Dualism

First published Tue Aug 19, 2003; substantive revision Fri Oct 17, 2025

This entry concerns dualism in the philosophy of mind. The term ‘dualism’ has a variety of uses in the history of ideas. In general, dualism is the view that, for some particular domain, there are two fundamental kinds. In theology, for example a ‘dualist’ is someone who believes that Good and Evil – or God and the Devil – are independent and more or less equal forces in the world. In the philosophy of mind, dualism is the theory that mind and body – or the mental and the physical – are, in some fundamental sense, different kinds of things. Dualism contrasts with monism, which says that there is only one fundamental kind; and, rather less commonly, with pluralism, which is the view that there are many fundamental kinds. Dualism usually enters philosophy as a response to the mind-body problem, where its main competitor is materialism, the form of monism that says that mind and body are both ultimately physical. Dualism is very common in the history of ideas. Today, dualism is the second most popular response to the mind-body problem among professional philosophers, after materialism and ahead of idealism and panpsychism.

1. Dualism and the Mind-Body Problem

Humans have, or seem to have, the sort of properties attributed in the physical sciences. These physical properties include size, weight, shape, colour, and motion through space and time. Humans also have, or seem to have, mental properties, which we do not attribute to typical physical objects. These mental properties include perceptual experience, emotional experience, beliefs, desires, agency, and subjecthood or selfhood. In its broadest form, the mind-body problem is the problem of explaining how humans and other mentally endowed beings end up having, or seeming to have, these very different characteristics (Weir 2023, 1–7). In a more specific form, which takes centre stage after the emergence of mechanistic science in the seventeenth century, the mind-body problem is the problem of reconciling the apparent ontological disparity between mind and body with the fact that they seem to interact closely (Westphal 2016, 1–3, 43).

The problem has a number of components. These include the ontological question, what are mind and body, and is one ultimately reducible to, or in some other sense ‘nothing over and above’ the other? They also include the causal question: do physical states influence mental states, do mentals states influence physical states, and if so, how? Different aspects of the mind-body problem arise for different aspects of the mental, such as consciousness, intentionality, agency, personal identity, and subjecthood.

Dualism is one of three classic responses to the mind-body problem alongside materialism and idealism (Wolff 1751). Materialism says that the mind, insofar as it truly exists, is fundamentally physical. Idealism is the converse view that matter, insofar as it truly exists, is fundamentally mental. Dualism is the view that mind and body are both real and fundamentally distinct. A fourth option which has gained prominence in recent discussions is a kind of panpsychism according to which the things described by physical science are deep-down, partly or wholly, mental in nature (Freeman 2006, Alter and Nagasawa 2015, Goff and Moran 2022). There is some disagreement as to whether these panpsychist theories form a subclass of one or more of the three classic views, or a distinctive class of their own (Weir 2023, 87–91). For an extensive taxonomy of responses to the mind-body problem as it concerns consciousness see Kuhn (2024).

Dualism usually enters philosophical discussions as one possible response to the mind-body problem, especially as it pertains to consciousness. A 2020 survey suggests that dualism is, in this context, the second most popular response to the mind-body problem among professional philosophers (Bourget and Chalmers 2023). Twenty-two percent of respondents indicated that they ‘accept or lean towards’ dualism, compared to fifty-one percent for materialism and eight percent for panpsychism. Idealism was not included as a possible response to this question (though seven percent indicated that they accept or lean towards idealism in response to a question about external-world scepticism).

More recently, dualism has also been discussed in the context of the ‘meta-problem of consciousness’. This is the problem of explaining why people report dualist intuitions about consciousness, or why dualism about consciousness seems true, irrespective of whether it is actually true (Chalmers 2018, Rickabaugh and Moreland 2023, 83–86). The meta-problem of consciousness arises because there is general agreement that dualism is intuitively appealing, even among its opponents (see Taliaferro 1994, 26 fn. 10). Analogous ‘meta-problems’ concerning other aspects of the mind-body problem such as intentionality and personal identity exist but have not yet received comparable attention. A final area where dualism is frequently discussed is in the philosophy of religion, where responses to the mind-body problem intersect with religious views about the soul.

Other entries which concern aspects of the mind-body problem include (among many others): behaviorism, consciousness, eliminative materialism, epiphenomenalism, functionalism, identity theory, intentionality, mental causation, neutral monism, panpsychism, and physicalism.

2 History of Dualism

An early form of dualism can be found in the idea that humans possess a psychological core, the self or soul, that survive bodily death. Versions of this idea appear in some of the earliest surviving sources, including Shang Dynasty oracles, the Epic of Gilgamesh, the Homeric poems, the Hebrew Bible and Egyptian funerary texts. Religious practices involving communication with the spirits of the dead appear to be universal across cultures (Steadman et al. 1996). Data from infant psychology suggest that dualism of this kind may be part of how humans naturally conceive of themselves, irrespective of environmental and cultural factors (Wellman 1990, 58; Bering 2006; Bloom 2007; cf. Hodge 2008). Early philosophical discussions of dualism emerge in Vedic India and Classical Greece. Both traditions have a powerful influence on philosophy of mind today. Works from a third major centre of ancient philosophical texts, China, also regularly presuppose dualism (Slingerland 2013). However, early Chinese philosophy is less preoccupied with the mind-body problem than that of India and Greece. Two events have a profound impact on subsequent discussions of dualism: the spread of the Abrahamic religions in late antiquity; and the emergence of mechanistic science in the early modern period.

2.1 Dualism in Indian Philosophy

A central focus of India’s foundational philosophical texts, the Upanishads (c. 700–500 BCE), is the nature and destiny of the soul (atman). The Upanishads present the theory that the soul is an unchanging and imperishable entity that survives bodily death and undergoes successive reincarnations (Olivelle 1998). This view would be taken up by numerous subsequent Indian philosophical traditions. A description of the same idea from the Bhagavad Gita reads:

There has never been a time when you and I… have not existed, nor will there be a time when we will cease to exist. As the same person inhabits the body through childhood, youth, and old age, so too at the time of death he attains another body. The wise are not deluded by these changes… The body is mortal, but that which dwells in the body is immortal and immeasurable. (Ch. 2, 12–18)

Two of the six ‘orthodox’ Indian philosophical schools, Samkhya and Vaisheshika, articulate detailed dualist theories which are further developed by their sister schools, Yoga and Nyaya. Of the remaining two ‘orthodox’ schools, Mimamsa appears to presuppose dualism, while focussing on other matters, and Vedanta develops both dualist and idealist sub-schools (Radhakrishnan and Moore 1998).

Of the two surviving ‘heterodox’ Indian philosophical schools—those that do not recognise the authority of Hindu scripture—Jainism advances a distinctive form of dualism, while Buddhism develops sub-schools with various theories of the mind. The texts of a third ‘heterodox’ school, Carvaka, are mainly lost, but fragments and second-hand reports show that it embraced a form of materialism.

Important differences exist between classical Indian forms of mind-body dualism. For example, Samkhya and Yoga represent the soul (purusha) as pure awareness. Vaisheshika and Nyaya, by contrast, attribute to the soul (atman) not just consciousness, but also volition and cognition. All four represent the individual soul as pervading the cosmos, while Jain texts state that it (ordinarily) fills only the body that it occupies, like the light from a lamp filling a room.

A distinctive version of mind-body dualism appears in the early Buddhist tradition, Abhidharma. The Abhidharma Pitaka (a collection of works by multiple authors, existing in several recensions) contends that what we mistake for the soul or self is really a bundle of fleeting atom-events called ‘dharmas’. These dharmas are nonetheless divided into what appear to be fundamentally mental and fundamentally physical kinds, making this position a form of dualism, albeit one that departs radically from other Indian theories in rejecting the idea of an enduring soul.

The classical Indian dualist theories retain varying degrees of influence into the present day. Buddhism declined in India and in Central Asia in the Middle Ages, but flourished in East Asia, carrying with it a philosophical interest in the mind-body problem and the nature and (non-)existence of the soul. One result was an early argument for the fundamentality of consciousness advanced by the Tang dynasty Buddhist monk, Guifeng Zongmi (780–841 CE):

Moreover, the qi of Heaven and Earth is fundamentally lacking in awareness. If humans are endowed with qi that lacks awareness, how can awareness suddenly arise? Grass and trees are endowed with the same qi, so why do they not have awareness. (On Humanity, 100)

An important shift in Indian philosophy occurred in the wake of Shankara’s (c. 8th century CE) exposition of the non-dualist (advaita) sub-school of Vedanta. Gradually, Advaita Vedanta gained a prominence unrivalled by other Indian schools (except perhaps Yoga). This explains the perception in some sources that Indian philosophical thought leans towards idealism over dualism.

2.2 Dualism in Greek Philosophy

There exists evidence of both mind-body dualism and the cycle of reincarnation among the Greek pre-Socratics, especially the Pythagoreans. The resemblance between these ideas and those of Vedic India has led to speculation about the possibility of a common source or influence between the two (McEvilly 2002, Ch. 4). Hard evidence for such a theory remains elusive, however.

The earliest philosophical discussions of dualism in the Greek tradition to survive in full are those of Plato (c. 429–347 BCE). Plato assumes a distinction between an invisible soul and a visible body, and argues for both the immortality of the soul, and for the theory that the soul undergoes successive reincarnations. The Meno, the Phaedo, and the Phaedrus all argue that humans exhibit knowledge that they could not have obtained in their current life, presenting this as evidence for the soul’s pre-existence. The Phaedo adds several arguments that the soul will continue to exist after death. One such argument appeals to the soul’s affinity with the eternal forms of which, according to Plato’s theory, material objects are mere copies (78b4–84b8).

