Disability and Well-Being

Until recently, disability has been widely and often unreflectively regarded as either an outright tragedy or, at the very least, a misfortune that significantly detracts from a person’s well-being. Thus, being disabled has been commonly assumed to be very harmful.

No doubt, it has long been true that myriad disadvantages have been imposed on disabled people by social structures and norms, architectural and environmental design, and prevailing attitudes and practices. But the dominant “common sense” view that being disabled is harmful has not been grounded in an appreciation of the harms caused by such social conditions. Instead, the focus was on perceived features, limitations, and costs of the disability itself, considered in isolation from the surrounding social environment. Even now, with greater recognition of those socially mediated disadvantages, it is widely assumed that disabled people would be badly off even in the absence of ableism or disability-based discrimination.

This highlights a noteworthy contrast between the disability rights movement and other civil rights movements, as well as between the philosophy of disability and the philosophy of race, gender, and sexual orientation. Despite various similarities and parallels between different socially disadvantaged groups, there is one difference on which all sides can agree: the disability rights movement and disability scholarship have devoted more time and energy than their counterparts to arguing against the assumption that their group is badly off. Advocates for other socially disadvantaged groups rarely deny that their members are as badly off as commonly assumed; indeed, advocates for those groups often challenge complacent views about how well members of those groups are now doing, compared to some past time. Disability advocates also point to the appalling social conditions in which many people with disabilities find themselves—excluded, unemployed, and institutionalized. But, in addition, they often argue against the assumption that disabled people lead far worse lives just because of their disabilities.

The assumption that disabled people are badly off due to their disability has itself contributed to various adverse practical consequences for disabled people. It has played a role in the high rates of abortion for fetuses diagnosed with Down syndrome and other significant disabilities, in the denial of life-saving treatment for infants with those conditions, and in the practice of assigning lower value to disabled lives in setting healthcare priorities (e.g., National Council on Disability 2019).

That assumption has also been the backdrop to philosophical discussions of disability and well-being. The philosophical literature on the topic has mostly centered around the question of how and to what extent disabilities in general or some large subset of disabilities (e.g., physical disabilities) might render people worse off. This entry will present and examine the main accounts of the relationship between disability and well-being that have been defended by contemporary philosophers.

In doing so, it suggests that there is less disagreement among many of those accounts than might first appear. In part because of disability advocacy, most mainstream philosophers have adopted a more nuanced view about the harmfulness of disability. The appearance of significant disagreement has been preserved, however, by claims about the neutrality of disability that seem, or have been taken to be, more radical than they prove to be on close inspection.

• 1. Conceptual Preliminaries
• 2. The Harm View
• 3. Arguments for the Harm View
  • 3.1 Restricted Options
  • 3.2 Welfare Security
  • 3.3 Incomplete Compensation
  • 3.4 The Asymmetry Argument
• 4. Alternatives to the Harm View
  • 4.1 The Neutrality View
  • 4.2 Complex Variation Views
  • 4.3 The Mere Difference View
• 5. Disability and Theories of Well-Being
  • 5.1 Disability and Objective Lists
  • 5.2 Disability and Subjective Theories of Well-Being
  • 5.3 Self-Reports, Adaptation, and Rival Theories of Well-Being
• 6. Implications for Theory and Practice
• 7. Future Directions
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Conceptual Preliminaries

One challenge in investigating the relationship between disability and well-being is that there are different schools of thought on how to understand both topics. There is ongoing debate about the best model or account of disability (entry on Disability: Definitions and Models), and there are competing analyses and theories of well-being (Campbell 2016; Lin 2022a, 2022b; entry on Well-Being). Obviously, one way forward is to restrict the focus to a particular conception of disability and a particular conception of well-being, but this requires staking a claim on deeply contested matters and will yield results of limited interest to those who do not subscribe to that combination of views. For this reason, many who write on this topic have tried to avoid committing themselves to particular accounts of disability or well-being. The assumption is that we have a good enough idea of what these things are to be able to meaningfully investigate their relationship. (In Sections 5 and 6, we’ll consider approaches that narrow the focus to particular theories of well-being and narrower subsets of disability.)

The meaning of “disability” may seem especially elusive. Myriad definitions and models are found in the philosophical literature (entry on Disability: Definitions and Models), and many more in other domains. Indeed, Anita Silvers worries that it may be an “essentially contested concept.” Such concepts “have underspecified definitions that permit people with different beliefs to flesh them out in different ways” (Silvers 2003: 473). And Jonas-Sebastien Beaudry has argued that “disability” is irreducibly polysemic, with no core meaning or definition (Beaudry 2016, 2020; cf. Timpe 2022).

The situation, though, is not as hopeless as it may seem. While people can hardly be said to “know disability when they see it,” there is widespread agreement on paradigm cases, such as paraplegia, blindness, deafness, cerebral palsy, muscular dystrophy, Down syndrome, major depression, and schizophrenia. Moreover, philosophers who propose and assess definitions of disability generally agree that one criterion of adequacy is that they include such paradigm cases (e.g., Barnes 2016a: 10–11).

For present purposes, a second criterion of adequacy is that the definition must not stipulate that disability is harmful or welfare-reducing. Any such definition would foreclose inquiry into the relationship between disability and well-being, having already assumed the answer at the outset. This rules out well-known definitions like the “welfarist account” proposed by Guy Kahane and Julian Savulescu (2009). Such definitions are intended to be revisionary, departing from the ordinary usage that constrains our discussion. Our everyday way of talking about disability may not be value-free and may tend toward negative evaluations, but it recognizes various (descriptively characterized) physical and psychological conditions as disabilities and it does not treat expressions like “harmless disability” as oxymoronic.

Well-being is also a philosophically contested concept. When psychologists talk of well-being, they usually have in mind a psychological phenomenon, such as positive affect or life-satisfaction (Rodogno 2015; Alexandrova 2017; Brown and Potter 2024). When philosophers use the term well-being, they typically have in mind an evaluative or normative concept (entry on Well-Being; Fletcher 2016). It refers to how well a person is doing or faring, or how well their life is going for them. It often goes by other names, such as prudential value, self-interest, welfare, quality of life, or flourishing. Some things positively impact our well-being; in other words, they are good for us, benefit us, make us better off, or have prudential value. Other things or events negatively impact our well-being; they are bad for us, harm us, make us worse off, or are prudentially bad. Well-being is widely agreed to be something that we have reason to promote for ourselves and for others (Heathwood 2010; Campbell 2016; Lin 2022a).

Although there is disagreement about the “currency” of well-being (pleasurable experience, fulfilled desires, valuable capacities and activities, etc.), there is a broad consensus on some important sources of well-being, such as happiness, rewarding relationships, knowledge, and achievement (Hurka 2011; Hooker 2015). One strategy for investigating disability’s impact on well-being focuses on such paradigmatic goods and bads of life, without focusing on how these goods and bads relate to different theories of well-being. An alternative strategy, explored in Section 5, involves explicitly evaluating the significance of disability in terms of one or more theories of well-being.

It should be noted that, as is common among philosophers, the term “harm” is being used here in a somewhat specialized sense: something harms a person if and only if it negatively impacts their well-being, even if only by depriving them of a benefit. Harm is contrasted with benefit, which is something that positively impacts a person’s well-being. However, in ordinary usage, people commonly associate “harm” with anything that injures, damages, or impairs a person. Indeed, one prominent account analyzes harming as causing a person “to be in a bad state” such as “pain, mental or physical discomfort, disease, deformity, disability, or death” (Harman 2009: 139). Not unlike the welfarist account mentioned above, this understanding of harm seems to assume a tight or essential connection between disability and harm. In contrast, the present use of “harm” is tightly linked with the concept of well-being and doesn’t presuppose any link between harm and disability.

2. The Harm View

Historically the dominant view about disability, which has commonly been assumed to be true, is that having a disability is typically bad or harmful for a person. In other words, having a disability negatively impacts one’s well-being. This is the Harm View—sometimes called the “Standard View” (Amundson 2005) or “Bad Difference View” (Barnes 2014, 2016a). Until recently, this view has not been precisely formulated; it was more often assumed than defended. Because there is a variety of ways in which something might negatively impact well-being, “the Harm View” actually denotes a family of related views (Barnes 2016a: 2.2).

