Dreams and Dreaming

First published Thu Apr 9, 2015; substantive revision Mon Jan 26, 2026

Dreams, dreaming, and sleep have been discussed in diverse areas of philosophy ranging from epistemology to ethics, ontology, and more recently philosophy of mind and philosophy of cognitive science. This entry provides an overview of major themes in the philosophy of sleep and dreaming with a focus on Western philosophy and relevant scientific findings.

1. Dreams and epistemology

1.1 Cartesian dream skepticism

Dream skepticism has traditionally been the most widely discussed philosophical problem raised by dreaming (see Williams 1978; Stroud 1984). Its most famous formulation is the one presented by Descartes in the Meditations. There, skeptical doubts are employed “to demolish everything completely and start again right from the foundations” (AT 7:17, CSM 2:12) of certain, indubitable belief. The dreaming doubt is the first of two major skeptical doubts formulated in the Meditations; the second is the evil genius doubt (Newman 2023).

Descartes begins his investigation of the reliability of sensory-based beliefs by considering commonplace sensory illusions such as seeing things as too big or small. However, because such errors can easily be avoided by taking a closer look, these cases do not undermine the general reliability of sensory perception. By contrast, dreams suggest that even in a seemingly best-case scenario of sensory perception (Stroud 1984), and against our best efforts, we can be deceived. As Descartes puts it,

How often, asleep at night, am I convinced of just such familiar events — that I am here in my dressing-gown, sitting by the fire - when in fact I am lying undressed in bed! Yet at the moment my eyes are certainly wide awake when I look at this piece of paper; I shake my head and it is not asleep; as I stretch out and feel my hand I do so deliberately, and I know what I am doing. All this would not happen with such distinctness to someone asleep. Indeed! As if I did not remember other occasions when I have been tricked by exactly similar thoughts while asleep! (AT 7:19, CSM 2:13)

Descartes suggests that dreams and waking perception are qualitatively similar. Even the realistic experience of sitting dressed by the fire and looking at a piece of paper in one’s hands (Descartes 1641: I.5) is something that can, and according to Descartes often does, occur in a dream. From this, he concludes that all sensory-based beliefs, including beliefs about the external world and his own bodily existence, are dubitable.

Generally, two dreaming doubts can be distinguished: One undermines the judgment that we are ever awake (the Always Dreaming Doubt; see Newman 2023); the other undermines the judgment that we are presently awake (the Now Dreaming Doubt; see Newman 2023). There is textual evidence of both dreaming doubts in the Meditations (Newman 2023). Importantly, both versions rely on the thesis that dreams are qualitatively similar to waking experiences. Again, this allows for two readings: One, the thesis that dream and waking experiences seem qualitatively similar to the dreamer after awakening, and two, the thesis that dream and waking experiences seem qualitatively similar only while dreaming. A natural interpretation of the example of sitting by the fire is that dreams produce the full range of sensory experiences in a way that seems qualitatively similar to waking both while dreaming and after awakening (Newman 2023).

Combined with the Now Dreaming Doubt, the alleged similarity of dreaming and waking experience raises the possibility that at any given time, our sensory experiences can be deceptive and give rise to false beliefs; we would then be unable to tell which sensory-based beliefs are and which are not deceptive. Combined with the Always Dreaming Doubt, we get the idea that literally all of our sensory-based beliefs might be deceptive. Even the first case is concerning: even if we are sometimes awake, we can never rule out that we are now dreaming, and so we cannot tell which of our sensory-based beliefs to trust.

At the same time, the dreaming doubt is not a full-scale “epistemic demolition” tool (Newman 2023): Dreaming doubts target only sensory-based beliefs. By contrast, according to Descartes, that 2+3=5 or that a square has four sides is knowable even if he is now dreaming, because such beliefs are not based on sensory experiences. More generally:

although, in truth, I should be dreaming, the rule still holds that all which is clearly presented to my intellect is indisputably true. (Descartes 1641: V.15)

Such non-sensory based beliefs are subsequently targeted by the Evil Genius Doubt (Newman 2023). But for Descartes, the dreaming doubt, whatever its strength, does not on its own undermine our ability to engage in the project of pure, rational enquiry (Frankfurt 1970; but see Broughton 2002).

1.2 Earlier discussions of dream skepticism

Dream arguments have been a staple of philosophical skepticism since antiquity and were so well known that in his objections to the Meditations, Hobbes (1641) criticized Descartes for not having come up with a more original argument. Yet, Descartes’ version of the problem, more than any other, has generated philosophical discussion.

One reason might be that while Descartes considered dreams as raising a distinctive epistemological threat, earlier versions tended to touch upon dreams just briefly and alongside other examples of sensory deception. For example, in the Theaetetus (157e), Plato has Socrates discuss a defect in perception that is common to

dreams and diseases, including insanity, and everything else that is said to cause illusions of sight and hearing and the other senses,

leading to the conclusion that knowledge cannot be defined through perception.

Augustine (Against the Academics; Confessions) thought the dream problem could be contained, arguing that in retrospect, we can distinguish both dreams and illusions from genuine perception (Matthew 2005: chapter 8). By contrast, Montaigne (The Apology for Raymond Sebond) noted that wakefulness itself teems with reveries and illusions, which he thought to be more epistemologically concerning than nocturnal dreams.

Dreams also appear in the canon of standard skeptical arguments used by the Pyrrhonists. Again, the contrast between dreaming and waking is presented alongside a number of further contrasts (ranging from differences in how things perceptually appear to cultural differences), which all aim to induce in the reasoner a suspension of judgment (Diogenes Laertius, Lives of Eminent Philosophers; Sextus Empiricus, Outlines of Pyrrhonism). There is another sense, however, in which Pyrrhonian skepticism might lead to deeper ontological concerns than those typically raised in the context of dream arguments: If evidential conflicts, such as the ones aimed at in the contrasts used by the Pyrrhonists, can be resolved only by appeal to independent reasons, then there seems to be no obvious way to privilege one side over the other (Veber 2017). There may then be no independent reason to prefer sensory-based beliefs acquired while waking over those acquired while dreaming. This is very different from Descartes’ assumption in the Meditations that dreams are deceptive whereas perceptual experience in waking, at least in a best case scenario, is veridical.

1.3 Dreaming and other skeptical scenarios

In the Meditations, after discussing the dream argument, Descartes raises the possibility of an omnipotent evil genius determined to deceive us even in our most basic beliefs. Contrary to dream deception, Descartes emphasizes that the evil genius hypothesis is a mere fiction. Still, it radicalizes the dream doubt in two respects. One, where the dream argument leaves the knowability of certain general truths intact, these are cast in doubt by the evil genius hypothesis. Two, where the dream argument, at least on some readings, involves just temporary deception, the evil genius hypothesis has us permanently deceived.

One modernized version, the brain-in-a-vat thought experiment, says that if evil scientists placed your brain in a vat and stimulated it in just the right way, your conscious experience would be exactly the same as if you were still an ordinary, embodied human being (Putnam 1981). The Matrix-trilogy (Chalmers 2005) introduces a variation in that Matrixers unbeknownst to themselves live in a computer simulation. Unlike the brain-in-a-vat, they have bodies that are kept alive in pods, and flaws in the simulation allow some of them to bend its rules to their advantage.

While dream deception is typically cast as a regularly recurring actuality (cf.Windt 2011), brain-in-a-vat-style arguments are often thought to be merely logically or perhaps even nomologically possible. It has also been argued, however, that there might be good reasons for thinking that we actually live in a computer simulation (Bostrom 2003). Moreover, if we lend even some credence to radical skeptical scenarios, we need to consider whether this has consequences for how we act and how we live our lives (Schwitzgebel 2017).

Finally, even purely hypothetical skeptical scenarios may capitalize on the analogy with dreams to enhance their psychological force. Clark (2005) argues that the Matrix is compelling in part because it contains elements of “industrial-strength deception” in which both sensory experience and intellectual functioning are exactly the same as in standard wake-states, while other aspects are more similar to the compromised reasoning and bizarre shifts that are the hallmark of dreams.