Aristotle (384–322 BCE) develops a very different theory of the soul. In multiple texts, including the Physics, Metaphysics, and De Anima, Aristotle analyses material substances into the matter they are composed of and the form that organises that matter. For example, Socrates is composed of some matter, his flesh and bones, organised by the form of a human being. This theory has come to be known as ‘hylomorphism’ from the Greek for matter (hyle) and form (morphe).

Aristotle identifies the soul of a living creature with its form, and he argues, contra Plato, that forms cannot exist separately from the material they organise. Aristotle must therefore reject the view that the soul can survive without the body. However, Aristotle also argues that one part of the soul, the intellect, is immaterial. He reasons that a material organ is sensitive only to certain things, just as the eye is sensitive to light but not sound, whereas the intellect, according to Aristotle, is sensitive to all forms (De Anima 429a10–b9). Commentators debate whether this means that, for Aristotle, the intellect can exist without the body, even if the entire soul cannot.

Most Western philosophers from antiquity well into the modern era embrace dualist theories descended from those of Plato and Aristotle. A third influential Greek tradition for our topic is Epicureanism. Epicurus (341–270 BCE) following the pre-Socratic Democritus (c. 460–370 BCE) argued that the ‘soul’ is really a collection of physical atoms that disperse at death (Letter to Herodotus 10.65). Though its influence waned in late antiquity, Epicurean materialism underwent a revival in modernity led by figures ranging from Hobbes to Marx and influenced the development of contemporary materialism.

Of the other principal Greek schools, the Stoics described the soul as composed of a special kind of spiritual matter, ‘pneuma’, which pervades the universe; a view that can be seen as anticipating contemporary panpsychism. The Sceptics, Academic and Pyrrhonist, attempted to suspend judgment about such questions.

2.3 Dualism in the Abrahamic World

A factor shaping philosophical developments in the Western half of Eurasia and in Africa in late antiquity was the expansion of the Abrahamic faiths. This gave dualism a new intellectual context, and one that continues to shape philosophical discussions today (e.g. Warren, Murphey and Maloney 1998; Van Inwagen and Zimmerman 2007; Farris and Leidenhag 2024). A tradition of harmonising Greek philosophy with Jewish scripture reached an early apex in the first century CE in the work of Philo of Alexandria, who drew heavily on Platonist approaches to the soul. Early Christian thinkers, most famously St Augustine (354–340), also adopted versions of Plato’s dualism. Some scholars also credit Augustine with introducing the conception of the soul as a subjective inner space, an idea that becomes important in modern discussions (Cary 2000).

Arabic-Islamic philosophy adopted a similar approach beginning with Al Kindi in the 9th century (Adamson 2018). Thinkers in this tradition tend to favour a synthesis of (neo-)Platonic and Aristotelian theories of the soul. One influential contribution was Al Farabi’s (c. 870–950) theory of the active intellect: a cosmic intellect that stands to the human intellect as the sun stands to the eye. This theory was further developed by Avicenna (c. 890–1037) and formed the basis for Averroes’ (1126–1198) doctrine of the ‘unity of the intellect’: the thesis that all humans share a single intellect. Averroes’s doctrine generated controversy by casting doubt on the idea of an individual afterlife. Another notable contribution is Avicenna’s ‘floating man’ thought experiment, which is sometimes regarded as a precursor to similar thought experiments in Descartes.

The philosophers of the Latin West inherited this synthesis of Platonic and Aristotelian dualism. A group at the University of Paris known as the ‘Latin Averroists’ even adopted Averroes’ doctrine of the unity of the intellect. The leading figures of the two main strands of scholastic philosophy, Thomas Aquinas (1225–1274) and Duns Scotus (c. 1266–1308), both opposed Averroes’ view, however, with Aquinas dedicating a polemical treatise to the topic (Adams 1992). At the same time, Aquinas also objects to the equation of the survival of the soul with the survival of the self, asserting ‘my soul is not me’ (Commentary on 1 Corinthians, 21:33–4). Commentors disagree about what this means for Aquinas’s understanding of an individual afterlife (De Haan and Dahm 2019).

While Aquinas and Scotus agree on the general hylomorphic dualist framework and in their opposition to Averroes, they disagree on other issues, especially whether the soul is the only substantial form organising the matter of the body. Aquinas argues that one substance can have only one substantial form. Scotus argues that the complexity of living beings requires multiple substantial forms (Cross 1998, 47–76).

Not all early Abrahamic philosophers embrace straightforwardly dualist views. The Church father Tertullian (c. 155–220 CE) and the medieval Jewish philosopher Solomon ibn Gabirol (c. 1021/1022–1058/1070) both argue that the soul is, in a sense, material (Kitlzer 2013; Pessin 2013). Tertullian and Ibn Gabirol are at most ambiguous materialists, however. The former is influenced by the Stoic idea that the soul is composed of a special kind of matter with fundamentally mental characteristics, while Ibn Gabirol posits a distinctive kind of ‘incorporeal matter’ to serve as the material component of spiritual beings. The first philosopher to combine the worldview of an Abrahamic religion with an unambiguously materialist response to the mind-body problem may be Hobbes (1588–1679) in the Early Modern period (Weir 2022, 116–117).

2.4 Dualism and Mechanistic Science

Early Modern philosophy also sees a major development in approaches to dualism pioneered by Descartes (1596–1650). In addition to advancing arguments for dualism that remain influential today, Descartes instigated two shifts in the way philosophers tend to understand dualism. First, in contrast to his Aristotelian predecessors, he combined dualism with a new mechanistic conception of the natural world of which he was a pioneer. Secondly, while earlier philosophers in the West tend to rest their arguments for the immateriality of the mind on the intellect, Descartes shifts the focus to consciousness, which he takes to include not just intellectual activity but also sensory awareness. It is also in the context of mechanistic science that the problem of mind-body interaction gains its status as the leading objection to dualism.

Descartes argues that mind and body are distinct substances characterised by thought (which for Descartes, includes all conscious mental states) and extension respectively. By a ‘substance’, Descartes means something that can exist by itself (Weir 2021a, 281–287). This theory, presented in all of Descartes’ major works, has served as a standard starting point for discussions of the mind-body problem ever since.

Descartes’ successors challenge various aspects of his dualist theory. Elizabeth of Bohemia (1596–1552) questioned whether Descartes can explain how mind and body interact. Leibniz (1646–1714) and Berkeley (1685–1753) both attempted to reduce the material half of Descartes’ ontology to the mental half, thereby inaugurating a modern tradition of idealist theories. Hume (1711–1776) substituted a bundle of fleeting perceptions for the Cartesian mind in a way reminiscent of, and possibly influenced by, earlier Buddhist theories (Gopnik 2009). Further details on these debates appear below.

Nonetheless, dualist theories resembling Descartes’ remained popular. In his 1949 book, The Concept of Mind, Gilbert Ryle was able to describe Cartesian dualism as the ‘official doctrine’ to which ‘most philosophers, psychologists and religious teachers subscribe, with minor reservation’ (Ryle 1949, 1). Not long after the this, however, any such consensus had evaporated. And although Ryle’s book is often seen as marking the moment when this shift took place, anti-dualist sentiment had been growing for some time. Writing in 1930 Arthur Lovejoy states:

The last quarter-century, it may fairly confidently be predicted, will have for future historians of philosophy a distinctive interest and instructiveness as the Age of the Great Revolt against Dualism. (Lovejoy 1930, 1)

If the long-standing predominance of dualism had been under threat for several decades before Ryle, a stable alternative had not yet been found. The leading alternatives to dualism in the first half of the twentieth century were neutral monism, phenomenalism, and behaviourism, all of which remained minority positions. It is only in the second half of the twentieth century that contemporary forms of materialism came to predominate, beginning with U. T. Place (1956) and J. J. C. Smart (1959).

The ascendance of materialism appears to have been due, in part, to the mechanistic conception of nature that Descartes had helped establish. According to the mechanist, the physical world is, as it would now be expressed, ‘causally closed’. This means that everything that happens follows from and is in accord with the laws of physics. Descartes made an exception to accommodate mental causation. If one does not make such an exception, however, the mechanistic theory seems to make the mind an epiphenomenon: that is, it is a by-product of the physical system which has no influence back on it (see Huxley 1893).

While epiphenomenalism has its supporters, many philosopher have found it implausible to claim such things as the following; the pain you feel when you stub your toe, the visual sensations you have when you see a ferocious lion bearing down on you, or the conscious sense of understanding you have when you read these words – all have nothing directly to do with the way you respond. One way to avoid this conclusion is to adopt the materialist hypothesis that one’s mental states are one and the same as the physical causes of one’s behaviours. David Papineau (2001) argues that it is the emergence of clear-cut evidence for closure under physics, even in the bodies of living creatures, that accounts for the rise of materialism in the 1950s and 1960s.

In the period since, the philosophy of mind has been characterised in large part by attempts to avoid dualism and vindicate materialism. Even so, some distinguished neuroscientists, such as Charles Sherrington (1951), Wilder Penfield (1975) and John Eccles (1994) continued to defend dualism throughout the second half of the twentieth century. Several influential philosophers also presented arguments for dualism during this period, most prominently thinkers like Alvin Plantinga (1970) and Richard Swinburne (1986) who specialise in philosophy of religion, but also others including Saul Kripke (1972/1989) and Karl Popper (Popper 1963, 395–408; cf. Sellars 1954; O’Hear 2025).