As an introduction to these views, it is helpful to consider some distinctions which mark off different versions of the Harm View and which clarify and sharpen the inquiry into disability and well-being. Some of these distinctions are widely recognized; others have received little notice. They are useful for organizing the logical space of the literature on disability and well-being and highlighting those regions that have been the sites of philosophical analysis and debate.

• Intrinsic vs. extrinsic vs. comparative.

Philosophers commonly distinguish several ways that something can be harmful or bad for you. One fairly restricted version of the Harm View claims that disabilities are intrinsically (or basically) bad for people—meaning that having a disability always has a direct, unmediated negative impact on well-being, whatever other conditions obtain, even if that negative impact is outweighed by less direct positive impacts. Another version asserts that disabilities are extrinsically bad for a person. Something is extrinsically good or bad in virtue of its relationship to something with intrinsic value or disvalue (entry on Intrinsic vs. Extrinsic Value). Extrinsic bads or goods may add to, or offset, intrinsic ones. While there are various forms of extrinsic value, the most well-known and widely discussed is instrumental value. On a common interpretation, a thing is instrumentally bad for a person when it brings about a net loss of intrinsic prudential value—by causing or enabling intrinsic bads or by preventing the attainment of intrinsic goods (Bradley 2015; see also the entry on intrinsic vs. extrinsic value). For instance, the loss of both legs can prevent someone from climbing mountains, denying them access to spectacular vistas and the attendant sense of awe (thereby preventing intrinsic goods), as well as causing frustration and disappointment (causing intrinsic bads). If such negative effects aren’t offset by positive effects, the person’s disability will be (overall) instrumentally bad for them.

Granted, what counts as intrinsically valuable is unclear. Since G. E. Moore (1903), there has been a protracted debate over what, if anything, has intrinsic value (entry on George Edward Moore). Moore proposed an extreme test: something is intrinsically good if and only if it would be judged good even if it existed in absolute isolation. It is difficult to understand how to apply this test, let alone how to decide what verdicts it would render for items conventionally regarded as having intrinsic value. Moore suggested that such familiar items like sight could have intrinsic value, but only as contributors to complex states of affairs he called “organic unities.” The event of seeing a beautiful sunset might have significant intrinsic value, while sight alone, or a beautiful sunset alone, would have little or none.

Outside of such organic unities, the impact of even the most likely bearers of intrinsic value, such as pain, pleasure, justice, and kindness, is arguably contingent. The badness of pain may depend on the attitude of the person experiencing it; the remorseful may welcome it. The goodness of kindness may depend on the deservingness of the person receiving it; it may be wrong to bestow it on evildoers. This contingency is obvious for sensory capacities. Sight is a great good in a world of beauty, not necessarily in a world of eyesores.

Even if intrinsic value is almost always contingent in these ways, it is still worth distinguishing it from instrumental value, which is contingent in a quite different way. That distinction is useful in articulating different versions of the Harm View.

Lastly, a broader version of the Harm View is cast in terms of comparative badness, which encompasses intrinsic and extrinsic badness. Here, the claim is that being disabled renders a person overall worse off than they otherwise would have been in the absence of that disability. This construal of prudential badness is comparative in that it is based on a comparison between an individual’s level of well-being in the actual world and their well-being level in a nearby possible world. Since this measure is arguably the most ethically salient, this entry will mostly focus on comparative badness.

• Probability vs. magnitude of harm.

In assessing the harmfulness of disability, the two most obvious questions are: how likely is it to be harmful, and how harmful is it likely to be? These questions concern, respectively, the probability and magnitude of the harm. They can be compressed into a single question about the “expected harm” of disability—all possible harms, of varying magnitude, discounted by their probability. Until recently, there has been little pressure to distinguish the two dimensions, since the prevailing view has been that disability is very likely to be very harmful.

Although disability scholars generally hold that the harm associated with disability is significantly less probable and severe than is commonly assumed, the recent philosophical debate has not paid much attention to magnitude, focusing on the probability of harm. (An exception is the Not-Very-Bad Thesis discussed in Schroeder 2018: 5.) This focus may well reflect a change in the background assumptions about the magnitude of harm. In the last fifty years, the sheer volume of empirical research on disability and well-being, and of testimony from disabled people, has put it beyond serious dispute that a great many people with disabilities lead rich, rewarding lives, and that for many of those who do not, discrimination and poverty are often the primary sources of harm. In light of the emerging consensus that disability is not typically a tragedy, philosophers have largely shifted to the question of whether it is, in general, harmful to some degree.

This shift has been motivated in part by provocative claims that disability is value-neutral, or that it is a “mere difference” like race, sex, or sexual orientation (Section 4). Most of the literature challenging these claims has emphasized the probability of harm, arguing that disability is likely to make life go at least marginally worse. While this response is appropriate, it is incomplete. Establishing that disability is slightly, moderately, or even highly likely to be harmful would not seriously challenge the claim of value-neutrality if the harm was almost always minor. Most of the arguments for the Harm View presented in Section 3 focus on probability; the debate about adaptation discussed in 5.3 concerns magnitude as well.

In discussing Harm Views, it is worthwhile to distinguish strong, presumptive views—according to which disability almost always has a negative impact on well-being—from weak, probabilistic views, which assert that disability is merely more likely than not to have a negative impact. For simplicity’s sake, these will be referred to as, respectively, presumptive and probabilistic views, though it should be recognized that both make probabilistic claims.

Arguments against value neutrality often cite empirical research finding that the self-rated well-being of people with disabilities is, on average, somewhat lower than the population average, though not nearly as low as many non-disabled people assume (Section 5.2). But the average, understood as the mean, can conceal a great deal of prudentially relevant information about the distribution of outcomes. There may be a substantial difference between two conditions with the same mean impact on well-being, if one consistently has a negligible impact and the other has a widely varying impact.

For example, consider a choice between two life-saving medical procedures that cause different disabilities as side-effects. The disability caused by the first procedure would moderately restrict the range of limb motion, with no other effects; the disability caused by the other has no effect or a slightly positive effect on well-being 98% of the time, but in 2% of cases results in total paralysis and severe chronic pain. While the mean harm that results from both conditions might be roughly the same (on most plausible metrics), patients with different risk preferences might have vastly different preferences about the two procedures.

• No-ableism restriction vs. unrestricted.

One version of the Harm View claims that having a disability is bad for people in the actual world. Since ableism is a significant source of harm for disabled people, it would not be all that surprising if this unrestricted version of the Harm View was true in our actual, ableism-ridden world. After all, disability scholars and advocates emphasize that, not unlike race and gender, many of disability’s associated disadvantages are attributable to oppression and injustice (e.g. Silvers 1998a)—indeed, that has been a central theme of the disability rights movement since it emerged in the 1970s. Given that, many proponents of the Harm View wish to defend a version that screens off the harms of ableism. This is typically understood in counterfactual terms: were a disabled person to exist in an ableism-free environment, their disability would be bad for them even in those circumstances (Barnes 2016a: 60–61; Crawley 2022). If this type of Harm View were true, it would show disability to be significantly disanalogous to other oppressed identities and might vindicate efforts to eliminate and prevent disabilities.

The counterfactual no-ableism restriction brings with it some noteworthy complications. Consider a Harm View that states: if a person were to live in an environment completely devoid of any personal and systemic ableism, having a disability would still be bad for that person. First, there is no consensus on what changes would be required to entirely eliminate ableism. Some argue that it would be impossible to make physical and social environments equally accommodating for every human variation. A no-ableism society would provide the accommodations required by justice, which arguably could not be strictly equal and should not attempt to be (Barclay 2010, 2011). Unfortunately, there is deep and widespread disagreement about what justice requires for people with disabilities and other disadvantaged groups (entry on Justice and Disability; Silvers, Wasserman, and Mahowald 1998).

Even if there were agreement on what justice required, there are two kinds of uncertainty about how individuals would fare in an ableism-free world (Campbell and Stramondo 2017). The first is counterfactual indeterminacy: even if we could agree about what is required to have an ableism-free environment, there may not be a determinate fact about whether disability would be bad for a person in such an environment, since there are any number of ways in which a world without ableism might be realized. These worlds might differ in ways that affected whether, or how much, an individual with a given disability was harmed. But even within a single ableism-free world, there is the further problem of counterfactual opacity: how can we know whether a counterfactual about disability in that world is true? It’s hard enough to assess the truth of counterfactuals that involve minimal departures from the world as we know it; it is much harder to do so with worlds very different from our own (Barnes 2016a: 99–100).

