist because when they prove useful at that stage in our evolution (Zhuangzi 2:6).

Dàos can be dàoed; they are not constant. Names can be named; they are not constant (Laozi Ch. 1).

3. Cosmology: Physicalism and Science

Most accounts portray Daoism as cosmology rather than metaphysics. Unlike Buddhism, it does not address the mind-body problems that traditionally defined Western metaphysics: objective reality vs subjective conscious experience. Buddhism had addressed these issues but, somewhat paradoxically, had denied both the ego and mind-body dualism; Daoism’s (Chan-Zen’s) response is “let’s not talk that talk.” It refuses to waste time even denying idealism or solipsism: “I’m carving an ox here!”

Contemporary metaphysics does countenance naturalism as a part-whole metaphysics. Pre-Buddhist Chinese (Later Mohist) metaphysics seems similar (Hansen 1983). and Daoist cosmology is a generalization of that metaphysics (Banka 2023). Chinese naturalism, aside from the concept of dào, would strike Westerners as naïve, peasant natural wisdom. We are in a world with tens of thousands of nameable natural parts: mountains, trees, water, oxen horses, fish, and humans. These are parts of a single reality (有exist, to have). Their dàos are entangled; we and they walk our respective paths, our parts of nature’s dào. Dào, yǒu and thing-like parts ground this naturalist metaphysics. The names of “ten-thousand kinds” (萬物 wànwù myriad things) are cosmological details.

Thing-parts (體 tí) are not rationalism’s sentence-filling objects, i.e., subject-substances with predicate-properties. Chinese places things in their dào metaphor. A thing is any proper part (of the one) that has a dào. Monism means any part’s dào is part of nature’s dào. A part unfolds or evolves in ways dependent on the paths of other parts. No part is more real or basic than the natural universe itself.

The “I” (ego, self) is not a point substance, but a cluster of local perspectives on dào, our points of view on the possibilities open to us given the distribution of other parts. My point of view includes that of my family, my profession, my sports teams, my class, nation etc. On the other side, the parts of my physical form. My heart and lungs, veins and brains have their roles to play in my dào (Zhuangzi 2:3).

Cosmological theories of some evolutionary mechanism—whether it is Yin-Yang theory or biological inheritance or viral cultural memes—explain the emergence, change and disappearance of natural parts. Daoism is committed to paths of nomic (causal) possibility and open to many conceptions of their mechanism. Dào is not a force. It is the paths forces can travel. Dào gives rise to, sustains (guides), and eventually eliminates things. Evolution and cosmic inflation theory are paradigms of natural dàos, not laws. Evolution was possible, but not necessary, before inflation.

Ancient zǐ (masters) may not have known that sun (日 rì sun, day) refers to a huge sphere of hydrogen. They did accept a theory of language that links the character日 to that physical object through a social dào of its use. Dào refers to the course of nature whatever it turns out to be. The Yin-Yang school’s theory of things emerging from mixing Yin and Yang qì was their theory of dào.

Modern Daoists embraced Western science, but Daoism is a philosophy of naturalism, not of science itself. It doesn’t tell us about science but accepts that science is good-at telling us about dào. Science does not choose dàos but gives us what helps us choose well. Science also exemplifies the kind of social-cultural dào Daoism favors: non-authoritarian, self-correcting, open-minded and experimental. It is a better choice for teaching, learning, understanding, finding and following dàos than was either Yin-Yang theory or Buddhism.

Daoism does not treat either atoms or egos as ultimate building blocks. Natural dào guides all unfolding of parts of being. The metaphysical framework allows new things to emerge as other things self-realize their dàos (DDJ 17, 23, 25, 51, 64). This makes Daoist metaphysics resemble religion in assigning the source of normative guidance to something outside the ego, but not to a supernatural ego. It is not that the universe is a living thing, but that evolution is a cosmic model of natural change.

Human learning is a form of change. It starts from an internal path-like structure (理 lǐ lane, principle, coherence) that makes it possible to change itself to adapt to external daos in one’s environment—acquiring dé. Human epistemic and normative dàos emerge. It is not obvious precisely where the boundary of emergence from purely causal to normative-causal lies. The biosphere emerged from the interaction of parts of a larger cosmic reality which unfolds with little hint of the human normative guidance familiar in our lives. We do observe a surprising degree of gradualism with signs of guidance in other primates, living things and increasingly plants. In that greater dào, pan-norm-ism of a barely comprehensible sort may be possible. What we know is things change and human normative (dàoable) dàos emerge, change, and recede into the past.

Daoism is not metaphysically committed to materialism, though its cosmology was and is broadly physicalist. Classical Daoism relied more on the ancient concept of ether (氣 qì matter, air, breath, energy) than it did Zou Yan’s division of it into two types: Yin and Yang. Another traditional mechanism was the five processes (行 xíng walk:behavior), named after the elements that underwent them, fire, water, metal, air, and earth. Recognizing dàos of over 200 elements takes more natural perspectives into account. Abandoning traditional Chinese cosmology need not entail abandoning Daoist metaphysics. Dào made possible the emergence of a sphere of change (yǒu). Science is good at detailing how nature unfolds.

Daoism views existence (yǒu) and its probability structure (dào) as metaphysical givens. The cosmos (天地 tiāndì sky-earth) contains all yǒu and is bounded by nothing (無 wú lack) (Laozi 1). Things are in constant (space-time) mereological flux. Facts, but not natural kinds, are human constructions using the model of sentences of human language. Facts figure in semantics (truth, belief) and in epistemics (reason, sense experience) (Chen 2019).

Yǒu and dào are one and yet constantly changing as new realities (parts of yǒu and the relative parts of dào) emerge. Dào and yǒu overlap all of space-time but differ in the principles that restrict how they unfold in emergent parts (Banka 2023). Parts, things, include natural-kinds (物 wù), artifacts (器 qì tools, utensils, socially constructed things) and affairs (事 shì business, socially constructed processes). Those parts of being also have parts guided by parts of the larger dào of which they are parts.

Dào is the structure of possible histories of things. There are (yǒu have, exist) wood and feathers; yǒu bows and arrows; yǒu archery tournaments. For each part of reality to exist, there are parts of dào guiding their emergence, their normal course of being and their ending. Causation (possibility and probability) is rooted in these dàos, natural processes; human scientific understanding uses laws (descriptions of constant dàos) and deductive derivation of event (fact) causation. Skilled navigation of these humanly knowable causal courses of unfolding provides normative guidance.

Modern Daoists, notably Yan Fu, Hu Shi, Jin Yuelin, Yin Haiguang, Zhang Dainian and Chen Guying, were drawn to science and logic. Jin Yuelin translated his own use of qì as "stuff," not metaphysical “matter,” reinforcing Daoism’s purely monistic, mereological structure. His stuff is “empty” prior to its entering into concrete possibility, becoming a possible thing distinguishable from what is fēi—not that thing. The tradition treated light as one form of qì, because it travels in straight lines. Daoism need not presuppose any particular account of the stuff of nature, but it will have potential to unfold the lines of dào to constitute part of yǒu, a something that follows or realizes dàos of possibility.

Daoist perspectives on evolution emphasize finding and exploiting niches (dàos) in the environment. Daoist evolution meshes with the Chinese focus on social cooperation—Zhuangzi’s 兩行 following two dàos together (Zhuangzi 2:6). It’s less tied to the Western emphasis on competition and struggle for survival than on working together to gain and store knowledge of natural dàos. Evolution involves discovering natural paths of opportunity but without depicting nature as friend (the Mohist position) or enemy (the West). We do not lead or control evolution, but entangle ourselves with it as we learn and practice behaviors to navigate our environment.

4. Dào-dé Norm Pivots

The conceptual pivots of the Classical dào-following metaphorical gestalt shaped the mechanism for its understanding of natural guidance as norm causation. It frames Daoist metaphysics, epistemology and ethics. The central elements were:

  1. an external structure accessible for guidance, dàos;
  2. a “walker”; the external structure (a) guides the walker’s conduct/behavior (行 xíng walk:behave) and
  3. the internal capacity/virtuosity (德 dé) within (b) to use (a)’s structure to realize in real-time a behavior that follows that path through the environment.