Towards the end of the century, a series of challenges to materialism from a naturalistic perspective led to a revival of property dualism in mainstream philosophy of mind (e.g. Jackson 1982; Chalmers 1996; Kim 2005). As a result, a widely accepted opinion in the first decades of the present century has held that although substance dualism is no longer a respectable option, property dualism is an important position that must be taken seriously (see Weir 2023, 31–33). The idea that property dualism is preferable to substance dualism is itself regularly challenged, however (Francescotti 2001; Searle 2002; Zimmerman 2010; Schneider 2012; Lycan 2013; Robinson 2016; Weir 2023).

3. Varieties of Dualism

One natural way to divide up kinds of dualism is in terms of what sorts of things one chooses to be a dualist about. The most common categories lighted upon for these purposes are substance and property, giving one substance dualism and property dualism. A second way is in terms of the sorts of causal influence between mind and body one recognises. Interactionism is the view that mind and body act causally on one another, epiphenomenalism says that that body acts on mind but mind does not act on body, and parallelism says that mind and body do not interact. This section reviews these distinctions and says something about where hylomorphic dualism fits in.

3.1 Substance Dualism

In around the 1970s it became standard practice to draw a distinction between ‘substance dualism’ and ‘property dualism’ (Weir 2023, 33). Despite their widespread usage, however, these terms are rarely defined precisely. It is agreed that by ‘substance dualism’ we mean the view that minds and bodies are fundamentally distinct kinds of substances, and that this is the kind of view exemplified by Plato, Augustine, and Descartes, and resisted by some more recent dualists such as Jackson (1982) and Kim (2005). What exactly ‘substance’means in this context is often left vague, however.

Two traditional senses of ‘substance’ help clarify what is distinctive of substance dualism. The first defines a substance as an independent entity: something that can exist by itself (Westphal 2016, 2–3; Weir 2023, 38–44). Substances on this view contrast with properties, insofar as properties depend on their bearers for their existence. The second defines a substance as a unitary entity that persists through time (Benovsky 2009). Substances on this view contrast with Buddhist or Humean bundles. (To persist through time in the relevant sense might require that a substance be ‘wholly present’ at each moment of its existence, in other words, that it endures rather than perdures, in the technical sense of those times. However, the idea of a substance as a persisting entity predates the the technical distinction between endurance and perdurance.) Paradigmatic substance dualists such as Plato, Augustine, and Descartes appear to affirm that the mind is an immaterial substance in both senses: a unitary, persisting entity, which is capable of disembodiment and, to that extent, has independent existence.

The two definitions of substance are logically independent, so someone might endorse substance dualism in one sense but not the other. For example, Martine Nida-Rümelin (2012) defends a view which plausibly qualifies as substance dualism in the sense that it posits a unitary, immaterial mind, but not in the sense that the mind can exist independently. Care must therefore be taken to be clear about what one means when one refers to a position as ‘substance dualism’. Nida-Rümelin chooses to use the term ‘subject-body dualism’ over ‘substance dualism’ for this reason.

It is also sometimes assumed that a substance dualist must posit something like a Lockean ‘substratum’ or a ‘thin particular’, a component that must be combined with something’s properties to yield an object. However, it is less clear that paradigmatic substance dualists posit immaterial substances in this sense. For example, Descartes argues explicitly that the mind is a substance in the sense that it exists independently (with the qualification that nothing can exist without God), and he also presents the mind as a unitary (indeed indivisible) persisting entity. But Descartes does not obviously posit anything resembling a Lockean substratum (Markie 1994, 75–6; Broackes 2006, 160–62; Madell 2010, 52–56; Weir 2021a, 280–1).

Philosophers sometimes use ‘substance dualism’ to refer to the kind of dualism that posits an immaterial self as opposed to immaterial sensations, thoughts, and similar. This is a reasonable usage insofar as most philosophers take the view that if there are immaterial selves, these will qualify as substances and that if there are immaterial mental substances, these will be selves.

However, there is logical space for forms of dualism on which the self is immaterial, in the sense that it consists in a complex succession of nonphysical properties, but is not independent, unitary, or persisting. Likewise, there is logical space for forms of dualism on which the mind is an immaterial substance that does not, by itself, qualify as a person or self. Aquinas’s hylomorphic dualism, described above, may count as an example of the latter. To this extent, the use of ‘substance dualism’ for forms of dualism that posit an immaterial self may be misleading.

It is generally accepted that substance dualism is the kind of dualism that predominates through most of the history of philosophy, and that may form part of the way humans naturally conceive of themselves (Bloom 2009). This makes sense, insofar as the traditional idea of a self or soul that survives bodily death is naturally be taken to suggest a unitary, persisting and independent entity (Weir 2023, 84–7). On the other hand, Buddhist philosophers have often combined belief in disembodied survival and reincarnation with the view of the self as a bundle of fleeting events.

Finally, ‘substance dualism’ is sometimes used interchangeably with ‘Cartesian dualism’. However, some substance dualists are keen to distinguish their theories from Descartes’s. E. J. Lowe (2006) for example, is a substance dualist, in the following sense. He holds that a normal human being involves two substances, one a body and the other a person. The latter is not, however, a purely mental substance that can be defined in terms of thought or consciousness alone, as Descartes claimed. While there is widespread agreement that substance dualism of some is widespread in the history of ideas, it is less clear that this is true of Cartesian dualism in a narrower sense (Hodge 2008).

The definitions given here do not exhaust those that have been appealed to in discussions of substance dualism. Lowe himself favours a distinctive definition in terms not of independence without qualification, but independence of identity. Swinburne (2019, 13) defines a substance merely as ‘a component of the world; a particular object or collection of objects.’

3.2 Property Dualism

Two senses of the term ‘property dualism’ have currency in contemporary philosophy. The first names a kind of nonreductive materialism and therefore not a form of dualism in the sense that contrasts with materialism. The second names a kind of dualism in the sense that contrasts with materialism, but that aims to avoid the perceived excesses of substance dualism. We will call the first view ‘predicate dualism’ for the sake of clarity.

Predicate dualism is the theory that mental predicates are (a) essential for a full description of the world and (b) not reducible to physicalistic predicates, in a sense of ‘reduction’ defined by Ernst Nagle (1961). For a mental predicate to be reducible in the sense in question, there must be bridging laws connecting types of mental states to types of physical states in such a way that all statements about mental states will be logically entailed by appropriate statements about physical states.

A standard example is the relationship between water and H2O. It is widely accepted that something is water if and only if it is H2O. It is therefore plausible that every statement about water is logically entailed by some statement about H2O, meaning that any theory concerning water can be reduced, in Nagel’s (1961) sense, to a theory about H2O. (An apparent exception is statements that create ‘intensional’ contexts like ‘Shakespeare knew that water quenches thirst’. A standard response is that ‘water’ cannot be replaced with ‘H2O’ here only insofar as the sentence really concerns the mode of presentation under which Shakespeare thinks of water, rather than water itself.)

Many terms of the special sciences (that is, any science except physics) are not reducible in this way. Not every hurricane or every infectious disease, let alone every devaluation of the currency or every coup d’etat has the same constitutive structure. These things are defined more by what they do than by their composition or structure. Such things are multiply realizable; they may be constituted by different kinds of physical structures under different circumstances. Because of this, one could not replace these terms by some more basic physical description and still convey the same information. There is no particular description, using the language of physics or chemistry, that would do the work of the word ‘hurricane’, in the way that ‘H2O’ would do the work of ‘water’.

It is widely agreed that many, if not all, psychological states are similarly irreducible, and so psychological predicates are not reducible to physical descriptions. This is what is meant by predicate dualism. The classic source for irreducibility in the special sciences in general is Fodor (1974), and for irreducibility in the philosophy of mind, Davidson (1971).

Predicate dualism is perfectly compatible with materialism. Even though the term ‘pain’, for example, cannot be replaced by any term from physics or chemistry, it could still be the case that every particular pain – every pain ‘token’, as it is expressed – is identical with some physical event in the nervous system. That is how things are on Davidson’s theory.

The final decades of the twentieth century saw increasing interest in the stronger position which we call property dualism. Whereas predicate dualism says that there are two essentially different kinds of predicates in our language, property dualism says that there are two essentially different kinds of property out in the world.

Genuine property dualism occurs when, even at the individual level, the ontology of physics is not sufficient to constitute what is there. The irreducible language is not just another way of describing what there is, it requires that there be something more there than was allowed for in the initial ontology. Until the early part of the twentieth century, it was common to think that biological phenomena (‘life’) required property dualism (an irreducible ‘vital force’), but nowadays the special physical sciences other than psychology are generally thought to involve only predicate dualism.

In the case of mind, property dualism is usually defended by those who argue that the qualitative nature of consciousness is not merely another way of categorising states of the brain or of behaviour, but a genuinely novel phenomenon. Three classic defences of property dualism are Jackson (1982), Chalmers (1996) and Kim (2005). These works argue that consciousness involves properties above everything in the ontology of the physical science. At the same time, they refrain from positing immaterial substances.