Further, if the Harm View is specified in terms of comparative value, it might involve two layers of counterfactuals. For the claim may then be that were a disabled person to exist in a no-ableism environment, having a disability would lead to a well-being level that is lower than the well-being level they would have were they not disabled. Here, the Harm View appeals to the closest possible no-ableism world and, from that world, the closest possible world where the person isn’t disabled. This exacerbates the problems of indeterminacy and opacity.

Both versions of the Harm View could be made less speculative by pragmatic qualifications. For actual-world approaches, it would make sense to restrict the scope of the Harm View to specific contemporary societies. After all, when we assess the impact of disability on well-being, we are generally concerned with the here-and-now. Historians and anthropologists may debate the status and treatment of people with disabilities in societies remote from our own, but even if those questions are instructive for contemporary policy-making, they are not our central concern.

For no-ableism versions of the Harm View, one could bracket disagreements about what an ideally respectful or just society would look like by focusing on the bare minimum that respect and justice for people with disabilities requires. However great that disagreement, there is likely to be a consensus that the status quo is significantly ableist, and that substantial changes are morally required. Assessing how people with disabilities would fare in a minimally respectful and just society could reduce counterfactual speculation and normative controversy. That restriction would leave disability advocates free to argue that all or most of the harm still experienced by people with disabilities under a minimal standard would not be found in a more fully respectful and just society.

• General vs. specific types of disability.

Some engage with a Harm View that applies to disability in general (e.g. McMahan 2005; Campbell and Stramondo 2017). Other scholars are interested in discussing a version of the Harm View that only pertains to a proper subset of the larger class of disabilities. For instance, Elizabeth Barnes challenges Harm Views about physical disabilities, but is silent on the relationship between cognitive disabilities and well-being (Barnes 2016a: 2–5; for her explanation and defense of this restriction, see Barnes 2020). Wasserman and Asch (2013) restrict their investigation of the relationship between disability and well-being not only to physical disabilities, but to static ones that involve absent or limited function but not significant “pain, functional decline and loss, or reduced life-expectancy.” Gould (2020, 2022) defends a Harm View specifically about intellectual disability.

In sum, there are multiple versions of the Harm View. Different versions may be relevant for different purposes. For example, some philosophers in the “public reason” tradition have argued that policy makers should not be concerned with overall well-being, but with a subset of instrumental goods, such as opportunities (Aas 2020; MacKay 2017). Prospective parents, in contrast, may be especially concerned with all of the harms that may befall their children. Justice theorists will be interested in the versions of the Harm View that are most relevant to their chosen “currency” (e.g. welfare, resources, or capabilities); those giving priority to the “worst off” will have a special concern about the magnitude of harm.

It might be thought, as argued by Thomas Crawley (2022), that the most plausible, charitable, and normatively significant version of the Harm View is a probabilistic, comparative version with the no-ableism restriction. Roughly, such a view claims: setting aside the effects of ableism, having a disability is likelier than not to render a person at least somewhat worse off. This view may be more plausible than less qualified versions of the Harm View. Yet it may not capture the heart of the dispute about disability and well-being since it is arguably accepted by many self-proclaimed proponents and critics of the Harm View, provided that it does not assume that disability is typically very bad for well-being. Some critics are willing to accept a probabilistic Harm View but question its normative importance (Asch and Wasserman 2010; Campbell and Stramondo 2016; Campbell, Stramondo, and Wasserman 2021).

3. Arguments for the Harm View

Although the Harm View in some form is widely adopted both outside and inside academia, it had long seemed too obvious to require a defense. In the past two decades, however, various arguments have been offered for it. These usually don’t distinguish the version that is being defended, though they are most plausibly regarded as arguments emphasizing probability more than magnitude.

3.1 Restricted Options

One of the most common grounds for thinking that disability is a bad thing focuses on its instrumental badness and, more specifically, the fact that disabilities prevent a person from doing certain things and thereby restrict their options (Buchanan et al. 2000; Brock 2005; Shakespeare 2014; Kahane and Savulescu 2016; Crawley 2020). The Restricted Options Argument is roughly this: having a disability is likely to lead to a net restriction in a person’s options; having restricted options is bad for a person; therefore, having a disability is likely to be bad for a person.

There are various strategies for challenging this argument. First, one might question our ability to meaningfully individuate options, which may undermine claims about option restriction (Sugden 2003; Mills 2003). Options can be “carved up” differently based on different features. For example, a single set of drink offerings might be depicted as two options (water vs. sugary drink), three (water vs. juice vs. soda) or six (water vs. orange juice vs. apple juice vs. Coke vs. Dr. Pepper vs. Canada Dry) (Iyengar 2010). Since having a disability doesn’t merely subtract options but may add new ones, there may not be a determinate fact about whether the option set for a disabled person is larger or smaller than the option set they would have had if non-disabled.

Second, one might try to establish that, with any plausible way of individuating options, disabilities are not likely to lead to a net restriction in options. This claim will be harder to defend if the focus is on actual contexts where ableism is operative, since one of the obvious effects of ableism is to restrict or fail to provide options that should be available to people with disabilities.

Third, even assuming that disabilities almost always reduce options, one could reject the claim that having restricted options is always or even typically bad for a person. It is now widely appreciated by philosophers and social scientists that having more options isn’t always a good thing. Having more options from which to choose can complicate or impede decision-making, increase the likelihood of regret or disappointment, encourage a maximizing mentality, and alter the nature of one’s options (e.g., Dworkin 1988; Velleman 1992; Silvers 1999: 92; Schwartz 2016; Iyengar and Kuman 2018). In addition, per Adrienne Asch and David Wasserman (Asch and Wasserman 2010; Wasserman and Asch 2013), it is plausible that the goods of life—such as pleasure, knowledge, achievement and friendship—are multiply realizable and that most people have a surplus of opportunities to access these goods in some form or other. If so, even if disability does restrict options, this need not reduce one’s well-being prospects. (For critical discussion of this multiple-realizability reasoning and the Restricted Options Argument more generally, see Schroeder 2018; Crawley 2020; and Campbell, Stramondo, and Wasserman 2021.)

The first and third challenges are closely related. The more broadly options are individuated, the more readily they can be realized in multiple ways. As Wasserman and Asch (2013: 150–151) argue, the experience of music and the experience of art are appropriately seen as members of a broader class of aesthetic experience (cf. Brock 2005: 69–70). Within this broader category, blind and deaf people can have experiences as rich and rewarding as people with the typical complement of senses (Schroeder 2018; Moller 2011). But while the multiple-realizability argument is more plausible for broader classes of goods, we lack a principled basis for individuation.

3.2 Welfare Security

Even those who support a broad framing of goods or options may still conclude that disabilities are likely to be slightly harmful because of the limits on multiple realizability. One way to motivate a probabilistic Harm View is in terms of “welfare security” (Wasserman and Asch 2013; Stramondo and Campbell 2020). Even if people with a major disability are sometimes able to live as well as people without one, it requires more effort or luck for them to do so, and they are at greater risk of lacking the means to do so. The first claim is that the fewer means there are to achieve a particular good like rich aesthetic experience, the more difficult it may be to achieve it. An individual who can meet their aesthetic quota, so to speak, with sunsets or symphonies doesn’t have to work as hard or need as aesthetically rich an environment as one who can meet their quota only with symphonies. The second claim is that people with disabilities are at greater risk than people without any disabilities of losing the means to achieve various goods, since they have a smaller surplus or reserve (Stramondo and Campbell 2020: 145–147; Kittay 2021).

The plausibility of these claims depends on a myriad of unresolved issues: Is there an irreducible plurality of prudential goods and, if so, how are they individuated? How limited are the means for attaining those goods? If it requires greater effort to attain a particular good with fewer functions, does that additional effort itself enhance or reduce well-being?