1.4 Descartes’ solution to the dream problem and real-world dreams

At the end of the Sixth Meditation, Descartes suggests a solution to the dream problem that is tied to a reassessment of what it is like to dream. Contrary to his remarks in the First Meditation, he notes that dreams are only rarely connected to waking memories and are often discontinuous, as when dream characters suddenly appear or disappear. He then introduces the coherence test:

But when I perceive objects with regard to which I can distinctly determine both the place whence they come, and that in which they are, and the time at which they appear to me, and when, without interruption, I can connect the perception I have of them with the whole of the other parts of my life, I am perfectly sure that what I thus perceive occurs while I am awake and not during sleep. (Meditation VI. 24)

For all practical purposes, he has now found a mark by which dreaming and waking can be distinguished (cf. Meditation I.7). While the coherence test is not fail-safe, the threat of dream deception has been contained.

This shift in assessment of the dreaming doubt is related to the narrative style of the Meditations. The first-person narrator of the Meditations is supposed to exemplify everyone’s epistemic situation, illustrating the typical defects of the human mind. Readers are further drawn in by Descartes’ strategy of moving from commonsense examples towards more sophisticated philosophical claims (Frankfurt 1970). This style is modeled on meditations or spiritual exercises in traditional religious writing (Hatfield 2024).

Descartes’ remarks about the discontinuous and ad hoc nature of many dreams are backed up by empirical work on dream bizarreness (Revonsuo & Salmivalli 1995) and the widespread assumption that bizarreness is a distinctive and pervasive feature of dreaming (but see Rosen 2018b, Kirberg 2022 for critical discussion). Still, many of his critics were not convinced. Even if Descartes’ revised phenomenological description of dreaming characterizes most dreams, one might occasionally merely dream of successfully performing the test (Hobbes 1641), and in some dreams, one might seem to have a clear and distinct idea but this impression is false (Bourdin 1641). Both the coherence test and the criterion of clarity and distinctness would then be unreliable.

How considerations of empirical plausibility impact the dream argument continues to be a matter of debate. Grundmann (2002) appeals to scientific dream research to introduce an introspective criterion, proposing that when we introspectively notice that we are able to engage in critical reflection, we have good reason to think that we are awake and not dreaming. Empirical considerations may also, however, enhance the threat of the dreaming doubt, at least in certain situations and for certain people (Windt 2015a). For example, dream-reality confusion is prominent in people with narcolepsy. False beliefs resulting from unrecognized dreams can persist for days or weeks and lead to actions that have personal and sometimes even legal consequences (Wamsley et al. 2014).

Because the Cartesian version of the dreaming doubt builds upon the supposed similarity between dreaming and waking perception, it is closely linked to questions not just about empirical plausibility, but about the ontology of dreaming. While questions on the ontology of dreaming have gained prominence in the philosophy of dreaming since the mid 20th century, these are often raised in the context of epistemological questions or even cast as responses to Cartesian dream skepticism.

2. The ontology of dreams

Since the middle of the 20th century, questions about the nature of dream experience have been at the forefront of philosophical work on dreaming. Often, claims about the ontology of dreaming have been proposed as a solution to dream skepticism, for instance, by denying that idea that dreams are experiences at all, or that they are experiences of the relevant kind to be deceptive.

In this entry, and consistent with much of the philosophical literature on the ontology of dreaming, the term “conscious experience” is used as an umbrella term for the occurrence of sensations, thoughts, impressions, emotions etc. in dreams (cf. Dennett 1976). These are all phenomenal states: there is something it is like to be in these states for the subject of experience (cf. Nagel 1974). To ask about dream experience is to ask whether it is like something to dream while dreaming, and whether what it is like is similar to (or relevantly different from) corresponding waking experiences.

2.1 Are dreams experiences?

The most influential denial of dream experience was formulated by Norman Malcolm (1956, 1959), though important aspects were foreshadowed by Wittgenstein and others (1953: 184; see Chihara 1965 for discussion, Bouwsma 1945, and Macdonald 1953). At the heart of Malcolm’s argument was the idea that sleep is opposed to consciousness: “if a person is in any state of consciousness it logically follows that he is not sound asleep” (Malcolm 1956: 21), implying that dreams occurring in sound sleep are not experiences. Malcolm further argued that that first-person, past-tense reports of dreaming, despite being superficially similar to first-person, past-tense psychological reports of waking experiences, have a different grammar and hence different meaning. In particular, he denied that dream reports imply the occurrence of experiences (such as thoughts, feelings, or judgements) in sleep:

If a man had certain thoughts and feelings in a dream it no more follows that he had those thoughts and feelings while asleep, than it follows from his having climbed a mountain in a dream that he climbed a mountain while asleep. (Malcolm 1959/1962: 51–52)

Malcolm (1956) initially formulated his rejection of dream experience as a response to Cartesian dream skepticism. Later (Malcolm 1959/1962), his main target became scientific dream research, which gained traction following the discovery of REM (rapid eye movement) sleep and its alleged association with dreaming (Dement & Kleitman 1957). Malcolm (1959/1962) particularly objected to the proposal that the physiological characteristics of REM sleep are objective markers of the occurrence and duration of dreaming in preceding sleep periods (Dement & Kleitman 1957). According to Malcolm, adopting a physiological criterion of dreaming (such as EEG measures of brain activity during sleep, but also outward behavior such as sleeptalking or sleepwalking) would change the concept of dreaming; by contrast, Malcolm regarded retrospective reports as the only criterion of dreaming and considered attempts to establish an objective science of dreaming to be misguided.

Malcolm’s analysis of dreaming was widely criticized as assuming an overly strict form of verificationism as well as a naïve view of language and conceptual change. Many of his critics objected that justification does not depend on strict criteria with the help of which the truth of a statement can be determined with absolute certainty, but “on appeals to the simplicity, plausibility, and predictive adequacy of an explanatory system as a whole” (Chihara & Fodor 1965: 197). This leaves open that behavioral and/or physiological evidence may, contra Malcolm, be used to verify dream reports (Ayer 1960).

For example, Putnam argued that

the lexicographer would undoubtedly perceive the logical (or semantical) connection between being a pediatrician and being a doctor, but he would miss the allegedly “logical” character of the connection between dreams and waking impressions. […] this “depth grammar” kind of analyticity (or “logical dependence”) does not exist. (Putnam 1962 [1986]: 306)

And Nagel pointed out that even if one accepts Malcolm’s analysis of the concept of dreaming,

it is a mistake to invest the demonstration that it is impossible to have experiences while asleep with more import than it has. It is an observation about our use of the word “experience”, and no more. It does not imply that nothing goes on in our minds while we dream. (Nagel 1959: 114)

Overall, the upshot was that the question of dream experience, or whether dream thoughts, feelings or beliefs should count as real instances of their kind, should be considered an open empirical question, and no conceptual contradiction is involved in saying one has experiences in sleep.

Dennett used an extended thought experiment to argue that settling the question of dream experience requires independent empirical evidence. Dennett’s (1976, 1979) cassette theory says dreams are the product of instantaneous memory insertion at the moment of the awakening, as if a cassette with pre-scripted dreams had been inserted into memory, ready for replay. While there would then be something it is like to remember dreaming after awakening, there would be nothing it is like to dream while asleep. Like Malcolm, Dennett was skeptical of the idea that dreams are experiences. However, while Malcolm regarded dream reports as the sole criterion of dreaming, Dennett argued that dream reports cannot be used to distinguish between the cassette theory and the idea that dreams are experiences. Moreover, for Dennett, the unreliability of dream recall was not unique, but exemplified a broader problem with memory reports, such that we generally cannot use retrospective recall to distinguish conscious experience from memory insertion (Dennett 1991; see also Emmett 1978).

The cassette theory of dreaming was predated by earlier proposals that dreams unfold in a single instant in sleep, rather than sequentially and at a pace similar to waking experiences. Maury (1861) described a long and complex dream about the French revolution that culminated in his execution at the guillotine, at which point he awoke to find that the headboard had fallen on his neck. Because the dream seemed to systematically build up to this dramatic conclusion, which in turn coincided with a sudden external event, he suggested that such cases were best explained as instantaneous memory insertions experienced at the moment of awakening. Similarly, Gregory (1916) described dreams as psychical explosions to highlight their instantaneous occurrence at the moment of awakening.