It should be noted that Chalmers (2010, 139) has clarified that he intends ‘property dualism’ to entail that there are nonphysical properties whilst remaining neutral on nonphysical substances, and he has since expressed a preference for substance dualism over property dualism (Chalmers 2016, 24), while Jackson (2003) has abandoned property dualism in favour of materialism.

3.3 Interactionism

Interactionism is the view that mind and body – or mental events and physical events – causally influence each other. That this is so is one of our common-sense beliefs, because it appears to be a feature of everyday experience. The physical world influences my experience through my senses, and I often react behaviourally to those experiences. My thinking, too, influences my speech and my actions. There is, therefore, a natural prejudice in favour of interactionism. It has been claimed, however, that it faces serious problems.

The simplest objection to interaction is that, in so far as mind and body are of radically different kinds from each other, they lack that communality necessary for interaction. It is generally agreed that, in its most naive form, this objection to interactionism rests on a ‘billiard ball’ picture of causation: if all causation is by impact, how can the material and the immaterial impact upon each other? But if causation is either by a more ethereal force or energy or only a matter of constant conjunction, there would appear to be no problem in principle with the idea of interaction of mind and body.

Even if there is no objection in principle, there may be a conflict between interactionism and some basic principles of physical science. For example, mind-body interaction seems to require that causal power flows in and out of the physical body in a way that would conflict with the conservation of energy, a fundamental scientific law.

Defenders of interactionism have challenged the relevance of the conservation principle in this context. The conservation principle states that ‘in a causally isolated system the total amount of energy will remain constant’. Whereas ‘[t]he interactionist denies…that the human body is an isolated system’, so the principle is irrelevant (Larmer 1986, 282; this article presents a good brief survey of the options). This approach has been termed conditionality, namely the view that conservation is conditional on the physical system being closed, that is, that nothing non-physical is interacting or interfering with it, and, of course, the interactionist claims that this condition is, trivially, not met.

That conditionality is the best line for the dualist to take, and that other approaches do not work, is defended in Pitts (2019) and Cucu and Pitts (2019). This, they claim, makes the plausibility of interactionism an empirical matter which only close investigation on the fine operation of the brain could hope to settle. Papineau (2001) argues that such evidence was already clear cut in the 1960s. Cucu (2023), by contrast, claims to find critical neuronal events which do not have sufficient physical explanation even today. This claim clearly needs further investigation.

Robins Collins (2011) has claimed that the appeal to conservation by opponents of interactionism is something of a red herring because conservation principles are not ubiquitous in physics. He argues that energy is not conserved in general relativity, in quantum theory, or in the universe taken as a whole. Why then, should we insist on it in mind-brain interaction?

Most discussion of interactionism takes place in the context of the assumption that it is incompatible with the physical world’s being ‘causally closed’. This is a very natural assumption, but it is not justified if causal overdetermination of behaviour is possible. There could then be a complete physical cause of behaviour, and a mental one. The strongest intuitive objection against overdetermination is clearly stated by Mills (1996: 112), who is himself a defender of overdetermination.

For X to be a cause of Y, X must contribute something to Y. The only way a purely mental event could contribute to a purely physical one would be to contribute some feature not already determined by a purely physical event. But if physical closure is true, there is no feature of the purely physical effect that is not contributed by the purely physical cause. Hence interactionism violates physical closure after all.

Mills says that this argument is invalid, because a physical event can have features not explained by the event which is its sufficient cause. For example, ‘the rock’s hitting the window is causally sufficient for the window’s breaking, and the window’s breaking has the feature of being the third window-breaking in the house this year; but the facts about prior window-breakings, rather than the rock’s hitting the window, are what cause this window-breaking to have this feature.’

The opponent of overdetermination could perhaps reply that the principle applies, not to every feature of events, but to a subgroup – say, intrinsic features, not merely relational or comparative ones. It is this kind of feature that the mental event would have to cause, but physical closure leaves no room for this. These matters are still controversial.

Lowe (2008) proposes a different strategy for reconciling mental causation with the empirical evidence for closure under physics. He suggests that physical causes always bring about the effects that we would expect given the laws of physics. But certain physical causes in the brain do so indirectly, by bringing about an intermediate mental state that in turn causes the ordinary physical effect. The mental state and its physical cause are simultaneous, so that there is no temporal gap in the causal sequence, allowing the mental state to bring about its physical effect in a way that is invisible to scientific observation.

The main objection to Lowe’s proposal is that it seems to require an absurd coincidence, such that the effect of every mental state just happens to be the effect one would expect its proximate physical cause to bring about by itself under other circumstances. Lowe (2008, 77) dismisses this objection, questioning whether it makes sense to speak of a coincidence at the level of causal laws. An alternative objection says that Lowe must posit a causal theory that breaches ordinary standards of theory choice by sacrificing simplicity for no gain in strength. Ordinarily, if two causal theories have equal explanatory power, we favour the one that is simpler. This principle would lead us to favour epiphenomenalism over Lowe’s proposal (Weir 2021b).

The problem with closure of physics may be radically altered if physical laws are indeterministic, as quantum theory seems to assert. If physical laws are deterministic, then any interference from outside would lead to a breach of those laws. But if they are indeterministic, interference might produce a result that has a probability greater than zero, and so be consistent with the laws.

Because it involves assessing the significance and consequences of quantum theory, this is a difficult matter for the non-physicist to assess. Some argue that indeterminacy manifests itself only on the subatomic level, being cancelled out by the time one reaches even very tiny macroscopic objects: and human behaviour is a macroscopic phenomenon. Others argue that the structure of the brain is so finely tuned that minute variations could have macroscopic effects, rather in the way that, according to ‘chaos theory’, the flapping of a butterfly’s wings in China might affect the weather in New York. (For discussion of this, see Eccles (1980; 1987), and Popper and Eccles (1977).) Still others argue that quantum indeterminacy manifests itself directly at a high level, when acts of observation collapse the wave function, suggesting that the mind may play a direct role in affecting the state of the world (Hodgson 1988; Stapp 1993).

3.4 Epiphenomenalism

Epiphenomenalism is the theory that mental events are caused by physical events, but have no causal influence on the physical. The view was given currency by the biologist Thomas Huxley (1893), partly as a result of his observations of reflex responses in frogs. An ancient precursor may be found in the Yoga-Samkhya view that the soul (purusha) consists in pure awareness and has no effect on the natural world (prakriti) (Schweizer 2019).

Epiphenomenalism does not avoid the problem of how two fundamentally different categories of thing might interact (Green 2003, 149–51). If it is mysterious how the non-physical can have it in its nature to influence the physical, it ought to be equally mysterious how the physical can have it in its nature to produce something non-physical. But epiphenomenalism does promise to avoid the distinctive problems associated with an immaterial mind acting on a material body.

There are at least three serious problems for epiphenomenalism. First, as indicated in section 1, epiphenomenalism is profoundly counterintuitive. What could be more apparent than that it is the pain that you feel that makes you cry, or the visual experience of the boulder rolling towards you that makes you run away? At least one can say that epiphenomenalism is a fall-back position: it tends to be adopted because other options are held to be unacceptable.

A second problem, pressed by William James (1890), is that, if mental states do nothing, there appears to be no reason why they should have evolved. This objection ties in with the first: the intuition there was that conscious states clearly modify our behaviour in certain ways, such as avoiding danger, and it is plain that this would make them very useful from an evolutionary perspective.

Jackson (1982) replies to this objection by saying that it is the brain state associated with pain that evolves for this reason: the sensation is a by-product. Evolution is full of useless or even harmful by-products. For example, polar bears have evolved thick coats to keep them warm, even though this has the damaging side effect that they are heavy to carry.

Jackson’s point is true in general, but does not obviously apply to the case of mind. The heaviness of the polar bear’s coat follows directly from those properties and laws which make it warm: one could not, in any simple way, have one without the other. But with mental states, dualistically conceived, the situation is the opposite. The laws of physical nature which, the mechanist says, make brain states cause behaviour, in no way explain why brain states should give rise to conscious ones. The laws linking mind and brain are what Feigl (1958) calls nomological danglers, that is, brute facts added onto the body of integrated physical law. Why there should have been by-products of that kind seems to have no obvious evolutionary explanation.

The third problem concerns the rationality of belief in epiphenomenalism, via its effect on the problem of other minds. It is natural to say that I know that I have mental states because I experience them directly. But how can I justify my belief that others have them? The simple version of the ‘argument from analogy’ says that I can extrapolate from my own case. I know that certain of my mental states are correlated with certain pieces of behaviour, and so I infer that similar behaviour in others is also accompanied by similar mental states.

Many hold that this is a weak argument because it is induction from one instance, namely, my own. The argument is stronger if it is not a simple induction but an ‘argument to the best explanation’. I seem to know from my own case that mental events can be the explanation of behaviour, and I know of no other candidate explanation for typical human behaviour, so I postulate the same explanation for the behaviour of others. But if epiphenomenalism is true, my mental states do not explain my behaviour and there is a physical explanation for the behaviour of others. It is explanatorily redundant to postulate such states for others. I know, by introspection, that I have them, but is it not just as likely that I alone am subject to this quirk of nature, rather than that everyone is?

For more detailed treatment and further reading on this topic, see the entry epiphenomenalism.

3.5 Parallelism

Epiphenomenalists wishes to preserve the integrity of physical science and the physical world, and appends those mental features that they cannot reduce. Parallelists preserve both realms intact, but deny all causal interaction between them. The mental and physical realms run in harmony with each other, but not because their mutual influence keeps each other in line. That the two should behave as if they were interacting would seem to be a bizarre coincidence. This is why parallelism has tended to be adopted only by those – like Leibniz – who believe in a pre-established harmony, set in place by God.