3.3 Incomplete Compensation

Jeff McMahan (2005) mounts a distinct defense of the Harm View that appeals to the idea of compensation. He first suggests that a single disability may seem neutral (and thus not bad for a person) because it can be compensated for by other abilities that develop to fulfill its functions. However, McMahan claims that if individual disabilities were neutral on their own, they would also be neutral in combination. But it is impossible to believe that a person who had all disabilities wouldn’t be worse off than most other people. The badness of their situation, he adds, wouldn’t be entirely due to ableist discrimination and lack of adequate accommodation. Instead, the explanation for this badness would “appeal primarily to effects that each [disability] would have on its own that cannot be adequately compensated for” by other abilities. All of this speaks against the idea that combinations of disabilities are “organic unities” that possess some disvalue as a whole that is not possessed by their parts. “In short,” McMahan concludes, “the bad effects of disabilities are largely additive.” Since disabilities seem to be bad in combination, McMahan concludes that individual disabilities are bad for people (2005: 95–96).

One questionable part of McMahan’s reasoning is the assumption that being as well-off without any given ability depends on the possibility of other abilities compensating for its absence. A multiple-realizability approach provides an alternative to ability-compensation as the primary source of flourishing for people with disabilities. If an important good can be realized as fully in multiple forms, a disabled individual need not develop compensatory abilities to enjoy that good; they can simply adopt a different way of pursuing it that was already available to them. People who pursue a different vocation or hobby in response to an acquired disability need not be seen as “compensating” any more than people who do so because of relocation or unemployment. As suggested earlier, a blind person can live as well as a sighted one not because they compensate by developing better hearing—they may not—but because the senses and abilities they retain are more than adequate for them to derive as much sensory and aesthetic fulfillment without sight.

On this alternative, some number or combination of disabilities could make life significantly worse not so much because small gaps in compensating for single disabilites add up, but because the remaining options for realizing some important goods shrink to the vanishing point (Asch and Wasserman 2010; Wasserman and Asch 2013). This may happen far less than many Harm View proponents assume, but the possibility of such a shortfall cannot be categorically denied.

3.4 The Asymmetry Argument

If a strong version of the Harm View were true, one might appeal to it to argue that it’s wrong or morally problematic to cause disability in another person. Some philosophers have flipped this reasoning on its head (Harris 2001; Singer 2004; McMahan 2005; Kahane 2009; Kahane and Savulescu 2016). They take as their starting point the widely held intuition that it’s morally problematic to cause disability in others and use that intuition to critique the Neutrality View of disability, usually in the service of defending the Harm View. The thinking goes something like this: “If the Neutrality View were true, it would be permissible to cause disability in much the way that most people think it’s permissible to remove or prevent disability. But it’s not permissible to cause disability in this way. So, the Neutrality View must be false.” This argument appeals to most people’s intuitive sense that there is a moral asymmetry between the act of removing or preventing a disability and the act of causing a disability.

Elizabeth Barnes criticizes this specific way of defending the Harm View. Part of Barnes’s strategy is to establish that there are other explanations of the wrongness of causing disability in certain cases such that we cannot so quickly reject the Neutrality View (or, more broadly, the various versions of the “Mere Difference View”; Section 4.3) (Barnes 2014, 2016a; cf. McMahan 2005: 95–99). First, causing disability in another person without their consent would constitute a form of unjustified interference in their life. Second, doing so is risky since it might turn out that they will not ultimately like or prefer being disabled. Third, even if being disabled is not in general a bad or harmful thing, becoming disabled usually involves substantial “transition costs” from having to adopt, and adapt to, a new lifestyle.

However, when those factors are not present, many will still have the intuition that it’s wrong to cause disability. Barnes suggests that people may have that intuition precisely because they are antecedently committed to the Harm View and that, therefore, their intuition about the wrongness of causing disability doesn’t provide any independent support for the Harm View. Kahane and Savulescu (2016) counter that the wrongness intuition in these cases has independent traction. Relying on intuitive judgments about such hypothetical cases is a standard, legitimate move in philosophical argument: by pointing out the most extreme implications of a contested view, its opponents seek to win over those who are undecided about its plausibility. (For her response, see Barnes 2016b.)

4. Alternatives to the Harm View

Suppose that a given version of the Harm View is false. If disability doesn’t negatively impact well-being in the specified way, three other possibilities present themselves. Having a disability might positively impact well-being in that way (the Benefit View); it might have a neutral impact on well-being (the Neutrality View); or it might have an impact on well-being that is complex, variable, or uncertain enough to make generalizations difficult (Complex Variation Views). Since few have argued for the Benefit View, this entry will set it aside and focus on the latter two possibilities. These views will then be situated in relation to the Mere Difference View.

4.1 The Neutrality View

While the Harm View asserts that disability is bad for a person, the Neutrality View holds that disability is neither bad nor good for a person; it is instead neutral. One can think of well-being as a bipolar scale with a midpoint, with positive well-being on one side and negative well-being (or ill-being) on the other. Things that are bad for you are, in some sense, pulling you toward the negative end of the well-being spectrum; things that are good for you pull toward the positive end. There are two ways that a thing can qualify as prudentially neutral: either it has no impact on well-being at all, positive or negative; or it has a positive and a negative impact that balance each other out. To extend the above metaphor, something that is neutral for you either isn’t pulling at all in either direction, or it is pulling with equal force in both directions. This distinction gives rise to distinctive versions of the Neutrality View:

• No impact vs. balanced impact.

One version of the Neutrality View claims that disability has no impact on well-being at all; it is prudentially inert, one might say. Another version holds that disability both positively and negatively impacts well-being and that these good and bad impacts balance each other so as to have a (roughly) net neutral impact.

Some of the distinctions discussed in connection with the Harm View also mark out different versions of the Neutrality View:

• Intrinsic vs. extrinsic vs. comparative.

One version of the Neutrality View claims that disabilities are intrinsically neutral for people. In other words, having a disability is not, in and of itself, prudentially good or prudentially bad. Another version asserts that disabilities are extrinsically neutral—or, more narrowly, instrumentally neutral. To claim that having a disability is instrumentally neutral is to suggest either that it doesn’t bring about any intrinsic goods or bads or that it brings about a roughly equal amount of intrinsic goods and bads. A broader version of the Neutrality View claims that having a given disability is comparatively neutral: it renders a person no worse or better off than they otherwise would have been.

• Probability vs. magnitude.

Like the Harm View, the Neutrality View can have presumptive and probabilistic versions on which, respectively, disability is very likely or merely likely to have a neutral impact. On the issue of magnitude, the Neutrality View is consistent with disabilities having no significant impact at all or (on a balanced impact view) having a highly variable impact on well-being that averages out to neutral. As suggested in outlining versions of the Harm View, there may be significant differences between these two kinds of neutrality. (This point will be revisited in the discussion of disabilities as high-impact traits in Sections 4.2 and 6.)

• No-ableism restriction vs. unrestricted.

A popular formulation of the Neutrality View adopts the no-ableism restriction: in a world without ableism and its effects, disability would have a net neutral impact on well-being. Without this restriction, a Neutrality View claims that, in our world as it is, disability has a neutral impact on well-being.

Although much of the resistance to the Harm View has been expressed in the language of “neutrality” and “mere difference,” philosophical defenses of the Neutrality View (at least, as formulated here) have been fairly modest and qualified. The most widely accepted version of the Neutrality View pertains to intrinsic prudential value. Anita Silvers, who defends a “neutral conception of disability,” claims that “badness, while very strongly associated with disability, is not inherent in it” (2003: 481). Asch and Wasserman (2010) argue that “static” disabilities—those involving the simple loss or absence of a typical sensory or motor function, with no pain or progression—are not intrinsically good or bad. While acknowledging that some exceptions may exist (e.g. conditions essentially involving pain), Campbell and Stramondo (2017) argue that most of the conditions that society labels “disabilities” are intrinsically neutral.

In defending her “Value-Neutral Model” of disability, Barnes argues that disability and many other things are “neutral simpliciter with respect to well-being—their presence doesn’t, by itself, make you better or worse off than people without such things” (2016a: 84). She recognizes that some specific types of disabilities may not be neutral even in this narrow sense but maintains that disability as a category is intrinsically neutral (101–102). While Barnes might be gesturing toward a somewhat more expansive Neutrality View that goes beyond intrinsic value (59–70, 84–101), she certainly appears to be committed to an intrinsic-value Neutrality View for physical disability.