The metaphorical elements can be seen easily in the ancient form of the character for dé (德) here:

The ancient Chinese character for capacity/virtuosity (de). The visual components of the character are described in the main text below.

Note that it metaphorically outlines the norm-following capacity by linking the three elements symbolically. The indexing component on the left, originally the left side of a crossroad-like graph, is also the left side of the character for behavior/conduct (行 xíng). The component on the top right is composed of an eye (目) and a line or crossroad. On the bottom right is the ancient Chinese graphic form of a heart (♡). Practiced learning stored in the heart interacts with information from the senses about external possibilities for learned behavior to fit that possibility.

The path metaphor had three implicit phases. One is knowing-of paths, becoming aware of a possibility for the exercise of a behavior. The second is choosing it—usually with a “This!” (是 shì) or a “Not-that!” (非 fēi) for other paths. Then we exercise some behavior to realize the possibility. Realizing it in our way is like musical or role interpretation. We interpret by walking (xíng) that path. We can evaluate that interpretation as good-at (善 shàn) or beautiful (美 měi). Ancient Ru-Mo use of the metaphor centered on human, socially constructed norms, mores and viewed humans as social, as pursuing cooperative behavior (massive public works like controlling the Yellow River’s flooding).

Zhuangzi’s later contemporary, Xunzi, elaborated the shared conception of heart’s guidance function more fully. The senses deliver the path information to the guiding organ (心 xīn heart, mind, heart-mind) in the form of distinctions (biàn 辯 analysis, argument, dispute) between differences (異 yì) marking the boundaries of a thing. The xīn also monitors internal moods (情 qíng feelings, facts, reality) that emerge internally reflecting the situation. The heart differentiates (辯 biàn distinguish) among them. These qing (attitudes) generate desires (欲 yù) for things. The Confucian Xunzi thought the desires were natural and irreducible; Mozi and the Daoists school treated only some as natural, others as also socially constructed using names. Eliminating those frees us from social domination of our desires and sensitivity to differences. Using this external and internally gathered information, the xīn issues normative permissible (可 kě may, can) and this-not that (是非 shì-fēi right-wrong) judgments evaluating paths as possibilities and initiating guided behavior (行 xíng walk, conduct) (Xunzi 22:2–5).

Daoism’s normative naturalism thus makes human morality a continuation of natural guidance as found in other things (Zhuangzi 12:8). The paths of inanimate things are possibilities of causal processes for them given their inherent inner processes (their 理 lǐ) which resonate with external possibilities and their adaptive virtuosities (dé). Learning typifies animal adaptations. It transforms their inner structure (whether by the evolutionary process or past practice). The interaction of the inner and outer in the unfolding of history results in their dé.

From water and wind to ants and bees, tigers and elephants, we understand this self-realizing (自然 zìrán natural) behavior in terms of the metaphor of finding and following paths. Human morality does not require a prior emergence of reasons or a Geist with a property of reason or faculty to engage in a process of reasoning. The capacity which both unites and separates humans from other things is learning-how. Where human learning takes a quantum leap is with the addition of social practices and languages. These which underwrites iteration of dào guidance—we can guide how natural dàos guide us.

The form of learning and of knowing is knowing-how. We don’t evolve language to express inner thoughts, but to facilitate learning, including learning to cooperate. The Ru-Mo treated the evolution of social cooperation as distinctively human; Zhuangzi seemed to sense how it runs through living things as does signaling to coordinate behavior to enhance group knowing-of and know-how. Our learning how stems from apprentice learning, typically on the school (家 jiā family) model.

Daoism sees language as continuous with maps, cairns, blazing trees etc. The use of pictographs and words emerges naturally in this socially cooperative species. Creature vocalization, found elsewhere, we recruit in training, practicing, planning and shared decision procedures. Modern Daoists would acknowledge the role of sentences, syntax and logic in this process and the surprising discovery that human model emulation values accuracy of mimicry over achieving an outcome. Hence our tendency to superstitions and religious rituals. While this enhances our tendency to transmit cultural forms and conventional practices and aesthetic styles, Daoists see it as leading to Ru-Mo dogmatism and speciesism. Thus, Daoists emphasize open-minded skepticism, and thinking outside the box. As one of the smaller group of cooperating creatures using intentional teaching and of even fewer whose learning accumulates across generations, we should suspect the value of elegant signaling, of symbolic commitments. We should recognize our own tendency to superstitious behavior and fondness for symbolic commitment. Daoism’s self-critical motivation for reform, however, still values aesthetic creativity for its own sake where the Mohists’ rejected it.

The path metaphor does give us a way to understand the emergence of reasoning. We can diagram the connectives of propositional calculus as paths—not-gates, and-gates, or-gates and if-then-gates. Path awareness also gives us a more objective conception of the theory of mind. The scientific mirror neuron phenomenon meshes easily with the dào-dé metaphor structure. We know what it is like to contemplate the paths available to others. We don’t need a counterpart of mind-reading to simulate their dé and estimate where they are walking.

The path metaphor would be less likely to invite the “fundamental attribution error” (explaining behavior by psychology rather than situation) (Nisbett and Ross 1980). Some comparative cultural psychologists have experimentally concluded that East Asians are less prone to the error (Mason and Morris 2010; Masuda and Nisbett 2001). The use of a path rather than a law metaphor as a normative focal point could play a role in explaining that result. Empathy is less a matter of mirroring another’s conscious state as is knowing how to navigate from another’s position and momentum in their environment, thus it guides us to avoid colliding even as we pursue separate goals. The path metaphor can invoke common dé to explain theory of mind simulation.

The most frequent translation of the nearest Chinese concept, “heart-mind,” invites misunderstanding by importing the Western spectator and container concept of ‘mind.’ It does reflect the important insight that a single organ, the brain, processes both belief and desire. Munro’s (2001) translation, “guiding organ” avoids the misunderstanding, removing the invitation to attribute the West’s “belief-desire” explanation of human action and agency. Chinese behavior theory commits them only to internal paths among the organs for processing sensory information and guiding behavior (walking). Zhuangzi allows that the heart functions in these decisions but denies its performative authority. Nature distributes expertise (know-how) through all the “hundred joints, nine openings, and six inward parts.” Still, he acknowledges the role of the heart’s reactive moods (qíng) that “pop-up before us day and night,” without which there would be no choosing and no “I.”

While sight dominates the metaphorical structure of the dé character, all the senses and feelings work together to guide behavior in the empirically sensed external environment. Hearing also plays a vital role. It’s especially linked to social dàos and figures centrally in coordinating behavior, whether in music, chanting or speech (Geaney 2010).

Although the dào-dé metaphor starts from the point of view of the human “I,” we naturally project it on inanimate objects but also on larger forms of life. Personification in China need only project on things a capacity to realize its possibilities, not inner conscious states. Families, communities, nation-states and species can be said to have know-how and cognitive achievement may be distributed in various ways among parts of the social unit. Non-human living groups may find, choose, and pursue paths—and have internal dàos of choosing and allocating in the process, e.g., quorum-sensing in ants, bees etc.

While Laozi suggests “normative” causation is similar in, e.g., water and other inanimate objects, it is part of his rejection of language and learning. Water is naturally “good at” finding its way (Laozi 8). However, when Shen Dao draws fatalistic conclusions from the metaphorical picture, the Zhuangzi marks the error as confusing human dào with the dào of dead things (Zhuangzi 33:4). The crucial difference is the ability to learn and know-how to find and follow dàos (how to walk). The inner process would be a dào-dé rather than a given material disposition (理 lǐ lane) resonating with possibility.

Daoist dé is not a free-standing inner source of absolute normative guidance. It results from past real-world practice. Ru-Mo’s use of the metaphor privileges a humanist virtuosity arising either from respect for models or teleological universal human well-being. Daoist’s is more open-ended and may evolve in directions we realize to be moral after we reform mores in diverse ways.