Contemporary philosophers tend to agree that dreams are experiences and this view is supported by empirical evidence from sleep physiology (Flanagan 2000; Metzinger 2003; Revonsuo 2006; Windt 2013, 2015a). A first reason for thinking that dreams are experiences during sleep is the relationship between dreaming and REM (rapid eye movement) sleep. Researchers in the 1950s discovered that sleep is not a uniform state of rest and passivity, but there is a complex sleep architecture involving different stages of sleep that is relatively stable both within and across individuals (Aserinsky & Kleitman 1953, 1955; Dement & Kleitman 1957). Following sleep onset, periods of non-REM (or NREM) sleep including slow wave sleep (so called because of the presence of characteristic slow-wave, high-voltage EEG activity) are followed by periods of high-frequency, low-voltage activity during REM sleep, resembling waking EEG. Reports of dreaming are much more frequent following REM (81.9%) than NREM sleep awakenings (43%; Nielsen 2000). REM sleep is additionally characterized by rapid eye movements and a near-complete loss of muscle tone (Dement 1999: 27–50; Jouvet 1999), potentially explaining the absence of outwardly observable behavior during dreams.

A second line of evidence comes from lucid dreams, or dreams in which one knows one is dreaming and often has some level of dream control (Voss et al. 2013; Voss & Hobson 2015; Baird et al. 2019). The term lucid dreaming was coined by van Eeden (1913), but Aristotle (On Dreams) already noted that one can sometimes be aware while dreaming that one is dreaming. Scientific evidence that lucid dreaming is real and a genuine sleep phenomenon comes from laboratory studies (Hearne 1978; LaBerge et al. 1981) showing lucid dreamers can use specific, pre-arranged patterns of eye movements (e.g., right-left-right-left) to signal in real-time that they are now lucid. These signals are clearly identifiable on the EOG (electrooculography) and suggest a correspondence between dream-eye movements and real-eye movements. Such signal-verified lucid dreams have even been used for real-time communication between dreamers and experimenters, with lucid dreamers responding to sound cues (Baird et al. 2021). Retrospective reports confirm that the dreamer really was lucid and signalled lucidity (Dresler et al. 2012; Stumbrys et al. 2014).

Signal-verified lucid dreams have been used for studying muscular activity accompanying subjective body movements in dreams (Erlacher et al. 2003; Dresler et al. 2011), for advanced EEG analysis of brain activity during lucid dreaming (Voss et al. 2009), and for imaging studies (Dresler et al. 2011, 2012). Eye signals can also be used to measure the duration of different activities performed in lucid dreams; contrary to the cassette theory, lucid dreams have temporal extension and certain dream actions even seem to take slightly longer than in waking (Erlacher et al. 2014). There have also been attempts to induce lucidity through non-invasive electrical stimulation during sleep (Stumbrys et al. 2013; Voss et al. 2014: Carr et al. 2020). The combination of signal-verified lucid dreaming with volitional control over dream content, retrospective report, and objective sleep measures has been proposed to provide controlled conditions for the study of conscious experience in sleep and a new methodology for investigating the relationship between conscious experience and neurophysiological processes (Baird et al. 2019).

A third line of evidence (Revonsuo 2006: 77) comes from dream-enactment behavior (Nielsen et al. 2009), most prominently in patients with REM-sleep behavior disorder (RBD; Schenck & Mahowald 1996; Schenck 2005; Leclair-Visonneau et al. 2010). Due to a loss of the muscular atonia that accompanies REM sleep in healthy subjects, these patients show complex, seemingly goal-directed outward behaviors such as running or fighting off an attacker during REM sleep. Retrospective dream reports often match these behaviors, suggesting that patients literally act out their dreams during sleep.

Taken together, these lines of evidence have been interpreted as empirically supporting the claim that REM dreams are experiences (Revonsuo 2006). Moreover, dream reports obtained following timed awakenings, often together with physiological measures from the preceding sleep period, are regarded as the gold standard in dream research, and it has been argued that under these conditions, dream reports can be regarded as trustworthy sources of evidence about experiences in the preceding sleep period (Windt 2013, 2015a). There have, however, also been proposals for an updated form of skepticism about dreams, such that empirical evidence for the fleeting nature of dream recall is leveraged to cast doubt upon the trustworthiness of dream reports (Rosen 2013, 2024b).

These differences notwithstanding, the contemporary philosophical debate on the evidential status of dream reports with respect to dream experience has shifted from principled and theoretical questions about verification and meaning to consideration of specific lines of empirical evidence that is often seen to either support or undermine the trustworthiness of certain types or aspects of dream reports (e.g. reports of dreaming in color; Schwitzgebel 2002, 2011). It has been suggested that while the philosophical debate in the second half of the 20th century centered on a single report problem, which concerned whether dream reports count as evidence for the occurrence of experiences during sleep, this has now been replaced by a number of different report problems that raise specific methodological questions about which kind of dream report (such as free dream reports, but also questionnaires and phenomenological interviews) and which types of analysis (such as self- vs external ratings) are most suitable for investigating different questions about dreaming (Demšar and Windt 2024) and how to balance conflicting results.

2.2 What kinds of conscious experience are dreams?

With increasing philosophical consensus that dreams are experiences, focus has shifted to how best to describe the kinds of experience involved in dreaming. An important question is whether dreaming is a sui generis type of experience or one that is best described in familiar wake-state terms. In the first option, dreams might still bear deep similarity to different wake states such as imagination and perception, but in a way that requires a description of their own (Windt 2020). The most widely discussed contrast for the second option is that between saying that dreams are perceptual (hallucinatory or illusory) experiences vs imaginings. A related but separate question is whether to dream just is to perceive, hallucinate, imagine, mind wander, or remember (in a certain way), or whether dreams rather contain perceptions, hallucinations, imaginings, memories etc. The latter allows that dreams contain a mixture of different mental states or that there is even variation across (different types of) dreaming. For example, a pluralist can allow that some aspects of dreaming are hallucinatory, others involve imaginings, and yet again others illusory (Rosen 2018b). Yet another approach that avoids strong ontological commitments is to compare dreams (or particular dream phenomena) to wake-state perception, hallucination, imagination and so on (Windt & Noreika 2011). Often, these different approaches will be intertwined to some degree.

2.2.1 Perception, hallucination, and illusion

The standard view is that dreams have the same phenomenal character as waking perception in that they seemingly put us in contact with mind-independent objects, yet no such object is being perceived. This means dreams count as hallucinations in the traditional philosophical sense (Crane & French 2017; Macpherson 2013, 2024). Even if, in a particularly realistic dream, my visual experience subjectively seemed exactly as it would if I were awake (say, I could see the sun coming in through the window and the pattern of my bed sheets), I would not, while dreaming and lying asleep in bed with my eyes closed, be seeing anything.

The assumption of phenomenological equivalence between dream and waking experience is exemplified by Descartes’ observation that even when dreaming,

it is certain that I seem to see light, hear a noise, and feel heat; this cannot be false, and this is what in me is properly called perceiving (sentire). (Descartes 1641: II.9)

This idea is also central to the virtual reality metaphor, according to which consciousness itself is dreamlike and waking perception a kind of online hallucination modulated by the senses (Llinás & Ribary 1994; Llinás & Paré 1991; Revonsuo 2006; Metzinger 2003, 2009). This metaphor finds its philosophical expression in simulation theory (Revonsuo et al. 2015), which defines dream experience through its self-in-a-world structure (Revonsuo 2006: 84). Again, a natural reading is that dreaming feels exactly like waking perception, it is only the connection to the external world that is different (i.e., dreaming is offline as external stimulus processing is blocked or at least diminished during REM sleep).

LaBerge and colleagues (2018) recently showed that eye tracking of objects is smooth in lucid dreaming and perceiving, but not in imagining. Drawing from this evidence, Rosen (2021) suggests many dreams mimic the phenomenology of interacting with a stable world, including eye movements and visual search. A potential problem is that especially for subtle perceptual activities (such as visual search), we might not know enough about dream phenomenology to make any strong claims about whether dreams typically (or even just potentially) replicate waking perceptual experience (Nielsen 2010). Specifying points of similarity leads to a more nuanced view, in which some dreams and/or some aspects of dreaming might be more perception-like while others resemble imagination (Windt 2015a). For example, visual imagery might be quite different from touch sensations, which tend to be rare in dreams (Hobson 1988). And visual dream imagery itself might overall resemble waking perception but lack color saturation, background detail and focus (Rechtschaffen & Buchignani, 1992). Classifying dreams as either hallucinations or imaginings is further complicated by the fact that there is strong overlap in cortical activity associated with both visual imagery and perception (Zeidman & Maguire, 2016).