A proponent of the intrinsic-value Neutrality View can grant that, say, dwarfism may be extrinsically or comparatively bad for a person in certain contexts, leading them to suffer discrimination from others or experience frustration from navigating environments designed for taller people. However, the view implies that being within a given range of height is not, in and of itself, good or bad for someone.

Most of the scholars cited above appear to endorse a no-impact version of an intrinsic-value Neutrality View. There seems to be little substantive difference between versions of this view that apply to the actual world vs. an ableism-free world. If disabilities have no intrinsic value or disvalue, then having a disability will be intrinsically neutral in both ableist and non-ableist contexts. The presence or absence of ableist barriers and burdens will be just another extrinsic factor, irrelevant to intrinsic neutrality.

Given the doubts about what, if anything, has intrinsic value (Section 2), the claim that disability is “value-neutral” may be exceedingly weak. If little or nothing is intrinsically bad, it is hardly controversial to deny that disability is. Virtually no philosophers will claim that disability—as a broad, heterogeneous collection of bodily and mental states and conditions—is one of the rare things that always, or almost always, has a direct negative effect on well-being.

Once we move from intrinsic to extrinsic value, the Neutrality View is presumably a non-starter unless it screens off the impacts of ableism. Given the realities of ableist oppression, it is implausible that disability has a neutral relationship with well-being in our actual world. But is it true that, in the absence of ableism, disability in combination with other aspects of the world would typically have a neutral impact on well-being? This is a very strong claim, for it requires that having a disability—in combination with other things, such as a person’s personality, desires, beliefs, values, environment, etc.—would either have no significant effect on well-being, or would have positive and negative effects that more or less balance each other out. Few, if any, philosophers appear to endorse either of these claims.

4.2 Complex Variation Views

Another alternative to the Harm View is to reject the generalizations represented by the Harm, Neutrality, and Benefit Views. Given the great variety of disabilities, individuals with those disabilities, and circumstances in which they live with those disabilities, it is natural to suppose that the prudential impact of being disabled will vary quite a bit across individuals with their distinctive conditions and life circumstances. This variation might be great enough to undermine broad generalizations about disability being bad, or good, or neutral.

To be clear, rejecting that triad of views is not a viable option with respect to the average-impact versions. The average prudential impact of having a disability—whatever it might turn out to be—must be either positive, negative, or neutral. In other words, having a disability is going to be, on average, either good for those who are disabled, bad for them, or neutral.

Yet, it is possible to reject the probabilistic versions of the Harm, Benefit, and Neutrality Views. To illustrate, suppose that having a disability were 40% likely to be bad for a person, 40% likely to be good for a person, and 20% likely to be prudentially neutral. In that case, a Harm View that states that having a disability is likely to be bad for a person would be false, as would the corresponding Benefit and Neutrality Views. The Neutrality View would be false because, even if the mean outcome was neutral, it is unlikely (only a 20% chance) that any given disability will be neutral for any given person.

This sets the stage for Complex Variation Views. Though not explicitly articulated in the literature, these views capture significant common ground among several authors who reject a presumptive Harm View but characterize their own views in different ways. A Complex Variation View rejects the stronger presumptive versions of the Harm, Neutrality, and Benefit Views, all of which are far more often criticized than adopted. It thus holds that disability is neither very likely to be a bad thing, nor very likely to be a good thing, nor very likely to be neutral for disabled people. Instead, the situation is far more complicated. Take any large group of individuals living in diverse circumstances, and you will find some significant proportion for whom being disabled is good, another significant proportion for whom it is bad, and at least some for whom it is more or less neutral.

Of course, even a proponent of a presumptive Harm View can allow that there is variation—perhaps a great deal of variation—in how bad disability will be. In other words, a Harm View proponent might think that although disabilities are very likely to make a person worse off, they have varying levels of badness for different people, ranging from mildly bad to extremely bad. What is distinctive about Complex Variation Views is the idea that disability typically yields a wide range of outcomes, not clustered on the positive or negative side of the scale, or at the neutral point.

Some might hold that there is complex variation at the level of intrinsic value—denying that having a disability of one kind or another is very likely to be intrinsically bad, or very likely to be intrinsically good, or very likely to be intrinsically neutral. For instance, one might hold that certain kinds of disabilities (such as chronic pain) are intrinsically bad for everyone who has them, whereas other kinds of disabilities are intrinsically neutral or good. But given that the focus of the debate has been on extrinsic effects, no more will be said about this prospect. What matters most is disability’s impact on well-being in the range of circumstances and contexts in which we experience it.

One type of Complex Variation View that appears to be favored by a number of authors—some of whom take themselves to disagree about disability and well-being—pertains to extrinsic and comparative value. This type of view seems to be endorsed by various scholars, including Silvers (2003); Wasserman and Asch (2013); Barnes (2016a: ch. 3); Campbell and Stramondo (2017); Kittay (2019, 2021); Nadelhoffer (2022); and Crawley (2022). As Barnes puts it, disability “may be good for you, it may be bad for you, it may be utterly indifferent for you—depending on what it is combined with” (2016a: 98).

Much of the evidence for Complex Variation Views comes from disabled people’s testimony about their lives. There are countless examples of “disability-positive” and “disability-negative” testimony, in which disabled people report that their lives have been improved, or worsened, by their disability. If such testimony is taken at face value, a complex-variation approach has considerable appeal. (Proponents of presumptive Harm Views tend to dismiss disability-positive testimony as unreliable, an issue that is addressed in the discussion of adaptation in Section 5.3.)

Independently of disabled people’s testimony, there are various reasons why one might expect to find complex variation at the level of extrinsic and comparative value. First, the general category of disability covers a strikingly wide and diverse range of conditions—somatic conditions such as mobility impairments, sensory impairments, and anatomical differences; psychological conditions such as major depression and schizophrenia; and “hybrid” conditions such as chronic pain or fatigue disorder. Even if one focuses only on paradigmatic physical disabilities, it is obvious that they are a heterogeneous group of conditions, differing from each other in ways that are highly relevant to well-being. Some forms of blindness and deafness do not involve pain or progression, merely the absence (or loss) of a sensory or motor function. Duchenne muscular dystrophy and spinal muscular atrophy (Type 2), in contrast, are progressive or degenerative conditions, involving an increasing loss of function, and often pain and discomfort. Unlike the other conditions mentioned, they are also associated with significantly reduced life expectancy (Landfeldt et al. 2020; National Organization for Rare Disorders 2024).

Second, there is much diversity within many disability categories such that variations of traits, abilities, or embodiments are present even within a single diagnostic category. A single biomedically classified disability, such as Cerebral Palsy or blindness, will be experienced very differently by different people, depending in part on the time of onset; level of severity; and the individual’s goals, values, personality, and social circumstances.

Third, disabilities tend to be “high-impact traits” that exert a substantial causal influence over how a given person’s life unfolds (Campbell and Stramondo 2017: 166–168). While some traits (e.g. the ability to roll one’s tongue, having a few freckles) are usually “low-impact,” playing little or no role in shaping the course of a person’s life, a person’s disability—not unlike their race, gender identity, sexual orientation, political affiliation, and religious views—typically makes a significant difference to how they experience the world, what activities they engage in, how others interact with them, and so on. This strong causal influence has ripple effects that impact one’s well-being, for better and for worse.

Importantly, Complex Variation Views are compatible with weaker versions of the Harm, Benefit, and Neutrality Views. This helps to illuminate why some self-proclaimed critics of the Harm View (or Bad Difference View) do not seem threatened by, and are even willing to concede the truth of, a probabilistic formulation of the Harm View (e.g., Wasserman and Asch 2013; Campbell, Stramondo, and Wasserman 2021: 238). A Complex Variation View proponent can allow that a randomly selected person with a disability is more likely than not to have a somewhat negative outcome. Yet, as noted earlier, the normative significance of this is up for debate (Campbell and Stramondo 2017, 169–74; Crawley 2022).