Ethics, dàodé, then is how we navigate the actual world. What is the scope of “we”? The Classical conception was all under the sky (天下 tiān xià). Daoist ethics easily embraces environmentalism; we are part of the world of living things and find, choose, and follow daos from that perspective as well as the other parts of which we are parts. Ethics is in the title (accidentally?) of Laozi’s classic, Dàodé Jīng canon-of-ethics. The compound became common toward the end of the Warring States philosophical period (Liu 2020). Dé was also frequently paired with walking (déxíng)—virtuoso path-following.

We find ethical guidance in the natural world. We can be better or worse at reading and following it. Chinese thought holds that education and practice helps. Daoists de-emphasize our particular (e.g., Chinese) traditional practice, any natural learning helps.

5. Norms, Mores & Morality

Norms are dàos woven into the fabric of nature by the past. Daoist conception of norms differs from the Ru-Mo in:

  1. They focus on natural and social dàos (norms),
  2. They are skeptical of authority and speciesism (humanism), and
  3. They reflect from a detached perspective on the Ru-Mo moral dispute.

Daoism has a more broadly naturalist conception of the emergence of norms. Cosmic history wears dào-like structures in the distribution of stuff into things. The parts of dào guiding natural living creatures are those knowable by them. Their walking these paths of possibility wears them into the natural and/or social environment. As dàos and their practitioners evolve, the paths become and deeper, wider and more attractive ways and the practitioners become more adept at following them. Dào, thus, constantly changes, evolves as do the things following dàos.

Confucians and Mohists called their social paths ritual (禮 lǐ decorum, ceremony). The role players shaped by them and capable of following them have a named status. The group followed its moral norm when the performers followed the norms for their named role well (善shàn good-at). Confucius analogized the performance to artistic group performance, paradigmatically a musical entertainment (樂 lè/yùe joy, pleasure music). Confucius’ was an aesthetic conception of mores and etiquette with faint (but persistent) echoes of their religious heritage (Hall and Ames 1987). The goal of the performance was its inherent beauty, not obeying the afterlife ancestors of the Shang. The religious focus persisted in its ineliminable reliance on a maestro leader, the sage or authoritative gentlemen. His judgment was the standard of teaching and reform and coordination of players.

Mohists jettisoned this form of authority and the aesthetic focus and blended the evolved religious attitude toward natural social norms with a “natural” goal (天志 tiānzhì sky-nature will) of universal human well-being. This dào utilitarianism (Hansen 1989) justified reforming past practice and could appeal to a more epistemically objective (measurable) and universal standard (Mozi 9B:2). This reduced but could not eliminate the reliance on authority—in organizing and evaluating the process of reform and in following the humanist benefit standard. The philosophically interesting feature of Mohist utilitarianism is its focus on social mores, rather than rules or acts. We behave according to social mores that society actively chooses and that evolve in use guided by utilitarian measurement standards.

This dispute had classical masters focused on mores and meta-dàos. The Mohists called the target of their reform process morality (義 yì righteousness, duty, right). Individual guidance was correct practice of the reformed mores and participating in the reform process. Their meta-dào was sky-nature’s objective standard: universal utility. This forced Confucians into a defense with an alternative two-tier account of morality, i.e., correct mores (lǐ). The individual follows a “correctly rectified” traditional system of rituals. One wing of Confucianism relied on scholar authority and another on “cultivated” intuition to mount this defense. Their respective meta-dàos also came into play in the interpretation phase, resulting in individual dàos of performing a ritual-music role well.

Ru-Mo agreed in calling the successful (成 chéng mature, complete) project of reform morality (yì). They further agreed on the internal dé that chooses the reform: humanity (仁 rén benevolence, conscientiousness). The Mencius wing amounts to virtue utilitarianism so began to emphasize that rén was rooted and learned first in filial concern and only gradually and in grades becoming universal humanism. Other natural creatures were not the proper objects of sympathy or compassion. Nature, Xunzi argued, intended humans to dominate and enslave animals. They began to construe their disagreement with Mozi as universal vs. partial love (愛 aì favor, prefer).

Confucians depicted Mozi’s universal humanism as more authoritarian than their own. Mozi did rely on a natural master (天子 tiānzǐ Son of Heaven). All the philosophers of the period were called zǐ and Mozi portrayed the social world selecting the natural master by unanimous acclamation that he was “wisest and best.” The natural master immediately announced he was epistemically not up to the task. So, he selected the “next best” as helpers. Similarly, they pled ignorance and selected the third best and so on down to the bottom of the social hierarchy.

Then they consulted those on the bottom for their judgments of this and not-that. These first-order moral judgments were then “synthesized” by the selected authority at the next level up and reported up the chain, with each synthesizing (somehow?) the moral judgments and reporting these up the chain of wise men until the natural master ultimately synthesized the final set of norms. Then everyone followed that system of social mores. Mozi averred that the result would coincide with the this/not-that judgment of nature (tiān), i.e., utilitarian social mores.

Both the selection of the master initiating the reform process and the reliance on first-order normative judgments suggest a tilt toward a democracy of moral construction cum judicial appeal. The residual reliance on authority involved a) sky-nature itself, which Mozi claimed willed (zhì) the utility standard, and b) the universally acclaimed hierarchy of judges doing the synthesizing of differing moral opinions reported from below. Mozi endorsed punishment for those refusing to participate in the process.

The output was a shared, reformed morality and we all accept its this’s and not-that’s. The democratic component was merely a computational device to make every human judgement count equally. There would no longer be moral disagreement and the humanly constructed moral dào would guide us all. Mozi had no theory of popular sovereignty conferring a right to command society at large!

Daoism responded to this dialectic by embracing both perspectives, seeing Mohism as a sound improvement, but rejecting the demanding imperial utilitarian morality. It reflects on how to pursue the dialogue to a naturalistic conclusion. Their skeptical relativist position emerged in two phases. The first eschewed talk of both social mores and morality in favor of physical paths in the broader natural environment with the path and virtuosity of water a model of navigating the natural environment. Famous hermits in literature avoided all social entanglements. Laozi interpreted naturalism as excluding human dàos and concluded we should avoid learning words and language along with other socially valued objects and status roles.

The second, mature phase of Daoism associated with Zhuangzi emphasized that humans were as natural as nature’s other living creatures. Human speech is as natural as other natural sounds; practice weaves human social arrangements into the structure of natural dào. He pushed Mozi’s first-order democracy to its logical conclusion. No one has the wisdom to say what is moral or what words to use. We “vote for” our dào by walking it. The outcome is a naturally evolving society and language.

The upshot is that nature is not a normative authority for mature Daoism in the way it was for Mohism. The guide for choosing and interpreting norms is also one of many possible dàos for the tasks. We naturally interpret and practice our own society’s social norms in various ways, various ways of choosing and practically interpreting, walking each iterative way. As we do, the way is constantly changing. Dào can be dào-ed (Laozi 1:1).

As humans walk their norms in different ways, they wear small variations into their physical and social environment thus changing the guiding structure. The normative guides were multiple existing, evolving paths through space-time. Zhuangzi’s skepticism is famous, but it is seldom noticed that Mozi’s natural masters, the “wisest and best in the world of living things” knew they did not know how to rectify mores into morality. Zhuangzi simply takes the point seriously--neither he nor anyone else was in a privileged position to select behaviors for all living things. Each must be its own judge in each situation.

His emphasis, in contrast to Laozi’s purely physical nature (e.g., water), was on other forms of life with a live appreciation of how each was somehow capable of finding, choosing and following dàos in their local situation from their individual perspective. That appreciation emerges as curiosity and open-minded engagement, fantasy dialogues, in which he asks the natural thing for its own account of its own know-how.

The earlier phase of Daoism could not survive the Mohist reductio of its implicit rejection of language. Zhuangzi’s mature naturalism avoided both species-favoring humanism and self-defeating quietism. We cannot fairly accuse Zhuangzi of opposing morality. Zhuangzi’s posture allowed him to be a realist moral skeptic. Neither he, nor anyone else is in a position to know the right dào for everyone. It does not entail moral nihilism; moral construction may converge on one or several fully evolved moralities.