The progression of thought can be seen as follows. Descartes believes in a more or less natural form of interaction between immaterial mind and material body. Malebranche thought that this was impossible naturally, and so required God to intervene specifically on each occasion on which interaction was required. Leibniz decided that God might as well set things up so that they always behaved as if they were interacting, without particular intervention being required.

Outside such a theistic framework, the theory may seem incredible. Even within such a framework, one might sympathise with Berkeley’s instinct that once genuine interaction is ruled out one is best advised to allow that God creates the physical world directly, within the mental realm itself, as a construct out of experience. For an argument that even Berkeley’s subjective idealism falls foul of the problem of mind-body interaction, see Weir (2021b).

3.6 Hylomorphic Dualism

As noted in section 1.2, hylomorphism is the view that material substances can be explained in terms of two principles, the matter they are composed of, and the form that organises that matter: Socrates is composed of flesh and bones, organised by the form of a human being. Hylomorphists since Aristotle have identified that soul of a living creature with its form. This need not entail any form of mind-body dualism. For a hylomorphist is at liberty to take the view that a human is a wholly physical composite of matter and form, like a plant or a rock. However, Aristotle argues that the human soul has an immaterial part, the intellect, making him to that extent a kind of dualist. More thoroughgoing forms of dualism can be found among later hylomorphists such as Thomas Aquinas, who states that the soul is an immaterial substance (Summa Theologiae, Q 75, A2).

It is no surprise, therefore, that some contemporary hylomorphists describe themselves as ‘hylomorphic dualists’ respecting the mind-body problem (e.g. Oderberg 2005). There is less agreement about two further questions: is hylomorphic dualism a kind of substance dualism, property dualism, or a third theory of neither kind? And where does hylomorphic dualism stand on the issue of mind-body interaction?

It might seem clear that Aquinas, at least, should be understood as a hylomorphic substance dualist. For he himself identifies the soul as an immaterial substance by name, and describes the soul as a unitary, persisting entity that is capable of disembodied existence.

At least some scholars are happy to class certain versions of hylomorphic dualism as hylomorphic substance dualism (Rickabaugh and Moreland 2023, 326–8). At the same time, there are several reasons why commentators have resisted the idea that even Aquinas’s position should be described this way.

First, although Aquinas identifies the soul as a substance, he describes it as an incomplete substance (Skrezypek 2021). Secondly, Aquinas does not identify the self as an immaterial substance, and may deny that the self can exist by itself (De Haan and Dahm 2019). Thirdly, substance dualism is naturally understood as a view on which both body and soul are substances. However, for Aquinas, the human body depends on the soul for its existence. For this reason, if might make greater sense to think of Aquinas as a kind of inverse property dualist, for whom a human is an immaterial substance with material properties (Weir 2023, 138–9).

Proponents of hylomorphic dualism contend that it has an advantage over other kinds of dualism respecting the interaction problem. As we have seen, some versions of the interaction problem rest on the claim that it is mysterious how an immaterial mind and a material body could interact. Hylomorphists can reply that interaction between mind and body is just one instance of the kind of interaction between form and matter that goes on throughout nature and is therefore unmysterious (Feser 2006, 223; 2024, 506–8).

This proposal is not necessarily pertinent to the most influential version of the interaction problem however, the contention that empirical evidence shows the material world to be causally closed. An opponent of hylomorphic dualism might contend that either the soul, on this view, either has no effect on bodily behaviour or, absurdly, causes only those behaviours that a mechanist would expect if there were no such thing as the soul. A natural response for hylomorphic dualists would be to reject the principle of causal closure itself, along with the mechanistic, bottom-up picture of the material world that this principle exemplifies. However, if the empirical case for closure under physics is less than clear cut this may be of comparable help to non-hylomorphic dualists, calling into question whether hylomorphic dualism has a special advantage here.

4. Arguments for Dualism

The most influential arguments for dualism in contemporary philosophy focus on consciousness, the fact that there is ‘something it is like’ to be a mentally endowed creature, in Thomas Nagel’s (1974) famous expression. Of these the most important are the knowledge argument and the conceivability argument. Two further motivations for dualism covered here are the argument from personal identity, and a modern version of the Aristotelian argument. Important motivations for dualism not covered include arguments from free will (Goetz 2016), from tense (Pearson 2018), and from the unity of consciousness (Hasker 1999).

4.1 The Knowledge Argument

One category of arguments for dualism is constituted by the standard objections against physicalism. Prime examples are those based on the existence of qualia, one of the most important of which is the so-called ‘knowledge argument’. Because this argument has its own entry (see the entry qualia: the knowledge argument), we will deal relatively briefly with it here.

The knowledge argument asks us to imagine a future scientist who has lacked a certain sensory modality from birth, but who has acquired a perfect scientific understanding of how this modality operates in others. This scientist – call him Harpo – may have been born stone deaf, but become the world’s greatest expert on the machinery of hearing: he knows everything that there is to know within the range of the physical and behavioural sciences about hearing.

Suppose that Harpo, thanks to developments in neurosurgery, has an operation which finally enables him to hear. It is suggested that he will then learn something he did not know before, which can be expressed as what it is like to hear, or the qualitative or phenomenal nature of sound. These qualitative features of experience are generally referred to as qualia. If Harpo learns something new, he did not know everything before. He knew all the physical facts before. So what he learns on coming to hear – the facts about the nature of experience or the nature of qualia – are non-physical. This establishes at least a state or property dualism. (See Jackson 1982; Robinson 1982.)

There are at least two lines of response to this popular but controversial argument (cf. Goff 2017, 64–74). First is the ‘ability’ response. According to this, Harpo does not acquire any new factual knowledge, only ‘knowledge how’, in the form of the ability to respond directly to sounds, which he could not do before. This essentially behaviouristic account is exactly what the intuition behind the argument is meant to overthrow. Putting ourselves in Harpo’s position, it is meant to be obvious that what he acquires is knowledge of what something is like, not just how to do something. Such appeals to intuition are always, of course, open to denial by those who claim not to share the intuition. Some ability theorists seem to blur the distinction between knowing what something is like and knowing how to do something, by saying that the ability Harpo acquires is to imagine or remember the nature of sound. In this case, what he acquires the ability to do involves the representation to himself of what the thing is like. But this conception of representing to oneself, especially in the form of imagination, seems sufficiently close to producing in oneself something very like a sensory experience that it only defers the problem: until one has a physicalist gloss on what constitutes such representations as those involved in conscious memory and imagination, no progress has been made.

The other line of response is to argue that, although Harpo’s new knowledge is factual, it is not knowledge of a new fact. Rather, it is new way of grasping something that he already knew. He does not realise this, because the concepts employed to capture experience (such as ‘looks red’ or ‘sounds C-sharp’) are similar to demonstratives, and demonstrative concepts lack the kind of descriptive content that allow one to infer what they express from other pieces of information that one may already possess. A total scientific knowledge of the world would not enable you to say which time was ‘now’ or which place was ‘here’. Demonstrative concepts pick something out without saying anything extra about it. Similarly, the scientific knowledge that Harpo originally possessed did not enable him to anticipate what it would be like to re-express some parts of that knowledge using the demonstrative concepts that only experience can give one. The knowledge, therefore, appears to be genuinely new, whereas only the mode of conceiving it is novel.

Proponents of the argument respond that it is problematic to maintain both that the qualitative nature of experience can be genuinely novel, and that the quality itself be the same as some property already grasped scientifically: does not the experience’s phenomenal nature, which the demonstrative concepts capture, constitute a property in its own right? Another way to put this is to say that phenomenal concepts are not pure demonstratives, like ‘here’ and ‘now’, or ‘this’ and ‘that’, because they do capture a genuine qualitative content. Furthermore, experiencing does not seem to consist simply in exercising a particular kind of concept, demonstrative or not. When Harpo has his new form of experience, he does not simply exercise a new concept; he also grasps something new – the phenomenal quality – with that concept. How decisive these considerations are, remains controversial.

4.2 The Conceivability Argument

The conceivability argument comes in two forms: the disembodiment argument, originating in Descartes (Meditation V) and the zombie argument, made popular by Chalmers (1996; 2010). The disembodiment argument can be put as follows:

  1. It is conceivable that one’s mind might exist without one’s body.
  2. If it is conceivable that one’s mind might exist without one’s body then it is possible that one’s mind might exist without one’s body.
  3. Therefore, it is possible that one’s mind might exist without one’s body.
  4. Therefore, one’s mind is a different entity from one’s body.

Descartes’ rationale for accepting premiss (1) can be found in Meditations I and II where he argues that one can coherently doubt that anything exists apart from one’s present conscious existence. Philip Goff summarises Descartes’ line of reasoning as follows:

The arms and legs you seem to see in front of you, the heart you seem to feel beating beneath your breast, your body that feels solid and warm to the touch, all may be figments of a particularly powerful delusion. You might not even have a brain. … [Nonetheless] you know for certain that you are a thing that has an experience as of having arms and legs, a beating heart, a warm, solid body. (Goff 2010, 124)

If one can coherently doubt the existence of anything beyond one’s conscious mind, then it is apparently conceivable that one’s mind might exist without one’s body. For Descartes, premiss (2) rests on the principle that anything one can clearly and distinctly conceive is possible.