One difficult question yet to be addressed is whether Complex Variation Views reject Harm, Neutrality, and Benefit Views with or without the no-ableism restriction. The unrestricted, actual-world Harm View claims that, in the world as we know it, having a disability is very likely to be bad for a person; in contrast, a no-ableism Harm View claims that, in a world or context without ableism, disability would be very likely to be bad for you. There obviously have been times and places in human history where a strong actual-world Harm View was true (e.g. during the Third Reich in Germany, especially after the adoption of the T4 program that killed at least 70,000 disabled people). There are also times and places where such a view seems exaggerated—for example, in contemporary affluent Western European states with expansive welfare provisions and enforced anti-discrimination laws. This variability in disabled lives across times and places might support an actual-world Complex-Variation View that denies that disability is almost always bad. But given how bad the lives of disabled people have been in so many times and places, it might also support a modest actual-world Harm View on which disability is very likely to be at least somewhat harmful. An actual-world Complex-Variation View may involve as much speculation as a no-ableism Complex-Variation View—though factual rather than counterfactual speculation.

As noted in the discussion of the no-ableism/actual-world distinction (Section 2), the uncertainties in applying either version can be mitigated by pragmatic strategies—in particular, limiting the no-ableism version to the minimal demands of any plausible theory of justice for disability; for the actual world version, restricting the “world” in question to modern post-industrial societies.

4.3 The Mere Difference View

In the wake of Elizabeth Barnes’ influential article “Valuing Disability, Causing Disability” (2014) and her subsequent book The Minority Body (2016a), many authors writing about disability and well-being have followed her lead and given a central place to the distinction between the “Bad Difference” and “Mere Difference” views of disability (e.g. Andric and Wundisch 2015; Wallis 2020; Crawley 2020; Gould 2022; Carter 2023; Weigel 2024). The Bad Difference View is effectively a version of the Harm View; it associates disability with “a negative effect on well-being” (Barnes 2016a: 60). The Mere Difference View is the rejection of all versions of the Harm View and the Benefit View (Barnes 2016a, ch. 2). (This point should be qualified in various ways. For instance, Barnes presents these views as restricted to physical disabilities and involving a no-ableism restriction.)

Although the phrase “mere difference” is strongly suggestive of neutrality, a commitment to the Mere Difference View is compatible with endorsing either some version of the Neutrality View or a Complex Variation View (which itself is compatible with rejecting all Neutrality Views). Moreover, a commitment to a Complex Variation View or a Neutrality View does not require accepting the Mere Difference View. To illustrate, a person might reject presumptive comparative-value versions of the Harm, Benefit, and Neutrality Views (and so accept a Complex Variation View); believe that disabilities are intrinsically neutral (and so endorse a certain Neutrality View); and yet maintain that having a disability is at least somewhat likely to be bad for a person. This last view is a weak Harm View and is therefore inconsistent with the Mere Difference View.

Whether the bad-difference/mere-difference distinction marks a crucial dividing line in the debate over disability and well-being depends on how much controversy there is over whether a weak Harm View is true. If the central disagreement is whether a stronger presumptive version of the Harm View is true, the more salient division may be between proponents of strong Harm Views on the one hand, and proponents of a Complex Variation View or relevant Neutrality View on the other.

5. Disability and Theories of Well-Being

As noted above, one strategy for exploring the relationship between disability and well-being involves appealing to commonly held intuitions about what things are good, bad, or neutral for us. Almost everyone can agree that a person’s life tends to be enhanced by such things as pleasure and enjoyment, freedom to move about and direct one’s own life, and meaningful personal relationships. Equally, it is uncontroversial that our lives tend to be worsened by things like suffering, frustrated goals, victimization, deep ignorance, and so on. Appealing to paradigmatic goods and bads of life can take us some way in an investigation of this topic.

However, another sensible strategy for gaining insight into this topic is to delve into the question of what ultimately makes our lives go better for us. A theory of well-being is an account of what kinds of things are intrinsically or basically good (and bad) for us. Rather than simply asking about disability’s relationship to well-being in the abstract, one might instead conduct a theory-specific investigation, inquiring whether disabilities are bad, good, or neutral for us if, say, hedonism is the correct theory of well-being. Some scholars have sought to critically examine the Harm View by systematically assessing it in relation to the leading theories of well-being (Wasserman and Asch 2013; Barnes 2016a).

Philosophical discussions of what makes life go well commonly divide theories of well-being into two broad camps: objective theories and subjective theories. This section discusses disability’s relationship to well-being in relation to some prominent theories from each camp.

5.1 Disability and Objective Lists

Derek Parfit coined the term “objective list theories” to refer to accounts of well-being on which “certain things are good or bad for us, whether or not we want to have the good things, or to avoid the bad things” (Parfit 1984: 493ff). Typical objective list theories are defined by two features. First, they are pluralistic, recognizing multiple components of well-being. Although the term “list” may suggest a simple checklist of goods, objective list theories are better seen as recognizing an irreducible plurality in the goods of life, such that their contribution to well-being cannot be expressed in terms of a common metric like utility. Second, they are “objective” in the sense that at least some goods (or bads) on the list can impact a person’s well-being even if the person does not have a positive (or negative) attitude toward them (Lin 2022b).

Objective list theorists often disagree about precisely what goes on the list, but the most commonly cited goods include happiness and pleasure, achievement, worthwhile knowledge, deep personal relationships, autonomy, aesthetic experience, and virtue (Hurka 2011; Rice 2013; Heathwood 2021: 7–8). Some of the more contentious questions about the relationship between disability and individual well-being concern what objective goods are indispensable for a good life and at what level of generality they should be described.

Martha Nussbaum, an influential objective list theorist, includes the following among her valuable capabilities and functionings: health, nourishment, shelter, sex, mobility; the ability to use one’s senses and to imagine, think, and reason; family and other relationships, attachments and love; living a life one has thought about and in some way chosen; laughter, play, and living in contact with the natural world (Nussbaum 1998; entry on The Capability Approach). It is difficult to see what unifies all of these different categories, but item by item there would probably be widespread agreement on their value and importance for individual well-being.

In earlier versions of her list, Nussbaum included capabilities, such as “the exercise of the five senses,” that many disabled people do not, and could not, possess. Because Nussbaum requires the possession of all of the basic capabilities for human flourishing, those earlier lists precluded the flourishing of many disabled people. Since roughly 2000, however, she has modified her individuation of capabilities to recognize the high levels of flourishing achieved by many people with disabilities. Her capabilities have become more general, in part because the more broadly they are framed, the less they are precluded by specific impairments. Thus, Nussbaum has gone from making the ability “to use the five senses” a condition of human flourishing—which would deny that blind or deaf people can flourish (Crocker 1995)—to reconceptualizing the capability as “being able to use the senses, to imagine, to think, to reason” (Nussbaum 2006), which she sees as encompassing experience from any combination of sensory modalities. This broader formulation makes human flourishing available to people who are blind or deaf.

Moreover, as Jerome Segal (1998) points out, most of us would agree that a life can go very well without one or more of the capabilities Nussbaum regards as essential. Indeed, the most successful lives of people lacking a single capability may go as well as the most successful lives of people with a full set of sensory and motor capabilities. Although a life could hardly go well without at least some of these capacities, there is no clear basis for establishing a minimum set.

More generally, objective list theories raise questions about whether and to what extent disabled people fare well or poorly in terms of specific prudential values or goods. In this vein, Daniel Brock (2005) maintains that while disabled people may flourish in terms of subjective components of well-being (due partly to adaptation; Sec. 5.3), they are likely to fare less well in terms of certain objective dimensions of well-being. Specifically, he thinks that serious disabilities can block or impede people’s access to certain valuable activities and experiences, which in turn can diminish the richness of their lives and their ability to exercise self-determination (Brock 2005: 69–75). In contrast, Campbell, Nyholm, and Walter (2021) have argued that prominent forms of impairment are in principle compatible with attaining key “goods of life”—namely, achievement, happiness, knowledge, and rewarding relationships. (For a challenge to their claims about achievement, see Dunkle 2024.)

As suggested above, it is plausible that people with a wide range of disabilities can access many of the “key goods of life” if we understand them broadly—e.g. close personal relationships, as opposed to narrower categories like romantic relationships, family relationships, and friendships. Another relevant consideration is Anita Silvers’ notion of “modes of functioning” (1998b). People with various disabilities may have atypical but effective means of realizing these more narrowly conceived goods. For example, many autistic people establish and maintain friendships in different ways than most neurotypical people, but those atypical friendships may be as deep and mutually rewarding. Professional wheelchair basketball can be just as skilled and intensely competitive as NBA basketball.