While the standard view says that dreams are (or involve) hallucinations, another way to make sense of the claim that dreaming has the same phenomenal character as waking perception is to say that dreams are illusory: they involve misperception of an external object as having different properties than it actually has (cf. Smith 2002; Crane & French 2021). The illusion view disagrees with the hallucination view on whether dreams have an appropriate and contemporaneous external stimulus source.

The illusion view has fallen out of favor but has a long history. It has predecessors in the ancient belief that dreams have bodily sources and that dream interpretation can thus be used to diagnose illness, as practiced in the shrines at Epidaurus (Galen On Diagnosis in Dreams; van de Castle 1994). Aristotle (On Dreams) thought some dreams are caused by indigestion, and Hobbes adopted this view, claiming different kinds of dreams could be traced to different bodily sensations. For instance, “lying cold breedeth Dreams of Feare, and raiseth the thought and Image of some fearfull object” (Hobbes 1651: 91).

Appeals to the bodily sources of dreaming became especially popular in the 19th and early 20th centuries. These views were extensively discussed and critiqued in Freud’s (1899) Interpretation of Dreams, which foregrounded the psychic sources of dreaming. Some proponents of “Leibreiztheorie” (or somatic-stimulus theory) of dreaming linked specific dream themes such as flying to sleeping position (Macnish 1838; Scherner 1861; Vold 1910/1912; Ellis 1911) and realizing, in sleep, that one’s feet are not touching the ground (Bergson 1914). Others attempted to explain the phenomenology of dreaming by appealing to the absence of outward physical movement during sleep. The lack of appropriate feedback and of movement and touch sensations was thought to cause dreams of being unable to move (Bradley 1894) or of trying but failing to do something (Gregory 1918). There were also early attempts to go beyond anecdotal observations of a correspondence between dream sensations and sleeping body by conducting controlled experiments to pinpoint the causal contribution of sensory stimulation and changes in room temperature, breathing, or sleeping position to dream experience (Weygandt 1893, Schredl 2010 for details).

More recently, attempts to systematically manipulate features of dream experience have been discussed under the heading of dream engineering (Carr et al. 2020). Such dream engineering techniques comprise various kinds of sensory stimulation either before or during sleep. They are often inspired by virtual reality technologies and additionally draw from insights about external stimulus processing during different sleep stages. Importantly, dream engineering recognizes the often idiosyncratic and top-down sources of dream generation, including an individual’s previous experiences, memories, and biases. According to Carr and colleagues (2021, p.3),

The dream emerges in a co-creative manner: real body sensation contributes to dream generation just as individual experience shapes dream narrative, which manifests in further body sensation, and so on, completing the dreaming circuitry.

In consequence, dream engineering focuses on manipulating simple attributes of sleep and dreaming rather than attempting to control entire dream narratives.

Importantly, saying that dreams can be prompted by external stimuli and that in some cases these are best described as illusions is different from the stronger claim, sometimes advanced by historical proponents of somatic-stimulus theory, that dreams generally are caused by external or bodily stimuli. As an example of the stronger claim, consider Wundt’s proposal that the

ideas which arise in dreams come, at least to a great extent, from sensations, especially from those of the general sense, and are therefore mostly illusions of fancy, probably only seldom pure memory ideas which hence become hallucinations. (Wundt 1896: 179)

Generally, it seems external and bodily stimuli can be related to varying degrees to dream and sleep onset imagery (Nielsen 2017; Windt 2018; Windt et al. 2016). Some of these cases appear to fit the standard concept of illusion, as when the sound of the alarm clock is experienced, in a dream, as a siren, or when blood pressure cuff inflation on the leg leads to dreams of wearing strange shoes (Windt 2018; for these and other examples, see Nielsen et al. 1995). In other cases, such as when blood pressure cuff stimulation on the leg is projected to another dream character, prompting a dream of seeing someone else’s leg being run over, describing this as illusory misperception might be less straightforward.

Such cases might illustrate the extent to which perceptual experience, both in general and in dreaming in particular, is more varied than the standard distinction between hallucinations and illusions allows. Macpherson (2024) has recently argued that to make sense of the varied nature of dream phenomena, we need to allow for further categories of hallucination and illusion, allowing for a more nuanced distinction between different perceptual, hallucinatory, and illusory phenomena in dreams on the one hand, and variation in correspondence between dream experience and external and bodily sources on the other hand. While the traditional view contrasts property illusions (involving misperception of the properties of a mind-independent object) with hallucinations in which one has a seeming perception of an object where no such mind-independent object is being perceived, Macpherson proposes additional types of illusions and hallucinations, such as property hallucinations in which a mind-independent object is perceived but some of its properties are hallucinated. She notes that her nuanced framework of illusions and hallucinations will allow for a more precise description of the outcomes of dream engineering attempts.

In sum, it seems likely that appeals to external or bodily stimuli on their own cannot fully explain dream imagery. Sensory incorporation in dreams is often hard to predict and indirect; associated imagery seems related not just to stimulus intensity, but also to short- and long-term memories. Again, a full explanation of dream content additionally has to take the cognitive and memory sources of dreaming into account (Windt 2018; Nielsen 2017; cf. Silberer 1919).

2.2.2 Imagination, dream imagery, and dream belief

The most important rival to the hallucination view is that dreams are imaginings (for a general discussion of imagination, see Liao & Gendler 2020). This can mean that dream imagery involves imaginings rather than percepts (including hallucinations or illusions; McGinn 2004), that (so-called) dream beliefs are imaginings and not real instances of belief (Sosa 2007), or both (Ichikawa 2008, 2009). The reasons for adopting the imagination view are diverse, and dreaming has been proposed to resemble imagining along a number of dimensions (e.g. McGinn 2004, 2005a,b; Thomas 2014). This issue is further complicated by the fact that there is little agreement on the definition of imagination and its relation to perception (Kind 2013).

Generally, we can separate two questions: One, which mental states in dreams count as real instances of their kind, and which are mere imaginings? And two, how (if at all) does the ontological status of dream experiences relate to other philosophical questions, in including epistemological questions about dream deception?

An important question for the imagination view is whether dreaming involves presence or the feeling of being in a world, which many believe is central to waking perception. Some imagination theorists have compared the sense in which we feel present in dreams to cognitive absorption, as when we are lost in a novel, film, or vivid daydream (Sartre 1940; McGinn 2004; but see Hering 1947; Globus 1987). Similarly, Soteriou (2024) proposes that when we dream, we represent a spatiotemporal perspective relative to the dream environment and dream persons and objects, but do not occupy this spatiotemporal perspective in the same way as we do in waking. Others accept the central claim of simulation views that dreams are immersive and involve the experience of a self-in-a-world (Revonsuo 2006), but argue this is consistent with dreams being imaginings (Thompson 2014, Lawson and Thompson 2024).

Another question is whether dreams are subject to the will (Ichikawa 2009). This is important because imagination is often characterized as active and under our control (Wittgenstein 1967: 621, 633), involving “a special effort of the mind” (Descartes 1641: VI, 2), whereas perception is thought to be passive (but see Thomas 2014 for critical discussion). Because dreams seemingly happen to us, this might seem to count against their being imaginings. Ichikawa (2009), however, argues for a more nuanced view, in which lucid control dreams show that dreams are generally subject to the will even where they are not under our deliberate control.

Recently, the imagination view has been assessed in light of growing evidence on aphantasia. Aphantasia involves an often lifelong impairment in imagery generation (Zeman et al. 2015, 2016). Importantly, while subjects with aphantasia report an inability to voluntarily generate imagery, they often still experience involuntary imagery, including dreams (Dawes et al. 2020). According to Whiteley (2021), the persistence of dreams in aphantasia is an empirical counterargument to versions of the imagination view in which dreaming involves an agential form of mental imagery, in the way suggested by Ichikawa (2009). She argues that if dreams are imaginings, they must involve a passive, non-agential form of imagination.