The result explains Zhuangzi’s seeming backtracking from primitive Daoism’s hermit-like withdrawal from social structures. He permits following the usual, the communicable, and thus the useful. Conforming to social norms enables one to coordinate with others, to “walk two paths,” to be in harmony (和 hé peace) with others. Social norms create legitimate expectations in others and following them allows us to maximize the range of joint cooperative behaviors we can choose. This is the serious, but non-authoritative naturalist response to the Confucian-Mohist moral dialectic.

This allows mature daoism to the read the first line of the Laozi in a grammatically accurate way. Dàos can be dào-ed. They are not constant dàos.

6. Metaphysical Implications

The Metaphysics implicit in Chinese naturalism in general resembles process philosophy (Hall and Ames 1987). Dào is neither a force or a causal agent, but the structure of causal possibility which entangles all things. As nomic dào unfolds, normative dào emerges as natural human dào.

Daoists emphasize the unity of cosmic process; though it has parts, there is one cosmic dào—the dào of space-time. Humans impose object permanence on proper parts of the cosmos. To those we assign a dào, a part of cosmic dào. Cosmic process surrounds, permeates and entwines with the processes of living things. Life emerges in the cosmos; humans and their groupings emerge from a living biosphere. Daoist norms emerge from and entangle with modally possible natural processes.

Chinese naturalism needn’t treat our natural cognitive ability to pick out objects from the “blooming, buzzing confusion” of reality as suggesting objects are unreal. It neither equates reality with permanence nor treats objects as combinations of permanent components, one material the other abstract or ideal. Objects are parts of reality with dàos that are part of dào. This changes with the 2nd C introduction of Buddhism. It introduces the rational-sensible (emotive, impressionist) split but Buddhism itself was skeptical about the mind-body distinction and the ego. What emerged was a more psychologized picture. Each part had an internal dào (lǐ lines, lanes) guiding its possible virtuosities (dé) and its role in environmental dào.

This analysis of Daoist metaphysics has emerged recently. Rafal Banka (2023) draws on naturalistic theory from modern Western metaphysics, mereology, to explain Daoist monism. Mereology is the study of part-whole relations that is “perfectly understood, unproblematic, and certain” (Lewis 1991). One version Schaffer (Schaffer 2007) calls “priority monism”. Parts emerge, function, and disappear in the structure of a singleton whole.

The stuff of mereology’s dào-like structures is space-time. Things (parts of being) occupy a 4-dimensional space-time region (Markosian 2004; Sider et al. 2008). Banka proposes to understand Daoist commitments to dào and existence (有 yǒu having) using restrictions on possible compositions. At one extreme are maximal restrictions typified by reductive atomism. The only ontological reals are simples, particles (logical atoms, quarks) and irreducible quanta of space-time. Humans, tables, houses, and villages are fictional because they include gaps and spaces between ultimate simples. At the opposite extreme is unrestricted composition (UC) ignores all such gaps and treats any combination of parts as a thing, so Gam Tin village plus an aerosolized particle of Donald Trump’s hair spray may constitute a thing. Maximally restrictive mereological monism would say the only ontological real is Shen Dao’s Great Dào.

This allows Banka to expand on a prior hypothesis that Classical Chinese monism is best understood as a part-whole naturalism (Hansen 1983; Robins 2000; Fraser 2007; Graham 1985). Banka’s approach can be expanded to relate other key concepts figuring in the Laozi’s cosmological outline: terms (名 míng words/names), existence-non-existence (有無 yǒuwú having/lacking) the cosmos (天地 tiān-dì sky-earth:world), the universe (宇宙 yǔzhòu space-time) (Graham 1978), and the ten-thousand kinds of things (物 wù natural-kinds, objects, things). Where Western mereology speaks of composition and restrictions on which compositions count as objects, Daoist mereology reaches its result using dàos of decomposition, of distinctions (biàn) into parts which count as natural object-kinds, including human social things. Dào is the natural structure along which being unfolds as parts emerge into existence along with their parts of dào.

Natural kinds emerge as structural parts in an environment. Boundaries (辯 biàn distinctions) divide the structures composed of this and not that (是非 shì-fēi right-wrong). (The Laozi avoids this Mohist vocabulary but gets the same result focusing on opposites. The Zhuangzi, by contrast, focuses on both biàn and shì-fēi.) The proper parts of existence count as objects or things insofar as we also treat them as having dàos. The boundaries, biàn, might be vague and there may be biàn that humans cannot register, although as science develops measures (fǎ), we discover new things and their dàos which enable us to distinguish this from not-that.

As dào unfolds in time and space, a dào of life emerges in a region. Physics structures a region with possible dàos through which various forms of life might emerge. Life forms, following those dàos spread across the region between sky and earth. Existence is temporally and spatially restricted; change is constant.

Science studies this natural structure. Daoists were always inclined to downplay the significance of human life in the cosmos, so its embrace of evolution was not a revolution in thought, but was an inspiring elaboration of their simple natural system. Given the times, they resonated to the “struggle for survival” theme in popular 19th C accounts, but the Daoist focus was always on the environmental niche, the naturally open possibility (kě dào 可道 permissible way) for things to emerge—if only temporarily.

The story of life is the dào narrative of which the story of humans is a part. The region of life afforded an opening, an invitation to the animal form that is human life. We depend on an environment of other natural kinds, from multi-cellular plants to our nearest relatives, our prey as well as our predators. Eventually humans emerge with their lǐ and their dé, making them good at exploiting the dàos in nature.

This is how modern Daoists such as Yan Fu could view evolution of species as paradigm of Daoist naturalism. The species that structure an ecosystem structure it with dàos through which other species emerge and disappear. Dàos change. It is popular, but not necessary, to portray this as a Chinese organic model of the entire natural universe. The core Daoist structure of ways, capacities to follow them in unfolding behavior, however, does not require thinking of minerals and atoms as alive. Collections of things are also things with collective dàos. There are dàos of families, prefectures, linguistic regions, states, all species and of life itself.

A modern Daoist, Jin Yuelin, argues explicitly for this kind of picture. Dàos for things are opportunities or possibilities created by the structure of all the other parts of being in larger and larger wholes. His “dào-one” is the improper part that is identical with that whole and dào-infinite are all the proper parts. They form the structures of possibility for all the proper parts of existence (yǒu). The myriad dàos for parts of existence are parts of dào-one. There is no external structure, nothing outside of dào one.

The picture is also Guo Xiang’s, and copied in Buddhist terminology in Hua Yan Buddhism. Ziporyn proffers a way to fold traditional oxymorons into this “unproblematic” natural dào. Let’s understand lǐ (internal lanes) as materially “coherent” (Ziporyn 2012) with dào on analogy to gear systems or to wave coherence. Given the convention of using lǐ to translate Western Rationalist terms like ‘reason’, ‘principle’, and ‘theory,’ we can explicate the sense in which “boundless” dào (Walker 2019) cannot be understood rationally. It means Jin’s “dào-one” has no lǐ of its own. Its lǐ is the sum of the lǐs of all its parts. Science can theorize about its parts as adapting to their context. Dào-one has no context, so it follows the self-realization (自然 zìrán natural) of all its parts (Laozi Ch. 25).

Our moderately permissive restriction on Daoist mereological decomposition simplifies folding the dàos of living things, animals, humans, priests and philosophers into natural dào. Natural and human (social) kinds are parts with their respective natural dàos. Chinese count horse and ox among things (物 wù). Both evolved into inviting environmental niches (dàos) that emerged with the unfolding of natural (tiān) dào. Likewise, humanity and all its social groupings. As parts of humanity, their social dàos constitute part of the dào of human life.

Socially constructed things, e.g., forks, chopsticks, and sake cups have both social and natural dàos. They would not exist without the social practices in which they are implements (器 qì tools, weapons) but they still follow natural daos, e.g., of gravity. Interactive behaviors (事 shì affairs) like paying a bill, marriage, and winning at chess are parts of a social structure that affords numerous ways of performing dàos. A thing’s dào is how it emerges, how sustained until some-how (like foot-binding) it disappears.