Another important disembodiment argument appears in Kripke (1972, 336–7). Unlike Descartes’ argument, which focusses on the conceivability that I, as a conscious mind, might exist without a body, Kripke starts with the claim that it is conceivable that a particular pain ‘A’ could exist without the particular brain state with which it is reputed to be identical.

Recent discussion has given greater weight to the second version of the conceivability argument, defended by Chalmers (1996, 94–9). Rather than focussing on the idea of a disembodied mind, Chalmers focuses on the idea of a mindless body. More precisely, he focuses on the idea of a ‘philosophical zombie’ understood as an exact duplicate of a conscious human being, without the consciousness. The zombie argument can be put as follows:

  1. It is conceivable that a physical duplicate of some human should exist without consciousness (i.e. zombies are conceivable).
  2. If it is conceivable that a physical duplicate of some human should exist without consciousness, then it is possible that a physical duplicate of some human should exist without consciousness (i.e. if zombies are conceivable then zombies are possible).
  3. Therefore, it is possible that a physical duplicate of some human should exist without consciousness (i.e. zombies are possible).
  4. Therefore, consciousness is something over and above the physical.

Chalmers (2002) distinguishes two senses in which premiss (1) seems to be true. First, zombies are conceivable in the sense that we cannot rule out the possibility of such a scenario a priori: there is no apparent contradiction in the idea of a physical duplicate of a human that lacks consciousness. Secondly, zombies are conceivable in the sense that we seem to be able to positively imagine such a scenario in sufficient detail to see that it is not contradictory: one can picture what it would be like for a zombie to exist. For Chalmers, the case for premiss (2) consists in a theory of the relationship between semantics and modality to which we return below.

The zombie argument differs from the disembodiment argument because the hypothesis that the unaltered body could exist without the mind is not the same as the suggestion that the mind might continue to exist without the body, nor are they trivially equivalent. The zombie argument establishes only property dualism and a property dualist might think disembodied existence inconceivable – for example, if they thought the identity of a mind through time depended on its relation to a body (e.g., Penelhum 1970).

There are two main responses to the conceivability argument, in either form. The first response claims that the scenario described in premiss (1) is not in fact conceivable. For example, an analytical behaviourist can argue both that the disembodiment scenario is conceptually impossible, because the existence of mental states a priori entails the existence of certain behavioural states, and that the zombie scenario is conceptually impossible because the existence of the physical duplicate’s behavioural states a priori entails the mental states associate with those behaviours. In the context of the zombie argument, opponents of premiss (1) are known as ‘type-A’ materialists. Chalmers attributes such a view to Dennett (1991).

Most professional philosophers accept premiss (1) of the zombies argument (Bourget and Chalmers 2023). Naturally, therefore, most of the discussion has concerned premiss (2).

The main challenge to premiss (2) says that conceivability is not a reliable guide to possibility. A rationale of those who think that conceivability is not a safe indication of possibility is that there exist a posteriori necessary propositions which we can nonetheless conceive being false. For example, we seem to be able to conceive a situation in which Hesperus is not identical to Phosphorus or on which water is not H2O. And yet if Kripke (1972/1980) is correct, these are not real possibilities despite their apparent conceivability. Another way of putting this point is that there are many epistemic possibilities which are conceivable because they are epistemic possibilities, but which are not real possibilities.

The standard response to this objection is to provide a theory of what is going in the kind of a posteriori necessities discussed by Kripke, and to show that the relationship between mind and body cannot be an a posteriori necessity of the relevant kind.

For example, Chalmers draws a distinction between two dimensions of the meaning of a term, the ‘primary intension’ and the ‘secondary intension’. Take the case of ‘water’. There is a sense in which we can imagine a scenario in which it turns out that water is not H2O but XYZ. And yet, there is also a sense in which, following Kripke (1972/1980), we think it is impossible that anything but H2O could be water. What is going on here? Chalmer’s answer is that the term ‘water’ has a primary intension, which is the function from the actual world to whatever meets our everyday understanding of water: roughly, the clear, drinkable liquid in lakes and rivers etc. ‘Water’ also has a secondary intension which is the function from a world considered as counterfactual to whatever, in that world, shares the underlying essence of water in the actual world.

The sense in which it is true that water could be XYZ is that there are possible scenarios in which the clear drinkable liquid in lakes and rivers really is XYZ. Were such a scenario actually to obtain, we would rightly say ‘water is XYZ’ because XZY is what the primary intension of ‘water’ would pick out. The sense in which it is impossible that water could be XYZ is that, given the empirical fact that water is actually H2O, the secondary intension of ‘water’ picks out H2O in all counterfactual scenarios.

While there are many details to fill in, the important point is that when we seem to conceive of water not being H2O, we do not conceive of an impossible scenario. We conceive of a possible scenario in which the extension of the term ‘water’ is different. This can happen because the primary and secondary intensions of ‘water’ differ.

Might we not be doing something similar when we seem to conceive of a philosophical zombie? Chalmers’ argues that this cannot be so. For it would require that the terms we use to describe conscious experience have different primary and secondary intensions, and they do not.

The primary intension of the term ‘pain’, for example, picks out a certain feeling – that of hurting – just as the primary intension of ‘water’ picks out the clear drinkable liquid in lakes and rivers. But the secondary intension of ‘pain’ does not pick out some underlying essence that might be present without the primary-intension property of hurting, in the way that the secondary intension of ‘water’ does pick out H2O. Rather, the secondary intension of ‘pain’ picks out exactly the same thing as the primary intension: anything that feels like pain.

Another way of putting this is to say that what we mean by ‘water’ is whatever has the actual underlying essence of the stuff that appears a certain way. Whereas what we mean by ‘pain’ is just whatever appears (or feels) a certain way: the primary and secondary intensions of ‘pain’ and other terms for conscious experiences are the same.

The upshot is that when we seem to conceive of a physical duplicate of a conscious human without conscious experiences we can be confident that we are conceiving of a genuinely possible scenario. There is no possibility that we are failing to recognise that the underlying essence of consciousness is present in this scenario. For when we talk about consciousness we are not talking about some underlying essence that stands to our experiences as H2O does to water but about the experiences themselves.

Other strategies for defending the inference from conceivability to possibility have been put forward by Swinburne (1997, New Appendix C; 2018), Goff (2017), and by Kripke (1972/1980) himself, among others. While the details differ, they share the basic structure, analysing what is going on in the kind of a posteriori necessity identified by Kripke, and then showing that the relationship between mind and body cannot be an instance of that kind of a posteriori necessity.

Two kinds of response exist. The first says that there is some other reason why we are mistaken when we take ourselves to be able to conceive of disembodied minds or of ghosts. The most influential version of this response says that the relevant mental terms are, or behave like, demonstratives or indexicals, which pick out their referent without conveying any information about them. This response is especially powerful regarding Descartes’ original articulation of the disembodiment argument, which uses the indexical ‘I’. For a disembodiment argument that does not use demonstratives or indexicals, see Weir (2023, 103–6).

To wield the same response against a conceivability argument that does not use demonstratives or indexicals it is necessary to argue that phenomenal concepts behave like demonstratives. We saw this kind of response to the knowledge argument above. As in that case, the main reply is that phenomenal concepts seem to capture the qualitative nature of their referents, in which case they are not relevantly like demonstratives.

The other option is to argue that while there is no special reason why the apparent possibilities described in the conceivability argument may turn out to be impossible, this could still be the case, simply because there is no strong connection between conceivability and possibility. This response is sometimes expressed by saying that the entailment from mind to body or body to mind might be a ‘strong necessity’ (Chalmers 2002, 36). For an argument that the existence of strong necessities is itself a priori impossible, see Cleevely (2022).

4.3 The Argument from Personal Identity

There is a long tradition, dating at least from Reid (1785), of arguing that the identity of persons over time is not a matter of convention or degree in the way that the identity of other (complex) substances is and that this shows that the self is a different kind of entity from any physical body. Criticism of these arguments and of the intuitions on which they rest, running from Hume to Parfit (1970: 1984), have left us with an inconclusive clash of intuitions.

A related argument which may have its first statement in Madell (1981), does not concern identity through time, but the consequences for identity of certain counterfactuals concerning origin. It can, perhaps, therefore, break the stalemate which faces the debate over diachronic identity. The claim is that the broadly conventionalist ways which are used to deal with problem cases through time for both persons and material objects, and which can also be employed in cases of counterfactuals concerning origin for bodies, cannot be used for similar counterfactuals concerning persons or minds.

Concerning ordinary physical objects, it is easy to imagine counterfactual cases where questions of identity become problematic. Take the example of a particular table. We can scale counterfactual suggestions as follows:

  1. This table might have been made of ice.
  2. This table might have been made of a different sort of wood.
  3. This table might have been made of 95% of the wood it was made of and 5% of some other wood.

The first suggestion would normally be rejected as clearly false, but there will come a point along the spectrum illustrated from (i) to (iii) where the question of whether the hypothesised table would be the same as the one that actually exists have no obvious answer. It seems that the question of whether it ‘really’ is the same one has no clear meaning: it is of, say, 75% the same matter and of 25% different matter; these are the only genuine facts in the case; the question of numerical identity can be decided in any convenient fashion, or left unresolved. There will thus be a penumbra of counterfactual cases where the question of whether two things would be the same is not a matter of fact.