As many philosophers have pointed out, the imagination view has consequences for Cartesian dream skepticism. Many have pointed out that if dream pain does not feel like real pain, one need only pinch oneself to determine whether one is now dreaming (Nelson 1966; Stone 1984; but see Hodges & Carter 1969; Kantor 1970). If one further accepts the common assumption that imagined pain lacks the bite of real pain, this could support the imagination view of dreaming. As Locke put it,

if our dreamer pleases to try, whether the glowing heat of a glass furnace, be barely a wandering imagination in a drowsy man’s fancy, by putting his hand into it, he may perhaps be wakened into a certainty greater than he could wish, that it is something more than bare imagination. (Locke 1689: IV.XI.8)

For the faint-hearted, other tests might be available. Gregory (2024) recently proposed that we can determine whether we are now perceiving something in a particular sensory modality (as opposed to imagining while awake or dreaming) by trying to imagine something in the same sensory modality. This is because we cannot, it seems, have separate imagistic experiences in the same sensory modality at the same time. For instance, you cannot visually imagine, say, your office (the keyboard on your desk, your computer screen, and the white wall behind it) while also visually imagining a magical fairy-filled forest. By contrast, you can visually perceive your current surroundings while visually imagining a scene. This limitation on imagination (and dreaming, if the imagination view of dreaming is correct) is related to the alleged attention-dependence of dreaming, or the idea that dream experience is exhausted by what is the focus of selective attention and has no foreground-background structure (Hunter 1983; Thompson 2014).

If dream imagery involves imagining as opposed to quasi-perception, this raises the question why we tend to describe dreams in the same terms as waking perception. Maybe this is because most people have not thought deeply about such ontological questions but would find the imagination view plausible if they considered it (Ichikawa 2009). Or maybe

it is just because we all know that dreams are throughout unlike waking experiences that we can safely use ordinary expressions in the narration of them. (Austin 1962: 42)

The philosophical discussion on the imagination view is complemented by and often draws from cognitive theories of dreaming. Foulkes (1978: 5) describes dreaming as a form of thinking with its own grammar and syntax, but allows that dream imagery is sufficiently perception-like to deceive us. Domhoff’s neurocognitive model of dreaming (2001, 2003) emphasizes the dependence of dreaming on visuospatial skills and on a network including the association areas of the forebrain. The theory draws from findings on the partial or global cessation of dreaming following brain lesions (cf. Solms 1997, 2000), evidence that dreaming develops gradually and in tandem with visuospatial skills in children (Foulkes 1993a, 1999; but see Resnick et al. 1994), and results from dream content analysis supporting the continuity of dreaming with waking concerns and memories (the so-called continuity hypothesis; see Domhoff 2001, 2003; Schredl & Hofmann 2003; Schredl 2006; see also Nir & Tononi 2010).

Aside from questions about the relationship between dream imagery, sensory imagination, and percepts, some versions of the imagination view argue that so-called dream beliefs are not real beliefs, but propositional imaginings (here, for ease of reading, I use the term “dream belief”, but note that whether these count as real beliefs is precisely the issue at hand). Again, this latter question is complicated by the fact that different accounts of belief exist. Also, the debate about dream beliefs is paralleled by a debate about whether delusions are beliefs or imaginings (see Currie 2000; Currie & Ravenscroft 2002; McGinn 2004; Bayne & Pacherie 2005; Bortolotti 2009). Both debates might plausibly inform each other, especially as dreams are sometimes proposed to be delusional (Hobson 1999).

Ichikawa (2009) argues that dream beliefs lack connection with perceptual experience and fail to motivate actions; consequently, dream beliefs do not play the same functional role as real beliefs. Moreover, we cannot ascribe dream beliefs to a person by observing them lying asleep in bed. Dream beliefs are often inconsistent with longstanding waking beliefs and acquired and discarded without any process of belief revision (Ichikawa 2009). He concludes that if we adopt interpretationist or dispositionalist accounts of belief, dream beliefs fall short of real beliefs.

As is the case for dream imagery, the analysis of dream beliefs has consequences for skepticism. If dream beliefs are propositional imaginings, then we do not falsely believe while dreaming that we are now awake, but only imagine that we do (Sosa 2007). It is not clear, however, that this protects us from deception: in mistaking dream beliefs for the real thing, we would now be deceived about the status of our own mental states (Ichikawa 2008).

It is also not clear whether the same type of argument extends to mental states other than beliefs. As Lewis points out, a person might

in fact believe or realize in the course of a dream that he was dreaming, and even if we said that, in such case, he only dreamt that he was dreaming, this still leaves it possible for someone who is asleep to entertain at the time the thought that he is asleep. (Lewis 1969: 133)

Mental states other than believing such as entertaining, thinking, or minimally appraisive instances of taking for granted might be sufficient for deception (Reed 1979).

2.2.3 Dreaming, daydreaming, and waking mind wandering

A number of researchers have begun to consider dreaming in relation to mind wandering. Mind wandering is frequent in wakefulness and involves thoughts and attention drifting away from ongoing tasks and/or the here and now. Mind wandering has been variously defined (Seli et al. 2018; Christoff et al. 2018; Irving & Glasser 2020) and different constructs such as task-unrelated thought, stimulus-independent thought, or freely moving thoughts plausibly refer to different phenomena (Smallwood & Schooler 2015; Christoff et al. 2016).

Based on phenomenological and neurophysiological similarities, dreams have been proposed to be an intensified form of waking mind wandering (Domhoff 2011; Wamsley 2013; Fox et al. 2013). The Dynamic Framework (Christoff et al. 2016) places dreaming on a continuum with mind wandering and posits that both are distinguished by progressively weaker deliberate constraints as compared to focused attention in wakefulness. Similarly, hallucinations have been suggested to be an intensified form of mind wandering, partly based on their similarity with REM sleep dreaming (Fazekas 2021).

In the context of mental agency, Metzinger (2013a,b, 2015) describes dreams and waking mind wandering as involving a cyclically recurring loss of mental autonomy, or the ability to deliberately control one’s conscious thought processes. In this view, dreams and waking mind wandering are not mental actions but unintentional mental behaviors. By contrast, Windt and Voss (2018) use the example of lucid control dreams, where dreamers realize they are dreaming and can exert some degree of control over the unfolding dream, to propose that spontaneous processes including imagery formation can co-exist alongside more deliberate, top-down control; they also argue that metacognitive insight and control themselves can have spontaneous elements.

The discussion of dreaming and mind wandering has also been used to reconsider how we think about the behavioral states of sleep and wakefulness in relation to conscious experience. Traditionally, it has often been assumed that the contrast between behavioral states is reflected in a contrast in associated conscious states, such that dreaming, as sleep-related experience, is sharply distinguished from waking consciousness. The alleged continuity between dreaming and waking mind wandering, however, casts doubt on this idea. Windt (2020) argues that if we take a broad view of both the range of sleep-related experiences and of waking mind wandering, we find plausible examples of the same kinds of mental state occurring in sleep and wakefulness. In other cases, sleep-related experiences may indeed be intensified along certain dimensions compared to waking mind wandering. In a similar vein, Kirberg (2022) argues that bizarreness, which has often been considered as unique to dreaming, is in fact frequent in waking mind wandering as well. Moreover, where bizarreness has often been regarded as an example of the cognitive deficiency that allegedly marks dreaming, Kirberg proposes that it is an expression of spontaneous, associative, and weakly constrained thought.

Lawson and Thompson (2024) draw from theoretical proposals and empirical findings to present a careful phenomenological analysis of daydreaming in contrast to mind wandering, waking imagination, and night-dreaming. They argue that daydreaming involves a particular type of spontaneous, immersive imagination in wakefulness, which is distinguished to different degrees from other spontaneous thoughts and experiences as well as from waking imagination. In their view, daydreams arise spontaneously in the relative absence of deliberate guidance, making them similar to mind wandering in some respects. Yet, daydreams exhibit greater dynamic stability as well as greater narrative and affective salience than mind wandering, and in this regard more strongly resemble more immersive night-dreams.

Moving forward, an important challenge is to more precisely describe the relationship not just between different kinds of spontaneous thoughts in waking and sleep, but also to work towards an integrated account of different kinds of mind wandering and imagination. Care should be taken to distinguish mind wandering from imagining. Not all mind wandering (such thoughts drifting, during an important meeting, to your grocery shopping list) involves imagining; and conversely, e.g. deliberate or task-oriented sensory imagining would not count as mind wandering. Making sense of the relationship between mind wandering and imagination by working towards a nuanced view stands to inform debates on the ontology of dreaming, and vice versa.