The possibility map of the cosmos changes as each thing, each proper part, realizes one of its possibilities and leaves others unrealized. Jin’s naturalistic conception of dào includes facts among the things with a human component (Chen 2019). They are not “socially constructed” in the sense that human conceptions control the unfolding of natural dào. The unfolding happens, then human measurement and syntactic structure makes knowing about it generally accessible in the form of theory, laws and logic. Daoism rejects fatalism (Zhuangzi 33:4) but is non-committal on determinism and no theory of free-will. We build our capabilities with learning and practice and, though there surely are things that are beyond us, usually we can do things better.

Human “facts” are not the sentences of any particular historical linguistic community, particularly not of the scientific community since its dào is one of denying that kind of authority. That even flawless application of its method may fail to discern truth is the key to its zìrán self-correction and echoes the Zhuangzi (2:12) on humanist methods. Mozi’s advocacy of relying on fǎ (measurement standards) hints at the key to this “Quasi-objectivity” (Gibbard 1990). We can learn and know how to use devices to query nature about a distinction or discrimination assuring consistency across linguistic communities.

Although training can increase accuracy in the use of measurement devices, most humans can operate them to arrive at nearly the same answer. We accept the norms of science even as working scientists treat them as hypotheses. Scientific consensus makes the concept of human facts useful in a broadly cooperative system of collecting, preserving, and accessing information about the structure of natural dào. Knowing this structure can make us aware of dàos we did not know and give us dàos of teaching, learning and practicing how to navigate them. Modern Daoist naturalists’ embrace of science is choosing a far-better human dào for this purpose than traditional (e.g., Yin-Yang) theory.

7. Implications for Normative Linguistics

Daoist metaphysics informs its theory of language. The second line of the Laozi parallels the first: “names can be named; they are not constant names.” From that to Yan Fu and Jin Yuelin’s embrace of Western logic and science, Daoist have seen language as evolving, not fixed. That attitude was implicit in the Classical view of language as part of human dào. In outline, it resembled the direct-reference, conventional-historical view that Plato rejects in the Cratylus while motivating his idea theory. Saul Kripke revived it as the “modern theory of reference” (Kripke 1980). In the Confucian version the “coiners” were ancient sages. They created names for things. Confucians the names and the social practice roles figured centrally in Confucian social practices, rituals (禮 lǐ ceremony, decorum, manners) which also derived from those sages.

The implicit norms of language, the dàos of using words, was to emulate one’s teacher. Learning was the link in a causal chain of use from the sage coiners. The teachers’ dào was to accurately model the way they learned to use the word to students. The norm of fidelity, respect for tradition, elders and teachers flowed with this normative theory of naming. Language was a paradigm of social practices. The crucial step to philosophy was Mozi’s argument that we can improve conventions, including language. His initial proposal was a crude form of language utilitarianism (Hansen 1989), the more carful formulation of his students incorporated the “utility” of consistency with the past and of measurement.

The early, primitivist, phase of Daoism rejected language: Shen Dao, on the basis of his extreme Monist metaphysics, rejecting all distinctions, Laozi, on the basis that socially constructed things create artificial desires for those things, e.g., money and status. Competition for these leads to disputes and war (Hansen 1992). This early quietism generated the paradox highlighted by these later Mohists (Canon II:172).

Zhuangzi refined the mature Daoist position, noting that like other tools with social uses, coordinating behavior with sounds, signaling was natural; the real issue between the humanists was which of the plethora of possible natural human languages to use in coordinating a scheme of rituals—social behaviors.

However, Zhuangzi saw Mozi’s proposal as leading to an impasse. A measurement might give us greater objectivity in determining how much utility (利 lì benefit, yield) but could not determine if utility was the only relevant measure. The Confucians reacted by rejecting use of the term and appealing directly to morality (yì). Given one consequence of the Mohist proposal, skimping on funeral expenses for one’s parents, Confucians concluded measuring utility was immoral.

Further, any measurement would presuppose an interpretation of utility—including the value of music and dance or only basic goods. The way of solving both impasses seemed to require an embedding of dàos in a hierarchy. There must be dàos of choosing and interpreting dàos. The complexity of the project of reforming language and other social norms made him skeptical that anyone knew how to complete it—including himself.

Zhuangzi’s implicit meta-dào was natural evolution with all users adapting their usage from their perspective and in their situation. Language, he argued, was ultimately grounded in user-relative terms like this and that. A choice of this and not that was a designation, initiating a use. “Language is not mere exhaling. Language says something, but what it says is never fixed” (Zhuangzi 2:4).

Shen Dao’s prescriptive eschewing of this and not-that usage and Laozi’s normative “wú-wéi” slogan were not only paradoxical, but they were also baldly unnatural for creatures like us. However, Zhuangzi’s mature Daoism could share in de-sanctifying conventional usage and could embrace liberation from conventional arrangements that no longer fit our situation while still recognizing that cooperation is beneficial. Our situation and perspectives include the established arrangements.

Zhuangzi avoided early Daoism’s over-correction. Mozi’s reformed social structure was neither more nor less natural (tiān) than Confucian tradition. It was another natural possibility. A new part of dào emerges for us when we construct a linguistic community—a part of natural possibility (Dào) we naturally (zìrán self-realize) construct.

Zhuangzi, rather than drawing the no-social-dào conclusion, revels in the freedom afforded by the plethora of different constructable human ways. The range of possibilities and the attractiveness of various alternatives is a function of our current trajectory and position along a previously chosen social dào. The self in self-realize is a perspectival self, not a substantive one. Any part of humanity, a person, family, village, culture, or species is somewhere on a trajectory along a path choosing its next branch. Linguistic communities are on a branching path of possibilities shaped by its current walking (行 xíng behavior) along a path of possibility it committed to in the past. The further choices are branches off this path.

Zhuangzi thus accepts the value of conforming to the “usual” language here-now while pointedly withholding the judgment it simply is correct (Zhuangzi 2:8). His this-ness is indexed—it is the better choice here, now, for us. Our choices are from here, now, given our current behavioral motivations, commitments and capacities. Still, many choices remain--neither none nor one. There is one probability map of the universe, but it maps uncountably many possibilities for many proper parts.

Natural paths are information structures in the natural environment that living things can find and follow. There is a gradation, but not a strict dualism, between those that are and are not learned, that are and are not conventional. We make physical paths, Zhuangzi points out, by walking them (practice). Social paths are entangled with the social practice of language norms and these information structures provide us with guidance that we can use in navigating our lives.

Conventional linguistic guidance as such need not impair our capacity to read and execute non-linguistic natural ways. It might be if the formulae are rather less permissive (可 kě assertible, possible). That would occur, for example, when we limit color distinctions to the conventional list of five colors (Laozi 12). A scheme of eight or twelve colors is a better possibility than one with a mere five. The essence of Zhuangzi’s correction is that rather than rejecting all color schemes we consider increasingly flexible ones. Appreciating the multiplicity of possible human conceptual schemes means learning any one is compatible with wanting to improve it, to amplify rather than regiment our natural capacity to distinguish the parts of reality relevant for sharing guiding information with each other.

Humans are distinctive in our capacity to evolve and shape our different norms of communication. Notoriously, other animals communicate. Their communicative capacities are more limited in structure and use than in humans. Bees’ waggle-dance can guide the hive to food or nesting sites, but their “language” is relatively “hard-wired.” Neither they nor ants are free to innovate, teach and learn new communicative norms. Human language ability equips us to treat our language (our names) as themselves objects of choice. Daoism is not committed to an ideal language but remains open to revising language and adapting it to facilitate natural guidance—"dàos can be dàoed and names can be named” (Laozi 1:2).

While the classical Chinese conception of a community’s language included a counterpart of reference/denotation, it functioned more explicitly in the context of learning and knowing-dào than in believing or knowing-that. A sign, a name, can help us identify a path, but guidance comes from the path. “Keep left” as an instruction only gives guidance relative to an external path which may branch both ways. In this way, knowing-dào is unlike linguistic commands (rules, laws or principles). It doesn’t immediately enmesh us in the logic of syntactical relations between a law and a fact—an event or action. Reference in the Chinese philosophical context was the knowing-of part of knowing-how. Even Mozi’s use of measurement in knowing-of a thing involved knowing-how to use the measurement tool. Knowing-of (e.g., by naming) triggers a behavior and helps orient that behavior.