Let us now apply this thought to conscious subjects. Suppose that a given human individual had had origins different from those which he in fact had such that whether that difference affected who he was was not obvious to intuition. What would count as such a case might be a matter of controversy, but there must be one. Perhaps it is unclear whether, if there had been a counterpart to Jones’ body from the same egg but a different though genetically identical sperm from the same father, the person there embodied would have been Jones. Some philosophers might regard it as obvious that sameness of sperm is essential to the identity of a human body and to personal identity. In that case imagine a counterpart sperm in which some of the molecules in the sperm are different; would that be the same sperm? If one pursues the matter far enough there will be indeterminacy which will infect that of the resulting body. There must therefore be some difference such that neither natural language nor intuition tells us whether the difference alters the identity of the human body; a point, that is, where the question of whether we have the same body is not a matter of fact.

How one is to describe these cases is, in some respects, a matter of controversy. Some philosophers think one can talk of vague identity or partial identity. Others think that such expressions are nonsensical. There is no space to discuss this issue here. It is enough to assume, however, that questions of how one is allowed to use the concept of identity effect only the care with which one should characterize these cases, not any substantive matter of fact. There are cases of substantial overlap of constitution in which that fact is the only bedrock fact in the case: there is no further fact about whether they are ‘really’ the same object. If there were, then there would have to be a haecceitas or thisness belonging to and individuating each complex physical object, and this we are assuming to be implausible if not unintelligible. (More about the conditions under which haecceitas can make sense will be found below.)

One might plausibly claim that no similar overlap of constitution can be applied to the counterfactual identity of minds. In Geoffrey Madell’s (1981) words:

But while my present body can thus have its partial counterpart in some possible world, my present consciousness cannot. Any present state of consciousness that I can imagine either is or is not mine. There is no question of degree here. (91)

Why is this so? Imagine the case where we are not sure whether it would have been Jones’ body – and, hence, Jones – that would have been created by the slightly modified sperm and the same egg. Can we say, as we would for an object with no consciousness, that the story something the same, something different is the whole story: that overlap of constitution is all there is to it? For the Jones body as such, this approach would do as well as for any other physical object. But suppose Jones, in reflective mood, asks himself ‘if that had happened, would I have existed?’ There are at least three answers he might give to himself. (i) I either would or would not, but I cannot tell. (ii) There is no fact of the matter whether I would or would not have existed: it is just a mis-posed question. (iii) In some ways, or to some degree, I would have, and in some ways, or to some degree, I would not. The creature who would have existed would have had a kind of overlap of psychic constitution with me.

The third answer parallels the response we would give in the case of bodies. But as an account of the subjective situation, it is arguable that this makes no sense. Call the creature that would have emerged from the slightly modified sperm, ‘Jones2’. Is the overlap suggestion that, just as, say 85% of Jones2’s original body would have been identical with Jones’, about 85% of his psychic life would have been Jones’? That it would have been like Jones’ – indeed that Jones2 might have had a psychic life 100% like Jones’ – makes perfect sense, but that he might have been to that degree, the same psyche – that Jones ‘85% existed’ – arguably makes no sense. Take the case in which Jones and Jones2 have exactly similar lives throughout: which 85% of the 100% similar mental events do they share? Nor does it make sense to suggest that Jones might have participated in the whole of Jones2’s psychic life, but in a rather ghostly only 85% there manner. Clearly, the notion of overlap of numerically identical psychic parts cannot be applied in the way that overlap of actual bodily part constitution quite unproblematically can.

This might make one try the second answer. We can apply the ‘overlap’ answer to the Jones body, but the question of whether the minds or subjects would have been the same, has no clear sense. It is difficult to see why it does not. Suppose Jones found out that he had originally been one of twins, in the sense that the zygote from which he developed had divided, but that the other half had died soon afterwards. He can entertain the thought that if it had been his half that had died, he would never have existed as a conscious being, though someone would whose life, both inner and outer, might have been very similar to his. He might feel rather guiltily grateful that it was the other half that died. It would be strange to think that Jones is wrong to think that there is a matter of fact about this. And how is one to ‘manage’ the transition from the case where there is a matter of fact to the case where there is not?

If the reasoning above is correct, one is left with only the first option. If so, there has to be an absolute matter of fact from the subjective point of view. But the physical examples we have considered show that when something is essentially complex, this cannot be the case. When there is constitution, degree and overlap of constitution are inevitably possible. So the mind must be simple. Given that the body is high complex, it seems to follow that the mind is immaterial.

4.4 The Aristotelian Argument in Modern Form

Putting his anti-materialist argument outlined above, in section 1, in very general terms, Aristotle’s worry was that a material organ could not have the range and flexibility that are required for human thought. His worries concerned the cramping effect that matter would have on the range of objects that intellect could accommodate. Parallel modern concerns centre on the restriction that matter would impose on the range of rational processes that we could exhibit. Some of these concerns are of a technical kind. Gödel, for example, believed that his famous theorem showed that there are demonstrably rational forms of mathematical thought of which humans are capable which could not be exhibited by a mechanical or formal system of a sort that a physical mind would have to be. Penrose (1990) has argued that Turing’s halting problem has similar consequences. But there are other less technical and easier to appreciate issues. We will mention four ways in which physicalist theories of thought seem vulnerable to attack by the dualist.

(a) At least since the time of Ryle’s (1949) Concept of Mind, it has been assumed that thinking can be handled in a dispositionalist way; so only sensations or ‘raw feels’ constitute a problem for the physicalist. There has been a rise or revival of a belief in what is now called cognitive phenomenology, that is, the belief that thoughts, of whatever kind – beliefs, desires, and the whole range of propositional attitude state – are conscious in a more than behavioural functional sense. This raises problems for physicalism, for, just as it is a problem that direct knowledge of ‘what it is like’ to experience your sensations is ultimately hidden from anyone else, so what you are thinking is directly accessible only privately, once it has been conceded that it has a phenomenology and not just a functional manifestation.

(b) Anything purely physical operates solely according to physical laws operating on its physical properties: it does not, at bottom, operate according to meanings, senses, or propositional content. As a ‘thinking machine’, it is what Dennett (1987, 61) calls ‘a syntactic engine’, where ‘syntax’ is used, somewhat extendedly, to signify merely the physical structure of symbols and the consequent rules of their operation, rather than their meaning. The issue is whether, under this constraint, one can give an account for meaningful communication and understanding at all.

(c) Physicalist theories of thought almost all focus on the model of computing, and when it comes to making problem solving (as opposed to simply calculating) computers, computation comes across what is known as the Frame Problem. This is clearly expounded in Dennett (1984); see also the entry on The Frame Problem. The problem is that the ‘mechanical mind’ can only follow instructions, cannot see relevance that has not been strictly encoded. This is often expressed by saying it lacks ‘common sense’.

(d) There is what has become known as ‘Benacerraf’s Problem’ (See his 1983; cf. Robinson 2011). Numbers, it would seem, are abstract objects, yet our intellects operate with them all the time. How does a physical brain interact with an abstract entity? A similar problem could be raised for concepts in general; they are abstract, general entities, not physical particulars, yet they are the meat and drink of thinking. For a dualist about intellect there does not appear to be the same problem. The immaterial intellect is precisely the sort of thing that can grasp abstract objects, such as numbers and universals – in the Aristotelian context, the immaterial intellect is the home of forms. (There is still the issue of how this intellectual capacity of the immaterial mind relates to sensory consciousness. According to Aristotle, perception is a wholly embodied process, but for modern dualists, sensory consciousness is not material. In order to unify the perceptual and intellectual functions of the mind, traditional empiricists tended to be imagists, in their theory of thought, in order to assimilate the intellectual to the sensory, but this assimilation is rejected by those who believe in a distinct cognitive phenomenology, as mentioned in (a) above.) The difficulty in accounting for the brain’s relation to abstract entities explains why most materialists tend to be nominalists, thus reducing thoughts to concrete particulars of some kind. (D. M. Armstrong in his (1978) is a striking exception to this, accepting an in re theory of universals.) But if you do not find either nominalism or Armstrong’s causal-functional theory of thinking convincing, Plato’s idea in the Phaedo that the intellect must be such that it can have an affinity with immaterial things may begin to look plausible.

We will not discuss (a) further, as it is discussed in section 5 of the entry on phenomenal intentionality, An immaterialist response to (d) can be found in Robinson (2011).

Both (b) and (c) seem to draw out the claim that a material system lacks understanding. John Searle’s famous ‘Chinese Room’ argument (Searle 1980; see also the entry on the Chinese Room Argument) seems to support this conclusion, at least if the material system takes the form of a classical computer, manipulating symbols according to rules. Searle imagines himself in a room with a letter box through which strings of symbols are posted in, and, following a book of rules, he puts out symbols which the rules dictate, given the strings he is receiving. In fact, Searle says, he has been conducting a conversation in Chinese, because the symbols are Chinese script, and the rules those on which a Chinese computer might work, but he has not understood a word. Therefore, neither does a computer understand, so we, understanding creatures, are not computers. If Searle is right, this is the end for the classical ‘syntactic engine’ as a model for thought.

Another argument for the same conclusion is advanced by James Ross (2008, Ch. 6) and Edward Feser (2013). This argument contends that for the kind of reasons given by Kripke (1982), nothing material can have an exact or unambiguous conceptual content. For example, nothing about a machine can ever make it determinately true that it is engaging in addition, rather than a distinct function, ‘quaddition’ which yields the same results when x and y are smaller than some arbitrarily high number n, but that yield 5 otherwise. Since the machine’s internal operations can be interpreted in various ways, nothing about its physical configuration or computational history uniquely fixes which rule it is following. If it malfunctions and starts yielding quaddition outputs rather than addition outputs, the only thing that makes this count as a malfunction is extrinsic factors such as its designers’ intentions or our interpretations. By contrast, human thought processes can have an exact or unambiguous conceptual content: it is really true that humans can add rather than quuad. If so, it follows that human thought processes are not material.