2.2.4 Dreaming, memory, and dream reports

Recently, there has been a flurry of renewed interest in the relationship between dreaming, memory, and dream reports. Three types of question can be distinguished (Gregory & Michaelian 2024b): One, how we remember and report our dreams; two, the status of memory within dreams; and three, the broader comparison between dreaming and remembering, and between dream and waking memory reports.

The first question about how we remember our dreams—and indeed whether dream recall is a form of memory at all—relates closely to the debate about dream experience initiated by Malcolm (1956, 1959) following the discovery of REM sleep. On the side of skepticism, we have the idea that dream reports are not memory reports at all: dreams are not, in this view, experiences, and so reporting a dream is not a genuine instance of reporting or remembering past experiences during sleep (Malcolm 1959). A slightly different position is to deny that dream recall has evidential status with respect to dreams and whether dreams are experiences needs to be decided by independent means (Dennett 1976).

Another family of views allows that dreams (or at least some dreams; Rosen 2024) are experiences, but distrusts dream reports. Rosen (2013) has defended a narrative fabrication view of dream reports, and Copenhaver (2024) has argued that even when we have a memory experience of having dreamed of an event that actually happened, this does not count as a memory: Because dreams do not acquaint us with the objects, properties, persons, and events they represent, our memory experiences of having dreamt are, at best, veridical confabulations. Finally, Schwitzgebel (2002, 2011) has used a historical shift in scientific opinion about whether we dream in color or in black-and-white to argue that our opinions about dreams can be quite radically mistaken.

On the side of anti-skepticism, we have the idea that dream reports, at least under certain conditions (such as following timed awakenings in the laboratory), are trustworthy sources of evidence about preceding dream experiences (Windt 2013). The question of whether to trust dream reports then turns into a set of questions about how best to gather and analyse dream reports, how to deal with potentially different results from different methods, and how detailed interviews might enable more precise understanding of dream phenomenology (Demšar & Windt 2024).

Yet another perspective is how to think about dream recall itself. Crespin and Rosen (2025) point out that whether dream recall is good or bad depends on what we compare it to—and the answer might be different not just for dreams from different sleep stages, but also for whether we compare dream recall to recall of waking perception on the one hand or recall of mind wandering and/or imagination on the other hand. Sant’Anna (2024) identifies a broader asymmetry in how we remember dreams and waking experiences: While waking experience reports are based on introspection of the relevant experiences, dream reports are based on introspection not of dreams themselves, but of dream memories. He further argues that recognizing the role of metacognition in dreams suggests an account in which dreaming is related to mind wandering. Finally, Nemeth (2023) points out that dream recall is in fact a complex construct, spanning dream production or generation, encoding, and retrieval, leading to a report. She identifies a complex web of factors that have been proposed to explain differences in dream recall frequency in different studies and for different participant groups.

The second big question concerns the status of memories within dreams. James (2024) asks how to make sense of dreams that seem to connect us to external-world particulars—such as a particular person in our lives—arguing that such cases are at least partially a matter of remembering those particulars. Drawing from philosophical work on episodic memory, Gregory (2024b) asks about the possibility of episodic memory in dreams. He suggests that allowing for episodic memories to be possible in nonlucid dreams entails commitment to assumptions that are likely too strong, including about our ability to make judgments about the past to retain a high degree of rationality in dreams.

This discussion stands alongside a large body of empirical work on the relationship between memory, different sleep stages, and dreams. This includes questions about episodic memory in dreams (Fosse et al. 2003), the waking memory sources of dreaming and the temporal pattern of their integration (Nielsen & Powell 1989; Eichenlaub et al. 2019), and whether targeted memory activation in dreams can support memory consolidation and learning after sleep (Picard-Deland & Nielsen 2022; Carr et al. 2020).

The third major question concerns the broader comparison of dreaming and memory. Bernecker (2024) argues that while dreams are imaginings, they are distinct from memory imaginings (or imaginings that qualify as memory) in that the latter are produced by a mechanism whose proper function it is to track the truth. Barkasi (2024) examines the feeling of pastness that typically accompanies episodic memories and argues that a similar feeling of pastness can occur in some dreams, though with subtle phenomenological differences insofar as dreams, unlike episodic memories, are immersive.

Other authors reflect more broadly on what dream recall tells us about memory, including different theories of memory (such as intentionalism and relationalism; Werning & Liefke 2024, 2025) and the accuracy of memory (Michaelian 2024, McCarroll et al. 2024).

Sutton (2024) examines Halbwachs’s treatment of dreaming in the context of memory. Halbwachs endorsed an anti-individualist account in which remembering is intrinsically social. The contrast with dreaming, in which consciousness is left to its own devices, sharpens this account. Dreaming, according to Halbwachs, resembles children’s memories insofar as the dreamer, similar to a small child, is temporarily outside of the social realm. Sutton makes this historical position accessible and relates it to contemporary dream research and work on distributed and 4E cognition. Finally, Dranseika (2024) reports the results of a study investigating folk beliefs about phenomenological similarities and differences between dreaming, remembering, perceiving, imagining, and hallucinating to suggest how experimental philosophy can contribute to debates on the comparison between these mental states. For example, such results can shed light on the psychological appeal of philosophical positions such as Cartesian dream skepticism, the imagination vs the quasi-perceptual view of dreaming, and so on.

3. Dreaming, sleep, and consciousness

3.1 Dreaming and the science of consciousness

Dreaming is commonly described as a spontaneously and regularly occurring global state of consciousness in which experience arises under altered behavioral and neurophysiological conditions as compared to standard wakefulness. Because dreaming is plausibly the most widespread altered state of consciousness, many regard dreams as a model system for consciousness research (Churchland 1988; Revonsuo 2006). As Revonsuo puts it,

the dreaming brain brings out the phenomenal level of organization in a clear and distinct form. Dreaming is phenomenality pure and simple, untouched by external physical stimulation or behavioural activity. (Revonsuo 2006: 75)

According to the “world-simulation metaphor of consciousness”, dreaming reveals the basic, state-independent structure of consciousness to be immersive: “dreaming depicts consciousness first and foremost as a subjective world-for-me” (Revonsuo 2006: 75), suggesting that consciousness itself is essentially simulational and dreamlike (see also Metzinger 2003).

The idea that dreaming is functionally a state of cranial envatment that nonetheless simulates the phenomenology of waking perceptual experience has often been regarded as supporting internalism about conscious experience, whereas dreaming has been thought to be a counter-example to externalist or enactivist account (Revonsuo 2006). Yet things may be more complex. A possible defense of enactivism is to say that dreaming does not in fact replicate the detail and stability of waking perceptual experience (but see Rosen 2021) and these phenomenological differences result from the lack of dynamic interaction with the environment in dreams (Noë 2004). Another is that dream experience is exhausted by what is in phenomenal experience at any given moment, whereas the phenomenology of waking perception includes what is accessible via sensorimotor exploration (Barkasi 2021b). Yet another is to acknowledge the variability of dream experience, which ranges from more to less detailed, stable, and vivid, as well as more to less cut off from the environment and sleeping body — though how this impacts the challenge dreams pose for enactivism is controversial (Rosen 2018a, Windt 2018). Finally, Windt (2018) has argued that the idea that dream experience is isolated from sensory input and motor output is itself problematic: dreams are not cranially envatted, but weakly embodied states of consciousness.

Others have cautioned against regarding dreaming as model system for consciousness research. One concern is that in the absence of a well worked out theory of dreaming and its sleep-stage and neural correlates, proposals for using dreaming as a model system risk relying on an oversimplified description of the target phenomenon (Windt & Noreika 2011). Another is that because of the unreliability of dream reports, and because dreaming cannot be easily or directly induced, dreaming cannot be operationalized as straightforwardly as e.g. visual experience in wakefulness (Carruthers et al. 2019; though lucid dreams might be a counterexample, see also Baird et al. 2019).