Until Buddhism arrived knowing language did not involve mental intermediates such as ideas, meanings, intensions, or other mental language symbols. We learn using the capacity to recognize a shape in either a written Chinese character, a picture, and reality. We learn it by following the model and speech behavior of others in the community.

The Daoist open-minded attitude toward evolving languages emerged in its openness to exploring the first import of a “Western” spectator and container metaphor of mind. Buddhist “mind-only” idealism made information come only the form of sense data and concluded that the apparent structure of the real-world possibilities embodied by learning and practice was an illusion. Buddhists concluded we should renounce language and life.

A smorgasbord of paradoxes accompanied this nothingness (Nirvana) goal. The paradigm was the paradox of desire—the desire for Nirvana prevents us from achieving it. Laozi’s insight paved a way to escape the paradox. The desire for Nirvana comes with Buddhist metaphysical language, learning the contrasting pair, Nirvana/Samsara (the cycle of reincarnation). Forgetting the terms, the distinctions and Buddhist metaphysics enables us to cease desiring Nirvana and return to life—“carrying water and chopping wood.” “There’s nothing much to Buddhist teaching!” (Feng and Bodde 1937)

The Zen (禪 Chan) result blended Buddhism with Daoism and limited the no-language, empty mind to exercises of highly skilled practitioners of various arts whose focus is on the way rather than the concepts used in acquiring it (Zhuangzi 3:1). Buddhism introduced syntactic concepts which repurposed lǐ (lanes) as principles and authentic (真 zhēn natural as opposed to artificial, social) as truth. It included an epistemic version of Greek syllogism but, purposed to motivate Buddhist anti-realism, remained a niche concern. Ditto for Jesuit 17th C. syllogistic logic which Chinese intellectuals viewed as verbal sophistry to spread their religion of a ruler of sky-nature (天主 tiānzhǔ Catholic God)—akin to Classical sophistries such as “White horse not horse.” When logic came packaged with a naturalist dào of evolutionary change (and western military might) in the 19th C, Yan Fu’s enthusiasm for it was contagious.

Sentence syntax and logical form were clearly parts of the dàos of language use, ergo of human dàos. This was especially true of quasi-objective measurement-based descriptions which all human languages can express and from which we can derive agreed logical conclusions. Jin Yuelin’s Daoist treatment of Russell’s logical positivism departed mainly on this point. Facts (true declarative sentences) are real human things. However, the world consists of its thing-parts and their dàos. Facts, like other human tools, have both natural and human dàos. Our measuring tools are human things, but they are ways of letting nature judge and thus produce quasi-objective results across diverse human groups.

The norms of scientific language emerged as the intersection of skilled use of tools of measurement and information in a structure that invites similarly reliable logical and mathematical processing. This makes the information recorded as facts available in compressed axiom format and removes reliance on performative authority. Efficient storage and easy access support cooperative accumulation of information. Compared to known alternatives, the social dào with the language-use norms of modern science is a preferrable dào of constructing a system of sharing information among humans. This left Jin able to affirm a correspondence theory of truth relating propositions to facts.

Some modern logicians have associated Daoism with paraconsistent logic. Graham Priest et. al. motivate this as allowing the paradoxical, anti-language formulations in Daoism and Buddhism (Deguchi et al. 2021; Priest and Garfield 2021). Koji Tanaka, however, is more consistent with mature Daoism’s naturalism and promotion of scientific method. Sometimes our best way to collect, process and use information may involve using two theories that technically are in contradiction, e.g., relativity and quantum mechanics. Paraconsistent logics allows us to hold both that the contradiction is false without trivially “exploding” logic—allowing us to prove any absurdity. We can leave the contradiction in place and go on gathering and processing information about the natural world. We rule out only using the contradiction in further logical inference (Tanaka 2004).

Our lives are limited; knowledge (natural guidance) is unlimited. To pursue the unlimited with the limited is dangerous (Zhuangzi 3:1).

8. Implications for Epistemology

The dào metaphor shaped Classical Chinese conceptions of knowing as pragmatic. The Confucian model of master-disciple training emphasized learning as increasing one’s virtuosity at some skilled real-world behavior. It did not pivot around the West’s knowledge versus belief dichotomy. The empirical component was not sense-data, but practice. Experience was “undergoing” not an inner movie. The senses and internal states were involved, but the whole body knows how to walk a path.

When we learn to do something, information stored in natural branching path-like structures—dàos of possibility—guides us. Our social histories construct paths of permissibility by which we find, choose, and follow natural paths. Intertwined with these are daos of sharing path relevant information. All of these, including the permissible use of words and structured strings turns on a learning amplified natural ability to distinguish X from not-X. The classical version of a simple “belief” grammatically resembled English de re beliefs. We recognize an indexical this or that as X or not-X. Daoist epistemology focused on the social categories available and the ways we knew to invoke them in processing and sharing practical information. A “belief” consists of assigning a term (名 míng name) to some contextually distinguishable object.

This blended with overall topic-comment larger structure of Classical Chinese in which the expression of the subject term was optional in either indicative or prescriptive voice. And we intuitively read reference to another’s propositional knowledge as possessive—he knows the horse’s quick(ness). So, the range of issues that would generate belief-knowledge discussions became matters of mastery of the social norms of category distinction, recognition, and communication.

De re belief could be wrong either because the person used the word incorrectly or failed to perceive the distinction between X and not-X. The social dào normative orientation continues to shape epistemological discussion until the import of Buddhism. The focus of skepticism was on both cultural and indexical relativity. We change our social dàos as we apply them in different situations, from different perspectives. The perspectives include the type and quality of training and practice in following a social dào. It ties individual subjectivity to a physical history of how we arrived here now facing this branch in our dào, not to an ego-self.

So rather than true vs. false claims, beliefs, assertions, statements etc., Daoist epistemology deals with this not-that and permissible or not judgments of courses of behavior, including speech behaviors (assertible or not). The Daoist suspicion of social practices is more central than worries about illusion. It lurks behind the early skepticism that all word use is bad and the mature Daoist celebration of the plethora of natural linguistic possibilities. Mature Daoist skepticism derives from the practical impossibility of surveying all and the suspicion that some of the choices may be multiply decidable. Perfection is beyond our natural reach. Some can be de re classed as better than others following available dàos of evaluation. This open-ended recursion is a behavior we routinely engage in but our “lives are limited; and knowing-how is unlimited.” (Zhuangzi 3:1)

Mature Daoism is also skeptical that we can draw any precise distinction between human and natural dàos. Confucians treat father-son and ruler-minister as equally natural human relationship structures. Daoists are less enamored of ruler-minister arrangements. Buddhists treat dreaming and being awake as indistinguishable. Daoists would treat that as a natural distinction (e.g., widely shared among diurnal animals) and accept that sometimes we sleep and dream that we are dreaming and awake sometimes wonder if we are. There are still normally straightforward ways of discerning if we are asleep or awake, except for hyper-phantastic dreamers. But learning (internal practice) can go on in dreams or in imagination and planning.

Dreaming plays a different role in Daoist epistemology. It becomes a metaphor for how our changing point of view can get better as our knowledge progresses (Zhuangzi 2:12). “Waking up” is seeing from a new perspective. We do not have a subjective inner world whose structure we project on reality; it is “out there.” Zhang Dongsun, the premier Chinese student of Western epistemology treated this as the key difference between Chinese and Western metaphysical outlooks (Rošker 2012). The dào possibility structure might be beyond our full understanding, but we are part of it, emerged from it and reflect one of its possibilities—the emergence of knowing creatures. Jin Yuelin similarly argued that the classic problem of induction requires assuming a metaphysical order and our inner coherence with it (Zinda 2012). This surprising epistemological role for dreaming results from the focus on a shared human discourse dào (Hansen 1992). We know how to find, choose and follow some natural and most human, ways.