Not only are these key objective goods of life multiply realizable, they are also the sort of goods that are generally thought, and have been shown, to lead to subjective happiness and satisfaction (Seligman 2011). Moreover, objective lists often include happiness or satisfaction as constituents. For these reasons, it would not be surprising to find substantial overlap in the individuals judged to be flourishing by objective theories and by subjective theories (e.g., Adler and Decancq 2022: 164).

5.2 Disability and Subjective Theories of Well-Being

Some theories of well-being are subjective in the following sense: they imply that something is intrinsically or basically good for a person only if it involves, or is the object of, some specified pro-attitude of the subject (Heathwood 2014). The most popular examples are hedonism and desire-fulfillment theory. According to hedonism, positive experiences and negative experiences are what ultimately contribute to and detract from well-being. According to desire-fulfillment theory, what matters for well-being is the fulfillment of our desires—either some set of desires we actually have or some set of desires that we would have under idealized conditions.

These rival accounts of well-being clearly have different implications about the bearing of disability on individual well-being. If hedonistic theories are on the right track, whether disability reduces well-being depends on how it impacts the number or intensity of positive and negative experiences had by persons with disabilities. On these theories, the self-reports of persons with disabilities should carry considerable weight in assessments of well-being, at least if we grant that people tend to be in a good epistemic position to assess the quality of their own experiences. On desire-based accounts of well-being, self-reports also ought to carry considerable evidentiary weight—though people sometimes have limited epistemic access to their own desires, and especially to whether they have been or will be fulfilled.

Empirical research on the subjective well-being of people with disabilities relies on self-reports, and those reports do not confirm the grim views that third parties often have. Most people with disabilities report a high quality of life, much higher than non-disabled people estimate (Saigal and Rosenbaum 1996; Albrecht and Devlieger 1999; Gill 2000; Goering 2008). At the same time, these studies do not support the conclusion for which disability scholars frequently cite them: that disabled people rate their well-being roughly the same as non-disabled people. As Avram Hiller points out in a critical literature review (2023), most studies find that people with disabilities rate their well-being somewhat lower, and much lower in the case of certain disabilities. Hiller also argues that these studies suggest that not all the difference in self-rated well-being can be attributed to ableism. He does, however, find strong empirical support for the claim that most people with disabilities lead good lives. Hiller’s review is a useful corrective to the “no difference” assumption made by some disability scholars. But it appears fully consistent with a Complex Variation View to recognize that many or most disabilities are likely to make a person slightly worse off, and some are likely to make them substantially worse off.

5.3 Self-Reports, Adaptation, and Rival Theories of Well-Being

There have been different responses to empirical findings about disabled people’s well-being. Some disability scholars have been drawn to subjective metrics on the basis of their considered judgment that persons with disabilities can achieve levels of well-being that are at least comparable to those of their able-bodied counterparts. However, in line with a presumptive Harm View, others reject this possibility. Some accept the legitimacy of data about disabled people’s self-reported quality of life but regard the implication that persons with disabilities can achieve levels of well-being equal or similar to those of their able-bodied counterparts as a reductio ad absurdum of subjective accounts of well-being (Sen 1980; Crocker 1995; cf. Brock 2005).

Other philosophers and laypeople, however, are inclined to doubt the reliability of disabled persons’ self-reports that they are doing well. Some suspect that these ratings are deliberately overstated to take account of their expected discounting by non-disabled people. Others may regard them less as self-reports than as directives against pity or sympathy (as suggested by Shakespeare 2014: 97).

Even when self-reports are accepted as sincere, the accuracy of self-reported well-being is sometimes disputed (Menzel et al. 2002; Goering 2008; McClimans et al. 2013; Barnes 2009). Some psychologists and philosophers see those reports as distorted by adaptation or response-shift (Brock 2005: 68–75; Menzel et al. 2002; Murray 1996; McClimans et al. 2013). In the context of disability, adaptation refers to a group of processes through which newly disabled people change their habits, activities, and goals to accommodate their disabilities. Among those processes are developing new skills, changing comparison classes and goals, and habituating to pleasant or unpleasant experiences (Menzel et al. 2002). Although the first of these processes—the acquisition of new skills—might reflect a change in objective features of well-being, the latter two will primarily impact subjective aspects of well-being. For instance, habituating to unpleasant experiences might improve well-being under a hedonic account by making the individual feel less pain or more pleasure. Similarly, insofar as changing one’s goals involves changing one’s desires, and insofar as one’s new desire set is more satisfiable than one’s old desire set, the second process of adaptation would yield an improvement in well-being on the desire-fulfillment view. By contrast, on an objective account of well-being, mere habituation and goal-downsizing would not necessarily improve well-being except insofar as feelings of satisfaction and pleasure are included on the objective list. In this way, the phenomenon of adaptation highlights some of the differences among rival accounts of well-being.

The skeptical view of self-reports from disabled people draws on the notion of “adaptive preferences” found in international development ethics and political philosophy (Barnes 2009; Barnes 2016a: 119–142; Howard 2015; Terlazzo 2015a, 2015b; Begon 2020; Stramondo 2021; entry on Feminist Moral Psychology). The concept of adaptive preferences was first introduced by Jon Elster via Aesop’s fable about the fox who decided that the grapes he initially desired, but then realized he could not reach, must be sour and therefore undesirable (Elster 1983). His preference to avoid the grapes is taken to be problematically adaptive either because it was formed unreflectively in response to his perception that the grapes weren’t an option for him (Elster 1983) or because abstaining from eating the grapes is a suboptimal option (Nussbaum 2001). As a parallel, it is sometimes suspected that, like the fox, disabled people who evaluate their well-being as on par with non-disabled people have developed distorted preferences in response to their option set being constricted by disability (e.g. Murray 1996).

Various scholars have pushed back against the adaptive-preference dismissal of disabled people’s testimony (Amundson 2005, 2010; Goering 2008; Barnes 2016a: ch. 4; Mitchell 2018; Stramondo 2021). For example, focusing on the suboptimal-option version of adaptive preferences, Barnes notes that when the prudential badness of disability is itself in question, we cannot merely assume that disability objectively reduces well-being (and that, therefore, testimony to the contrary must be false). Dismissing the first-person “disability-positive” testimony of disabled people requires some sort of independent evidence. Without such independent evidence, Barnes argues, we risk allowing uncritical biases to shape our judgments about adaptive preferences.

Whatever the best criteria for identifying adaptive preferences might be, it is clear that they should be applied no differently to disability than to other high-impact conditions and events, like moving to another state or country, changing marital status, or having a child. Treating the self-reports of people with disabilities as especially or uniquely unreliable is a paradigm instance of epistemic injustice (Fricker 2007; Stramondo 2021).

Finally, it is important to recognize that much of the testimony of disabled people adduced in the debate over disability and well-being does not primarily concern their happiness or satisfaction. Rather, disabled individuals describe how they go about their lives and achieve many of the key goods of life in atypical ways. To offer one example, Connie Panzarino describes her life with significant disabilities in the following terms:

At 42 years of age I am mostly paralyzed; have full feeling; I cannot swallow food unless it has been pureed in a blender; use a BiPAP for respiratory problems; use a puff ‘n’ sip wheelchair; take medication for my heart, stomach and body pain; and must be repositioned by my PCAs every 20 minutes. I also run my private psychotherapy/art therapy practice; own my own home and van; serve on several boards; maintain my sexual relationship with my lesbian lover; pet my cat with my chin; take my blender out to dinner with friends (and blend lobster, or whatever I like); travel; show the artwork I make by mouth or computer; write; read; plant a garden, and on and on. I have made a choice to live as fully as I can. (1990: 7)

While disabled people, like everyone else, can cherry-pick the details of their daily lives to make them look objectively better than they are, their testimony does not require uncritical deference to claims about feelings and desires. It merely requires flexibility and imagination in appreciating different modes of flourishing—as well as the grain of salt with which almost all self-reports should be taken.

6. Implications for Theory and Practice

Public assumptions and attitudes about disability and well-being have had a profound, and profoundly adverse, impact on the lives and very existence of people with disabilities. The belief that conditions ranging from Down syndrome to quadriplegia are worse than, or almost as bad as, death has contributed to high rates of selective abortion for diagnosed disabilities and to the denial of life-saving interventions for disabled newborns (entry on Eugenics). Those beliefs also contribute to steep reductions in the quality-of-life ratings for various disabilities given by doctors and others (Harris 1987; Murray 1996; Gold, Stevenson, and Fryback 2002).