Dreaming has also been suggested as a model system not just of waking consciousness in general, but of psychotic wake states in particular. The analogy between dreaming and madness has a long philosophical history (Plato, Phaedrus; Kant 1766; Schopenhauer 1847). Hobson famously claimed that “dreaming is not a model of a psychosis. It is a psychosis. It’s just a healthy one” (Hobson 1999: 44). Gottesmann (2006) proposes dreaming as a neurophysiological model of schizophrenia. There is a rich discussion on the theoretical and methodological implications of dream research for psychiatry (see Scarone et al. 2007; d’Agostino et al. 2013; see Windt & Noreika 2011) and a number of studies have investigated differences in dream reports from schizophrenic and healthy subjects (Limosani et al. 2011a,b). There have also been attempts to compare specific dream phenomena to wake-state delusions such as character misidentification and delusions of hyperfamiliarity (such as the Frégoli delusion, in which strangers are mistakenly identified as family members, and déjà vu; see Gerrans 2012, 2013, 2014), but also thought insertion and auditory hallucinations (Rosen 2015).

Predictive processing accounts (Clark 2013b; Hohwy 2013) suggest a unified account of perception, imagination, and dreaming. In these accounts, different mental states, including perception and action, involve different strategies of hypothesis testing and prediction error minimization. Perception is the attempt to model the hidden external causes of sensory stimuli; action involves keeping the internal model stable while changing the sensory input. Clark argues that on such a model,

systems that know how to perceive an object as a cat are thus systems that, ipso facto, are able to use a top-down cascade to bring about the kinds of activity pattern that would be characteristic of the presence of a cat. […] Perceivers like us, if this is correct, are inevitably potential dreamers and imaginers too. Moreover, they are beings who, in dreaming and imagining, are deploying many of the very same strategies and resources used in ordinary perception. (Clark 2013a: 764)

Predictive processing accounts have also been used to explain specific features of dreaming such as bizarreness (Hobson & Friston 2012; Fletcher & Frith 2008; Bucci & Grasso 2017) and bodily self-experience (Windt 2018).

Dreams have also been suggested as a test case for whether phenomenal consciousness can be divorced from cognitive access (e.g., Block 2007; but see Cohen & Dennett 2011). Sebastián (2014a) argues that dreams provide empirical evidence that conscious experience can occur independently of cognitive access. This is because during (non-lucid) REM-sleep dreams, the dorsolateral prefrontal cortex (dlPFC) as the most plausible mechanism underlying cognitive access is selectively deactivated (see also Pantani et al. 2018). While this would, if further substantiated, challenge theories linking conscious experience to access, such as higher-order-thought theory (Sebastián 2014b), both the hypoactivation of the dlPCF in REM sleep and its association with cognitive access have been debated. Fazekas and Nemeth (2018) suggest that certain kinds of cognitive access may be independent of dlPFC activation, necessitating a more complex account. Rosen’s (2024a) pluralism suggests variability in the extent to which phenomenal and access consciousness are expressed in dreams.

3.2 Dreamless sleep

In recent years there has been a surge of interest in the possibility of dreamless sleep experience and foundational issues about the definition of sleep and waking (Thompson 2014, 2015). This has been paralleled by growing interest in dreams occurring in NREM sleep.

Conceptually, interest in dreamless sleep experience has been facilitated by the precise definition of dreaming offered by simulation views (Revonsuo et al. 2015). If dreams are immersive sleep experiences characterized by their here-and-now structure, it makes sense to ask whether this is true for all or just a subset of sleep-related experiences and whether non-immersive sleep experiences exist. By contrast, if dreaming is broadly identified with any conscious mentation in sleep (Pagel et al. 2001), there is no conceptual space for dreamless sleep experience.

This work is relevant beyond sleep and dreaming for definitions of consciousness: In light of dreamless sleep experience, operational definitions of consciousness as that which disappears in deep, dreamless sleep and reappears in waking and dreaming (Searle 2000; Tononi 2008) are problematic and require revision (Thompson 2014, 2015). Dreamless sleep experience has been proposed to be particularly relevant for understanding minimal phenomenal experience, or the conditions under which the simplest kind of conscious experience arises (Windt 2015b).

Following Thompson’s (2014, 2015) discussion of dreamless sleep in Indian and Buddhist philosophy, Windt and colleagues (2016; see also Windt 2015b) introduce a framework for different kinds of (non-immersive) dreamless sleep experience ranging from thinking and isolated imagery, perception, or bodily sensations, where these lack integration into a scene, to minimal kinds of experience lacking imagery or specific thought contents. A possible example of minimal phenomenal experience in sleep are white dreams, where people report having had experiences during sleep but cannot remember any details. Taken at face value, some white dream reports might describe experiences that lack reportable content (Windt 2015b); others might describe forgotten dreams or dreams with degraded content (Fazekas et al. 2018). Another example are reports of witnessing dreamless sleep, as described in certain meditation practices. This state is said to involve non-conceptual awareness of sleep, again in the absence of imagery or specific thought contents, and loss of sense of self (Thompson 2014, 2015). There have also been attempts to study allegedly objectless or contentless sleep experience empirically (Alcaraz-Sánchez 2023, Alcaraz-Sánchez et al. 2022) and compare it to lucid dreams (Alcaraz-Sánchez 2024a), mind blanking, advanced meditative states (Andrillon et al. 2025), and other states of minimal awareness in waking and sleep (Alcaraz-Sánchez 2024b).

Interest in dreamless sleep experience is paralleled by increasing interest in experiences in NREM sleep. Most researchers now accept that dreaming is not confined to REM sleep, but also occurs at sleep onset and in NREM sleep. The deeper stages of NREM sleep are particularly interesting as they involve roughly similar proportions of dreaming, unconscious sleep, and white dreams (Noreika et al. 2009: Siclari et al. 2013, 2017). In the search for the neural correlates of dreaming vs unconscious dreamless sleep, this makes comparisons within the same sleep stage possible and avoids confounds involved in comparing presumably dreamful REM sleep with presumably dreamless NREM sleep. Findings suggest that activity in the same parietal hot zone underlies dreaming in both NREM and REM sleep (Siclari et al. 2017).

Finally, while sleep and sleep stages have traditionally been regarded as global, whole-brain phenomena, there is now increasing evidence that sleep itself is locally driven, and local changes in sleep depth might be associated with changes in sleep-related experience (Siclari & Tononi 2017; Andrillon et al. 2019). While sleep and wakefulness have traditionally, following Aristotle, been regarded as opposites (On Sleeping and Waking; see also Kroker 2007), recognition that sleep-like activity can occur in an otherwise wakeful brain, and vice versa, requires a shift in how we operationalize sleep and wakefulness in relation to different conscious states (Windt 2020a).

4. Dreaming and the self

The self is almost always present in dreams, though in our dreams, we can have the experience of being a slightly different (e.g. older or younger) version of our waking self or even a different person entirely (Rosen & Sutton 2013). Dreams therefore raise interesting questions about the identity between the dream and waking self. Locke (1689: II.I.12) invites us to imagine two men alternating in turns between sleep and wakefulness and sharing one continuously thinking soul. He argues that if one man retained no memory of the soul’s thoughts and perceptions while it was linked to the other man’s body, they would be distinct persons.

Valberg (2007) distinguishes between the subject of the dream (i.e., the dream self) and the sleeping person who is the dreamer of the dream and recalls it upon awakening. He argues that awakening from a dream involves crossing a chasm between discrete worlds with discrete spaces and times; it does not make sense to say that “the ‘I’ at these times [is] a single individual who crosses from one world to the other” (Valberg 2007: 69). He proposes this is relevant to dream skepticism because there is no simple way to make sense of the claims that it is I who emerge from a dream or that I was the victim of dream deception.

Vicarious dreams, or dreams in which the protagonist of the dream seems to be a different person from the dreamer, are particularly puzzling with respect to identity. They may even raise the question of whether the dream self has an independent existence (Rosen & Sutton 2013: 1047). Such dreams are superficially similar to cases in which we imagine being another person, but according to Rosen and Sutton require a different explanation: in the case of dreaming, the imagined person’s thoughts are not framed as diverging from one’s own and one does not retain one’s own perspective in addition to the imagined one; in nonlucid dreams, only the perspective of the dream’s protagonist is retained.