Otherwise, Daoist epistemology of the senses resembles naïve realism (aka neutral monism). We see, hear, feel, taste, smell, and experience the distinctions that are in the natural world. Our senses can make some, but not all the distinctions that mark natural kinds and things with natural dàos. Our human social practice of science enables us to use tools to measure others. “Experience” remains whole-body practice of learned skills (know-hows), realized in the context of natural paths of opportunity (dàos), realized from here (自然 zìrán). Our knowledge can always improve and increase as we broaden our range of perspectives (Sturgeon 2015). We needn’t assume a perfect perspective from nowhere/everywhere.

Social implements, like words and language, exist relative to both natural and social dàos. A knife is a knife because some natural being has a practice of cutting, but it is also a physical object following natures dào of inertia. A socially relative behavior such as buying a sandwich uses paper, metals, or electronic paths that follow natural dào. Science is a pan-human social dào of gathering, storing, arranging, sharing and accessing information about both the natural and social worlds. In science, we arrange these in syntactic sentential and argument forms, axiomatic theory structures. Daoism implicitly conforms to Lewis’s ability hypothesis about knowing propositions (Lewis 1988). Large scale scientific narratives such as evolution, inflation and multi-verse theory are dàos, historical narratives of us and other species. The information about our bodies and environment informs our social and individual programs for the entire range of recognized performances, from music to sports and philosophical ethics.

As Tanaka argued (Tanaka 2004), we cannot be sure our logical and mathematical language practices for these descriptive purposes are complete and consistent. Daoists are not idealist rationalists and do not have a religious faith in these methods. Daoism is naturalism, not scientism. The philosophical Daoist project is not oxymoronic, but neither is it exploded by discovering paradoxes in our human dàos of learning about nature’s dào.

The Daoist text is nature and we read nature in the language of logic, measurement, and mathematics, the language of science. Human construction is only one of the ways nature constructs new dàos (i.e., new dàos emerge). Large animals create paths to water and grazing areas and water itself creates dàos which humans and fish, bears etc. may follow. With humans, at least, one emergent guiding path is morality. It emerges from the recursive complexity of the path-metaphor of guidance, ways of finding, choosing, and interpreting dàos leads to a shared human conception of the limit of a human inductive process of finding natural guidance.

Humans navigate in dào as fish navigate in water (Zhuangzi 6:6).

9. Implications for (Social-Political) Moral Theory

Daoism, as a version of metaethical naturalism associated with skeptical-relativist attitudes about social mores grounds these normative accounts of metaphysics, linguistics, and epistemology. Norms (dàos) are everywhere. Their skeptical relativist metaethics inhibited Daoists from spelling out a normative theory of first-order social-mores. This perceived absence led Neo-Confucians to accuse Daoism (and its Zen Buddhist alter-ego) of being amoral.

Confucians also try to defuse Daoism’s critical stance by interpreting it as a rival first order scheme of social-political mores, like their own—relying sage authority and cultivated intuitionism but offering “do nothing” (無為 wúwèi non-action) as guidance. Here we traced Daoism critique of the moral biàn (辯 disagreement) impasse between Confucianism and Mohism. Like them, Daoism’s moral focus would indeed be on social mores (including norms of language use) rather than God’s/Reason’s commands to individuals (Rosemont 2015). Despite the differences in the concepts, morality (義 yì duty, righteousness) shares the sense of being the same for many perspectives since all parties to the classic dispute agreed when rival system of mores clash, both cannot be right.

The norms of language use become a paradigm case of how to settle such normative issues. The Later Mohists had proposed “making constant language which promoted good behavior (行 xíng walk, conduct)” (Mozi 11:3:11). The Daoists might endorse the broad spirit of that formula as the account of moral discourse dào, the correct way to talk about different systems of social mores.

“Good behavior,” unfortunately is the crux of the matter. We can judge this as moral or immoral from outside the community’s system. From inside, the issue is the virtuosity of realizing this local human dào. When we know of an alternative moral dào, it creates a choice of which to follow from here, now. Knowing from more perspectives improves our chances of choosing wisely. Choosing is natural when both accept the quasi-objective norm: our perspective is no more naturally authoritative than theirs (Zhuangzi 2:4). If their norms recognize their own natural fallibility, then a way of walking two dàos emerges (Zhuangzi 2:6). Each part realizes one of its possible paths forward. The natural way emerges from that permissive realization allowing the communities to walk together. Being in accord with another is being in accord with nature. Natural (天 tiān) dào models itself on self-realization (自然 zìrán natural, spontaneous) (Laozi 25).

The Ru-Mo (Confucian-Mohist) impasse resulted from their rival metadàos for choosing, reforming, and practically interpreting social mores—scholar authority vs utility calculus. Daoism implicitly changed both meta-dàos from required to permitted. There is no authority on morality (Mohists implicitly accepted this anti-authoritarian view. see (Hansen 2011)) and universal utilitarianism is too burdensome (Zhuangzi 33:2). Whatever morality is, it must incorporate my role in my profession, my community, my family and my own healthy living. If each community’s mores include what permissible moralities permit, we can slowly adapt norms to preserve some commitments while reforming others. Permissible systems normatively accept this is self-correcting when in contact with others. Thus, each becomes capable of evolution. We cannot exclude the intuition cultivated in past practice, but it cannot be what settles the matter.

At the same time, Zhuangzi accepts that the current local social mores are useful. They facilitate communication and cooperation. And while that is good, it is not the end of the matter (Zhuangzi 2:6). Zhuangzi’s epistemology reflects the anti-authoritarian and anti-intuition posture and the endless possibility of improvement—a conception of morality that transcends present social practice but not the evolutionary processes of nature.

Cultural and religious evolution are natural. We can and do judge other cultures (Mozi 6:12). Early Westerners experienced China as highly moral in behavior but lacking their deontic concept of morality. Their conception of the concept superficially had nature playing the God’s-eye view role, but nature’s way of unfolding lets each part play its own role, self-realizing (自然 zìrán natural, spontaneous) its evolving re-construction. Daoists do accept the scientific community as an expert authority. Science does not choose dàos, does not tell nature how to unfold but expertly tracks the process of change. Science gives us information that counts for or against our self-realizing choices.

Science does not make our perspectival choices but tells us the things we need to know to distinguish permissible (可 kě) dàos. Sky-nature (天 tiān) itself is also normatively neutral. Tiān’s dào is just the structure of natural possibility. It does not speak, ergo does not command. It is a fantasy of the Western version that morality is about such commands. The question is not “Who says?” but “where, when, and how to?”

Neo-Confucians project amoralism onto Daoist epistemic modesty, its rejection of authority and intuition (Zhuangzi 2:3–4, 12). The failure of Daoism to formulate a first-order normative dào does not entail that moral dào was mystical, unspeakable, or paradoxically unteachable.

The metaethics of Daoism make the possibility of naturally correct first-order moral guidance the default. It does not purport to label it as permissible from the perspective of the cosmos. Moral permissibility emerges from the sense that our moral culture can make progress in performance while broadening our perspective toward a limit. The moral path for each would converge, progressively improving this structure of linguistic and social mores. The complex, recursive nature of dào choice helps us recognize moral progress without assuming an absolute final morality. It’s an open-minded and open-ended process of finding, choosing and executing dàos of finding, choosing and executing dàos. While there may be a single point of convergence, pluralism is more likely (Wong 2006).

The conventional formula “harmony with nature” makes some sense as harmony with other parts of the natural world of living things. We obviously have little issue about the morality of the earth continuing on its evolving path in our solar system, galaxy, and the ultimate fate of the big-bang universe. In the relevant realm “under heaven,” the proper parts of which we are proper parts embrace many “life forms.” Daoism departs from the Ru-Mo pattern of limiting moral concern to “humans.” While the classical masters knew nothing about global warming, moral concern for the environment is clearly consonant with its naturalism. Normative path structures emerge as all the different natural perspectives we occupy, not merely that of the individual reasoner. My best path here now is finishing this sentence. It’s best for life on earth if humanity limits global warming. Both, and many in-between, are perspectives I juggle during a regular day—writing and sorting the recycling and compost. In between are my roles in my extended family, my school, state, etc.