These are very serious concerns, but the focus in this section will be much narrower: on the implications of the current philosophical debate about disability and well-being for social practices and public policies. Those implications are more modest and less dire. Virtually no contemporary philosophers hold that a newborn with Down syndrome is likely to have a life not worth living or should be denied life-support. Similarly, virtually no contemporary philosophers maintain that judgments about the impact of disabilities on quality of life should be left exclusively to non-disabled people, or that their judgments accurately reflect that impact.

Does the debate outlined in previous sections have any clear implications for practice, policy, or research? The picture emerging from the preceding review is of disability as an extremely heterogeneous category, with enormous variation in its impact across different disabilities, social contexts, and individuals. While this does not preclude generalizations altogether, it permits only modest, highly qualified ones.

First, most conditions classified as disabilities are high-impact traits: the outcomes of acquiring a disability vary widely, but there is usually a significant impact, which may be on balance negative, positive, or roughly neutral.

Second, to adopt statistical terminology, the distributions of well-being for most disabilities will have high variance but will often have a somewhat negative mean in the actual world. Whether and to what extent this would remain true in a world without ableism remains, and will continue to remain, a matter of debate. There are difficult conceptual and normative questions in play—for instance, about how to distinguish harms and benefits attributable to “disability itself” as opposed to external factors, and how much and what kind of inclusionary measures justice requires for people with disabilities in a society of modest scarcity.

The growing appreciation of the heterogeneity of disabilities and the variability in their impact across conditions, individuals, and societies relates to several emerging trends in research, policy, and social practice:

1) There has been an increasing focus on narrower disability categories and their complex impacts, from autism to chronic pain syndrome. The biomedical and health policy literature has long focused on specific clinically defined disabilities. In part because of the heterogeneity of “disability” and the challenges of defining it, philosophers have also started to pay greater attention to specific disabilities.

2) In particular, there has been more interest in intellectual, psychiatric, and other “non-paradigm” disabilities (e.g. Kittay and Carlson 2010; Rodogno, Krause-Jensen, and Ashcroft 2016; Carter 2023). Several authors have taken up the important challenge of applying or adapting standard theories of well-being to intellectual and psychiatric disabilities (Rodogno, Krause-Jensen, and Ashcroft 2016; Kaposy 2018; Gould 2020, 2022).

3) Disagreements about the badness of non-terminal disabilities are entering the conversation about medically assisted dying in different ways. Chronic pain, major depression, and mental suffering in general are starting to be taken more seriously as potential candidates for assisted dying (Dembo, Schuklenk, and Reggler 2018). However, there is also legitimate concern about society’s willingness to permit assisted death when much of the harm it would address is due to social factors (Berens et al. 2022; Kim 2023). One can expect that arguments about how bad a serious but non-fatal condition is, or is likely to be, may well affect the willingness to find a patient’s request for medically assisted dying or euthanasia reasonable. The more harmful the disability is judged, the less likely is a request for assisted death to be perceived as evidence of impaired decision-making capacity.

4) Because the prudential impact of disability is complex and variable, the appropriate medical response to disability has been subject to ongoing debate and discussion. Scholars and advocates have argued that disability in general, and specific conditions like achondroplasia and autism in particular, do not need to be cured, and that the attempt to cure them can often be harmful (e.g. Barnes 2016a; Chapman and Bovell 2022).

In 2023, the United States’ National Institutes of Health (NIH) considered a proposal to modify its mission statement, so that “reducing disability” was no longer a goal—only “reducing illness.” This controversial proposal was debated (pro: Iezzoni and Swenor 2023, 2024; con: Jost 2024) and raised theoretically and practically challenging issues of how to distinguish illness from disability and how to distinguish research that seeks to improve life with a disability from research that seeks to reduce disability itself (Hersh et al. 2024).

Resistance to the goal of “reducing disability” arises in part from the recognition of disability as a source of personal value and social identity threatened by efforts at wholesale prevention or cure (Iezzoni and Swenor 2023, 2024). This resistance was reflected in, and reinforced by, the NIH designation of people with disabilities as a population with health disparities. That designation was informed by the social model, which attributes much of the ill health of people with disabilities to poor, ableist medical care (Reynolds 2024).

Further complexity arises from differences in the value placed on disability-associated features and the extent to which they are seen as essential to the disability. Most people with achondroplasia would likely welcome a cure for spinal stenosis, but many would likely decline growth-stimulating hormones (e.g., McGraw et al. 2022). Many autistic people would likely welcome a cure for epilepsy, and some would support treatments to boost the cognitive skills of those with “lower functioning” autism. However, many oppose therapy to “normalize” behavior (Hersh et al. 2024; Dwyer et al. 2024). The parents of children with Down syndrome strongly support measures to correct heart valve problems and prevent Alzheimer’s, but there is ambivalence about measures to improve cognitive functioning and significant opposition to facial normalization surgery (Mintz et al. 2024).

5) There is a growing interest in transition costs (Ness and Barclay 2023). In previous work, the psychological, social, and financial costs of becoming disabled were bracketed, the better to evaluate the prudential impact of “disability itself” (e.g. Barnes 2014). The challenges in isolating and evaluating disability in this way have started shifting attention to the “brackets”—to the costs of acquiring or of losing a disability. The growing interest in transitions may reflect an appreciation of disabilities as high-impact traits—not only does living with a disability have a widely varying impact on well-being, but so also does acquiring or losing a disability. It is widely appreciated that becoming disabled can be highly disruptive even for individuals who quickly adapt, though it is less commonly recognized that becoming non-disabled through biomedical intervention can also be highly disruptive (Wasserman 2020). The disruption caused by such significant transitions helps make sense not only of why so many people dread becoming disabled but also why a sizable proportion of disabled people express ambivalence or reluctance about the prospect of correction or cure.

6) Although it may have begun with T. M. Scanlon’s challenge to well-being as a “master value” (1998), there has been a recent trend toward regarding well-being as having less significance in areas ranging from personal decision-making to policies for the allocation of scarce healthcare resources.

First, several political philosophers have argued that overall well-being, under any standard account, has only limited or selective relevance, both in distributive and relational justice (Aas 2020; MacKay 2017). What matters most are specific “goods” like opportunities and access, as well as relationships of non-domination—and not primarily who gets what.

Second, there has been growing resistance to relying on standard quality-of-life (QoL) measures to set health research and development priorities (National Council on Disability 2019). In addition to ethical objections, the variability and unreliability of the results obtained from standard QoL instruments and techniques (in particular, Time Trade Offs and Standard Gambles) raise doubts about how useful they are for their intended purpose of valuing specific health conditions (Arnesen and Norheim 2003). Even before the Covid-19 pandemic, there were proposals to supplement QoL assessment with measures that treat all life-years as equal and take into account only expected length, not quality of life (Pearson 2019). The pandemic gave further impetus to this move, because legal, practical, and moral objections to Cost-Effectiveness Analysis—the standard technique used to assess the comparative value of health interventions—were sharpened by the prospect of applying it to choices among individual lives rather than just among medical treatments (Wasserman, Persad, and Millum 2020; Ne’eman et al. 2021).

7. Future Directions

Even if Complex Variation Views are plausible for disabilities in general, this naturally raises the question of whether generalizations might be made about the prudential impact of specific conditions. As noted in Section 6, some scholars have begun to defend or challenge Harm Views about narrower categories or specific conditions, such as intellectual disabilities (Kaposy 2018; Gould 2020, 2022; cf. Carter 2023), dementia (Weigel 2024), locked-in syndrome and the minimally conscious state (Shepherd 2020), deafness (Wallis 2020), and chronic pain (Nadelhoffer 2022). We can expect to see further disability-specific analyses along these lines.

Moreover, it is likely that philosophers will seek to delineate broader classes of disabilities by prudentially relevant features, rather than by biomedical properties or etiologies. Such reclassifications of disability may be useful in several ways: identifying bad-making (or good-making) features shared by disabilities across biomedical classifications; examining how those features relate to more general accounts of well- and ill-being; and focusing prevention and treatment on features that are uncontroversially (or less controversially) inimical to well-being.

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