The dream self is also at the center of simulation views of dreaming, which define dreaming via its immersive, here-and-now character as the experience of a self in a world. This leads to further questions about the phenomenology of self-experience in dreams and how it is different from waking self-experience. Different versions of the simulation view focus on different aspects of self- and world experience in dreams, ranging from social simulation (Revonsuo et al. 2015) to the typical features of selfhood in dreams (Revonsuo 2005, 2006, Metzinger 2003, 2009) to the minimal conditions for experiencing oneself as a self in dreams and what this tells us about minimal phenomenal selfhood in general (Windt 2015a, 2018). Yet these different versions of the simulation view are largely complementary and together have forged unity in a field that was previously hampered by lack of agreement about the definition of dreaming. They also integrate the philosophy of dreaming and scientific dream research.

As so often in debates about dreaming, there is disagreement about basic phenomenological questions. Revonsuo (2005) describes self-experience including bodily experience in dreams as identical to waking, whereas Metzinger (2003, 2009; see also Windt & Metzinger 2007) argues that important layers of waking self-experience (such as autobiographical memory, agency, a stable first-person perspective, metacognitive insight, and self-knowledge) are missing in nonlucid dreams. Windt (2015a, 2018) has argued that bodily self-experience in dreams is both more variable and typically more weakly expressed than in waking, due in part to changes in the processing of environmental and own-body stimuli in sleep. She proposes that the analysis of bodily self-experience in dreams has implications for minimal phenomenal selfhood (Blanke & Metzinger 2009; see also Metzinger 2013b), showing that it is tied to spatiotemporal-self-location in the absence of body ownership (Windt 2010). Finally, Barkasi (2021a) has proposed that dreams only partly involve the feeling of presence. Specifically, dreams involve immersive presence but not motor presence, as this is tied to motion-guiding vision which is offline during sleep.

How the phenomenology of dreaming compares to waking and how the dream self relates to the waking self also bears on questions about the moral status of dreams. For Augustine (Confessions), dreams were a cause of moral concern because of their indistinguishability from waking life. Of particular concern were the vividness of dreams of sexual acts, as well as the feelings of pleasure and seeming acquiescence or consent on the part of the dreamer associated with such dreams. Augustine argued, however, that the transition from sleep to wakefulness involves a chasm, enabling dreamers to awaken with a clear conscience and absolving them from responsibility for their dream actions (see Matthews 1981 for critical discussion).

More broadly, the issue of dream immorality may be a choice point between different accounts of moral evaluation. Where internalists assume the moral status of a person’s actions is entirely determined by factors such as intentions and motives, externalists look beyond these to the effects of actions. Driver (2007) argues that the intuitive absurdity of dream immorality itself should count against purely internalist accounts; yet she also acknowledges this absurdity is not a necessary feature of dreams.

5. The meaning and functions of dreams

Traditionally, a main source of interest in dreams has been dream interpretation and whether dreams are a source of knowledge and insight. Historically, the epistemic status of dreams and the use of prophetic and diagnostic dreams was not just a theoretical, but a practical problem (Barbera 2008). Different types of dreams were distinguished by their putative epistemic value. Artemidorus (1975), for instance, used the term enhypnion to refer to dreams that merely reflect the sleeper’s current bodily or psychological state and hence do not merit further interpretation, whereas he reserved the term oneiron for meaningful and symbolic dreams of divine origin.

The practice of dream interpretation was famously criticized by Aristotle in On Prophecy in Sleep. He denied that dreams are of divine origin, but allowed that occasionally, small affections of the sensory organs may stem from distant events that cannot be perceived in waking but yet are perceptible in the quiet of sleep. He also believed such dreams were mostly likely to occur in dullards whose minds resemble an empty desert – an assessment that was not apt to encourage interest in dreams (Kroker 2007: 37). A similarly negative view was held by early modern philosophers who believed dreams were often the source of superstitious beliefs and akin to madness (Hobbes 1651; Kant 1766; Schopenhauer 1847).

Freudian dream theory considered dream interpretation as the royal road to knowledge of the unconscious. This was associated with claims about the psychic sources of dreaming. Freud (1899) also rejected the influence of external or bodily sources, as championed by contemporary proponents of somatic-stimulus theory.

The Freudian view of dream meaning was famously and radically opposed by Hobson’s (1988) claim that dreams are the product of random, brain-stem driven activation of the brain during sleep and at best enable personal insights in the same way as a Rorschach test (Hobson et al. 2000). Dennett (1991) illustrates the lack of design underlying the production of dream narratives through the “party game of psychoanalysis”, which involves an aimless game of question-and-answer. In the game, players follow simple rules to jointly produce narratives that can seem symbolic and meaningful, even though no intelligent and deliberate process of narration was involved.

Historically, views on the epistemic status of dreams and the type of knowledge to be gained from dream interpretation (e.g., knowledge about the future, diagnosis of physical illness, or insights about one’s current concerns) often changed in tandem with views on the origin and sources of dreaming, which gradually moved from divine origins and external sources, via the body, to the unconscious, and finally to the brain.

Indeed, the discussion of evolutionary functions of dreaming is closely tied to discussion of the functions of sleep and different sleep stages. Importantly, given that dreams occur in all stages of sleep, a theory on the function of dreaming has to be separate from a theory on the function of different sleep stages. Moreover, if dreaming is continuous, say, with waking mind wandering, this suggests that a unified account of their respective functions is required. Dreaming might not then have a distinctive function. It is also possible that different dreams and sleep-related experiences fulfill different functions to varying degrees (Windt 2015a).

Prominent theories on the function of dreaming focus on bad dreams and nightmares. It has long been thought that dreaming contributes to emotional processing and that this is particularly obvious in the dreams of nightmare sufferers or in dreams following traumatic experiences (e.g., Hartmann 1998; Nielsen & Lara-Carrasco 2007; Levin & Nielsen 2009; Cartwright 2010; Perogamvros et al. 2013). Based on the high prevalence of negative emotions and threatening dream content, threat simulation theory suggests that the evolutionary function of dreaming lies in the simulation of ancestral threats and the rehearsal of threatening events and avoidance skills in dreams has an adaptive value by enhancing the individual’s chances of survival (see Revonsuo 2000; Valli 2008). Another proposal is social simulation theory, in which social imagery in dreams supports social cognition, bonds, and social skills. (Revonsuo et al. 2015; see also Tuominen et al. 2019).

An evolutionary perspective has also been applied to specific aspects of dream phenomenology. According to the vigilance hypothesis, natural selection disfavored the occurrence of those types of sensations during sleep that would compromise vigilance (Symons 1993). Dream sounds, but also smells or pains might distract attention from the potentially dangerous surroundings of the sleeping subject, and the vigilance hypothesis predicts that they only rarely occur in dreams without causing awakening. By contrast, because most mammals sleep with their eyes closed and in an immobile position, vivid visual and motor experiences during sleep would not comprise vigilance and thus can occur in dreams without endangering the sleeping subject. Focusing on the stuff dreams are not made of might then be at least as important for understanding the function of dreaming as developing a positive account (Symons 1993).

Finally, even if dreaming in general and specific types of dream content in particular were found to be strongly associated with specific cognitive functions, it would still be possible that dreams are mere epiphenomena of brain activity during sleep (Flanagan 1995, 2000). A particular challenge for any theory on the function of dreaming is to explain why a majority of dreams are forgotten and how dreams can fulfill their putative function independently of recall. Crick and Mitchinson (1983) famously proposed that REM sleep “erases” or deletes surplus information and unnecessary memories, which would suggest that enhanced dream recall is counterproductive. A related challenge is that dreaming can be lost selectively and independently of other cognitive deficits (Solms 1997, 2000).

6. Conclusions

Philosophical questions about dreaming from epistemology, ontology, philosophy of mind and cognitive science, as well as ethics are closely intertwined. Scientific evidence from sleep and dream research can meaningfully inform the philosophical discussion of sleep and dreaming and has often done so in the past. The discussion of dreaming has also often functioned as a lens on broader questions about knowledge, morality, consciousness, and self. Long a marginalized area, the philosophy of dreaming and of sleep is central to a range of philosophical questions and increasingly plays an important role in interdisciplinary consciousness research, for example in the search for neural basis of consciousness, in conscious state taxonomies, in research on the minimal conditions for phenomenal selfhood and conscious experience, as well as in research on dreaming in relation to waking mind wandering, imagination, and daydreaming.

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Acknowledgments

I wish to thank Regina Fabry and two anonymous reviewers for helpful comments and constructive criticism on an earlier version of this manuscript.

Copyright © 2026 by
Jennifer M. Windt <jennifer.windt@monash.edu>

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