In each case, Daoists take Zhuangzi’s perspective. We act on and adapt existing shared practices (mores) guiding our/this part’s decision making and interpretation. Harmony with nature is harmony with other parts of each structure in which I participate. I choose paths using the complex recursive meta-daos from each and all of these things with which I identify, the parts of which I am part, and as that converges on a final, best overall choice and interpretation is the moral dào for me here now.

“Empty your mind” gives us permission to seek tranquility while behaving in “harmony with nature.” Like the adaptations acquired in evolution, our human problem-solving heuristics take reasonable account of the limitations of time and energy. With learning and practice, morality comes to seem natural (Analects 2:4). We see adapting and perfecting them as continued honing of practices, including norms of language use in the flow of this life (Zen).

10. Normative Moral Theory

Besides environmental ethics, Daoist metaethics has fueled debate about other implications for any first-order morality to count as Daoist. Early and mature differ on whether it is teachable. They agree on learning from nature, but Zhuangzi accepts learning and participating in human dàos as well. He also recommends improving moral performance by learning from others’ practices. Practice with a social dào may produce a dissonance and trigger looking for ways to reform or it may confirm and stabilize the commitment (Zhuangzi 20:4). For the possibility of this self-realized progress, it should encourage both curiosity and open-mindedness. Clearly, knowledge of the mores of other moral communities will enlarge the size of conceivable paths to inform our incremental reform. Mozi had to invent his (Mozi 6C:12).

The general Daoist norm is openness to change and progress. Both outcomes emerge (出 chū send out, produce, bear) naturally and communities assign them to a normative category. The Daoist prefers the naming norms of more and larger community perspectives. Morality evolves as does language use, by many individual choices of ways of performing an evolving community’s dào.

The whiff of relativism here invites a frequent normative challenge. The accusation is that since paradigms of social orders now known to be wrong emerged naturally, e.g., Hitler-Nazi or Southern slave owner mores, what does Daoist natural relativism say of them? Confucians used despotic mores such as those of the Qin “Legalist” regime in their version of this accusation (Van Norden 2016).

Natural evolutionary relativism would see such historical paradigms as instructive. The accusation contains this implicit key, we have naturally come to know they are wrong and epistemic modesty would have deterred enthusiastic participation. Insofar as Zhuangzi’s permission to use the existing norms goes, learning from the perspective of the oppressed motivates the Schindler’s and Huck Finn’s who interpreted the norms in ways to aid the victims of those cruel social mores. That the mores emerged naturally—and are ours, here, now—does not count in favor of stasis. They remind us that, despite Ru-Mo visions of single-dào societies, most social norm systems have their internal controversies and open-minded engagement with its critics and victims is clearly consonant with the program of mature Daoism.

Most important, these examples remind us to be alert to dàos in our own time that might lead to such regimes emerging again (with different symbols, leaders and dogmas). Rejecting “great man” authoritarianism sits centrally in the definition of the Daoist vs. Ru-Mo divide. Social mores, though useful, are most likely flawed. We temper our useful conformity with readiness to see the flaws while still avoiding free riding on others’ cooperative self-restraint. The cooperative goals, however, cannot be capriciously hostile to other perspectives and a modest skeptical realism might hasten the peaceful evolution to a better system of social mores—without resort to world or civil war.

Daoism, like most of the classical schools, was opposed to both war and punishment. It is notorious as the most egalitarian, least authoritarian and most creative and liberating of China’s ancient schools. Daoist, “wandering without a fixed destination,” does not rule out choosing the better of known mores and mature Daoism openly encourages curiosity about and communication with other ways of life. Its meta-ethics is skeptical relativism in that there may be a common outcome for progressively evolving first-order moral conceptions. However, it accepts that relative improvements converging toward multiple moralities is also possible.

Daoist perspectival relativism is a consequence of its commitment to natural normative guidance, not a premise of its conception of morality. It is skeptical of authority particularly that of this past tradition (Confucianism) and of imperial moralities make morality incompatible with full and contented life including aesthetic and intellectual joys. It was not alone in opposing punishment. Confucius’ argument (Analects 2:3) set the tone. It departed from Ru-Mo mainly in opposing the quest for a single system of mores. Laozi’s famous laissez faire conception of the ideal ruler and Zhuangzi’s refusal to accept high office was implicit acknowledgement that we could find ways to live in peace while tolerating many ways of life.

The disastrous Qin (221–206 BC) experiment translated as “legalism” was an enthusiastic use of punishment. Its theorists paradoxically argued that rigidly measured punishment would eliminate punishment. They borrowed Mozi’s quasi-objective concept of measurement and Shang Yang argued that people would welcome clear, measured regimes of punishment over Confucian reliance on scholars’ moral intuition, AKA rule of man. A widespread moral intuition that it was wrong to punish sincere attempts to do the right thing fueled the Han (206 BC–AD 220) compromise of Confucian and “Legalist” rule by law.

Exposure to Western principled and logically conceived “rule of law” offers an example of a social system that might make punishment less arbitrary without relying on everyone having the same morality (Hansen 1994). Chinese 19th C. “Westernizers” headlined science and democracy, but all sides now accept Western “rule of law,” although its interpretation filtered through Marxism would hardly satisfy Daoists. The key to a Daoist justification would be recognition that punishment has had a natural evolutionary role and is naturally persistent. That does not justify punishment but does justify introducing a social practice that makes it more predictable, consistent and transparent.

Embracing logic, as modern Daoist did, made the Western conception of rule of law intelligible as a way of achieving what the ancients sought: enabling people to avoid arbitrary punishment. It is that conception of the rule of law that enables liberal regimes to tolerate a wide variety of ways of life. The parallels of this direction of natural Daoist evolution of social mores and Western liberalism, tempts us to interpret Daoism as individualism. It is important to keep in mind the differences in how Daoists arrive at valuing maximal equal freedom and toleration of many ways of life.

It does not derive from either deontological reasoning (except for the weak negative retributive insight) or metaphysical commitment to the ego-self, reason, subjectivity etc. The embrace of Western Science during the May 4 movement included the embrace of democracy, but Daoism would see Mozi’s conception of a leader-guided process of moral construction as the insight that guidance comes to many different indexical perspectives in nature. Each is already in motion, committed to a plethora of paths and no one except those in relative inertial systems are making the choice of this and not-that.

The “I,” as Zhuangzi tells us, would not be making choices if there weren’t internal states of “happiness, anger, sorrow, joy…” (Zhuangzi 2:2–3). We choose the way forward and react with these responses to the reality and learn. Our families, communities, professions, orchestras, debate partners, co-workers, change directions as we learn. Democracy doesn’t need an argument starting from the moral autonomy of the rational soul. Science can tell us how social animals, from bee hives and ant colonies to schools of fish, “make decisions” emerging from the decisions of their parts, quorum sensing and voting with their feet.

The role of social leadership is perfecting our social systems of decision making and dào realization. It does not take for granted that the decisions will take the form of enacting laws, so does not rely on axioms of “popular sovereignty.” We didn’t elect Einstein as our model of scientific open-mindedness. While we can tolerate something like the rule of law based on assuming that we cannot eliminate punishment, punitive instincts are not the source of moral progress. Less punishment is better than more.

Social science may uncover that democracy is a pre-requisite of rule of law and reduces war and punishment. That is enough to contribute to our choosing such a democratic dào. The Daoist derivation, however, would be from its equal concern and respect for other points of view, not a meta-ethics of any majoritarian right to coerce others.

Daoism was also not alone in ancient China in being egalitarian (Munro 2001). Mohism was famously concerned about every human’s well-being, but even Confucians shared an assumption that everyone had a route to a sage-morality. Daoism’s early focus was on how similar our dàos were to those of all the other natural living things. The element of nature “worship” that emerges in Daoist guidance attitudes is broader equal respect for all “under the sky.”

Respect takes the form of acknowledging that while we may know better what course other things should take, they occupy the position of choosing and realizing it. Their perspective is corrigible and yet privileged. Morality, like knowledge, is choosing and realizing dàos from more and wider points of view. It is not a definition or formula but emerges from doing better as measured from here. We construct it as our social dàos evolve. The god’s-eye view is not zhēn (真 natural, authentic, true).

Bibliography

Primary Works (Chinese Text Project)

Secondary Literature

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