A blow was struck against the computational theory of thought when, in 2000, Fodor produced his The Mind Does Not Work That Way, in which he made clear his belief that the kind of computationalism that he had been describing and developing ever since the 1970s only fits sub-personal informational processing, not conscious, problem solving thought. Fodor had, in fact, always mentioned this reservation, but his claim that what he was describing was ‘the Language of Thought’ led his readers generally to take him to be proposing an account of what we normally consider to be thinking, which is not restricted to (even if it includes at all) sub-personal processes. The modest view is entirely in line with his close colleague Chomsky’s claim that his – Chomsky’s – linguistic theories cannot touch the ‘creative use of language’(See Baker, 2011).

A physicalist response to at least some of these challenges is to say that they apply only to the classical computing model, and are avoided by connectionist theories. Classical computing works on rules of inference like those of standard logic, but connectionism is rather a form of associationism, which is supposedly closer to the way in which the brain works. (See the entry on Connectionism.) The latest version of this – ‘Deep Learning’ – has proven unexpectedly powerful and underlies all the major advances of AI in recent years, from image generation to chatbots. But Gary Marcus (2018 – see Other Internet Resources) and others have pointed out the ways in which these impressive machines are quite different from human thought. Marcus points to ten significant differences, but the two most easy to capture briefly are (i) ‘deep learning’ is data hungry. We can learn things with very few trials because we latch on to abstract relationships, whereas the machine requires many – perhaps thousands or millions – of examples to try to catch extensionally what we get by the abstract or intensional relation. (ii) Deep learning is shallow and has a limited capacity for transfer of what it has learnt from one context to another, even though the differences look trivial to us. It may follow that collecting examples cannot itself constitute ‘getting the point’, though it might manage to mimic it, if the circumstances are carefully managed.

The dualist might sum up the situation on thought in the following way. The case against physicalist theories of sensation is that it is unbelievable that what it feels like to be struck hard on the nose is itself either just a case of being disposed or caused to engage in certain behaviours, or that what it feels like is not fundamental to the way you do react. Similarly, the dualist about thought will say, when you are, for example, engaged in a philosophical discussion, and you make a response to your interlocutor, it is obvious that you are intending to respond to what you thought he or she meant and are concentrating on what what you intend to say means. It seems as bizarre to say that this is a byproduct of processes to which meaning is irrelevant, as it is to claim the same about sensory consciousness. You are, in other words, as fundamentally a semantically driven engine, as you are a sensorily consciously driven one.

A dualist might, on this basis, argue that Plato was right in claiming that intellect necessarily has an affinity with the realm of abstract entities, and Aristotle was right to think that no material or mechanical system could capture the flexibility built into genuine understanding.

4.5 The Argument from Predicate Dualism

We said above that predicate dualism might seem to have no ontological consequences, because it is concerned only with the different way things can be described within the contexts of the different sciences, not with any real difference in the things themselves. This, however, can be disputed.

The argument from predicate to property dualism moves in two steps, both controversial. The first claims that the irreducible special sciences, which are the sources of irreducible predicates, are not wholly objective in the way that physics is, but depend for their subject matter upon interest-relative perspectives on the world. This means that they, and the predicates special to them, depend on the existence of minds and mental states, for only minds have interest-relative perspectives. The second claim is that psychology – the science of the mental – is itself an irreducible special science, and so it, too, presupposes the existence of the mental. Mental predicates therefore presuppose the mentality that creates them: mentality cannot consist simply in the applicability of the predicates themselves.

First, let us consider the claim that the special sciences are not fully objective, but are interest-relative.

No-one would deny, of course, that the very same subject matter or ‘hunk of reality’ can be described in irreducibly different ways and it still be just that subject matter or piece of reality. A mass of matter could be characterized as a hurricane, or as a collection of chemical elements, or as mass of sub-atomic particles, and there be only the one mass of matter. But such different explanatory frameworks seem to presuppose different perspectives on that subject matter.

This is where basic physics, and perhaps those sciences reducible to basic physics, differ from irreducible special sciences. On a realist construal, the completed physics cuts physical reality up at its ultimate joints: any special science which is nomically strictly reducible to physics also, in virtue of this reduction, it could be argued, cuts reality at its joints, but not at its minutest ones. If scientific realism is true, a completed physics will tell one how the world is, independently of any special interest or concern: it is just how the world is. It would seem that, by contrast, a science which is not nomically reducible to physics does not take its legitimation from the underlying reality in this direct way. Rather, such a science is formed from the collaboration between, on the one hand, objective similarities in the world and, on the other, perspectives and interests of those who devise the science. The concept of hurricane is brought to bear from the perspective of creatures concerned about the weather. Creatures totally indifferent to the weather would have no reason to take the real patterns of phenomena that hurricanes share as constituting a single kind of thing. With the irreducible special sciences, there is an issue of salience , which involves a subjective component: a selection of phenomena with a certain teleology in mind is required before their structures or patterns are reified. The entities of metereology or biology are, in this respect, rather like Gestalt phenomena.

Even accepting this, why might it be thought that the perspectivality of the special sciences leads to a genuine property dualism in the philosophy of mind? It might seem to do so for the following reason. Having a perspective on the world, perceptual or intellectual, is a psychological state. So the irreducible special sciences presuppose the existence of mind. If one is to avoid an ontological dualism, the mind that has this perspective must be part of the physical reality on which it has its perspective. But psychology, it seems to be almost universally agreed, is one of those special sciences that is not reducible to physics, so if its subject matter is to be physical, it itself presupposes a perspective and, hence, the existence of a mind to see matter as psychological. If this mind is physical and irreducible, it presupposes mind to see it as such. We seem to be in a vicious circle or regress.

We can now understand the motivation for full-blown reduction. A true basic physics represents the world as it is in itself, and if the special sciences were reducible, then the existence of their ontologies would make sense as expressions of the physical, not just as ways of seeing or interpreting it. They could be understood ‘from the bottom up’, not from top down. The irreducibility of the special sciences creates no problem for the dualist, who sees the explanatory endeavor of the physical sciences as something carried on from a perspective conceptually outside of the physical world. Nor need this worry a physicalist, if he can reduce psychology, for then he could understand ‘from the bottom up’ the acts (with their internal, intentional contents) which created the irreducible ontologies of the other sciences. But psychology is one of the least likely of sciences to be reduced. If psychology cannot be reduced, this line of reasoning leads to real emergence for mental acts and hence to a real dualism for the properties those acts instantiate (Robinson 2003).

4.6 From Property Dualism to Substance Dualism

As we noted in section 2.4, there exists a received opinion in recent philosophy of mind that property dualism is greatly preferable to substance dualism. Here, we consider one kind of argument that substance dualism is in fact more defensible. The argument discussed below presses the case that the mind is a substance in the sense that it is a unitary entity, not a Buddhist or Humean bundle. For an argument that dualists must accept that the mind is a substance in the sense that it is an independent entity, capable of existing by itself, see Weir (2021c; 2023).

Hume is generally understood to advance what is known as the ‘bundle’ theory of the self (Treatise Book I, Part IV, section VI), according to which there are mental states, but no further subject or substance which possesses them. He famously expresses his theory as follows.

…when I enter most intimately into what I call myself, I always stumble on some particular perception or other, of heat or cold, light or shade,love or hatred, pain or pleasure. I can never catch myself at any time without a perception, and can never observe any thing but the perception.

Nevertheless, in the Appendix of the same work he expressed dissatisfaction with this account. Somewhat surprisingly, it is not very clear just what his worry was, but it is expressed as follows:

In short there are two principles, which I cannot render consistent; nor is it in my power to renounce either of them, viz. that all our distinct perceptions are distinct existences, and that the mind never perceives any real connection between distinct existences.

Berkeley had entertained a similar theory to the one found in Hume’s main text in his Philosophical Commentaries, (Notebook A, paras 577–81), but later rejected it for the claim that we could have a notion, though not an idea of the self. Something resembling this Berkeleian view is anticipated by Nyaya responses to the Buddhist bundle theory of the mind in antiquity. It is expressed in more modern terms by John Foster.

A natural response to Hume would be to say that, even if we cannot detect ourselves apart from our perceptions (our conscious experiences)we can at least detect ourselves in them … Surely I am aware of [my experience], so to speak, from the inside – not as something presented, but as something which I have or as the experiential state which I am in … and this is equivalent to saying that I detect it by being aware of myself being visually aware. (Foster 1991, 215)

There is a clash of intuitions here between which it is difficult to arbitrate. There is an argument that is meant to favour the need for a subject, as claimed by Berkeley and Foster.

  1. If the bundle theory were true, then it should be possible to identify mental events independently of, or prior to, identifying the person or mind to which they belong.
  2. It is not possible to identify mental events in this way.
  3. Therefore the bundle theory is false.

E. J. Lowe (1996) defends this argument and argues for (2) as follows.

What is wrong with the [bundle] theory is that … it presupposes, untenably, that an account of the identity conditions of psychological modes can be provided which need not rely on reference to persons. But it emerges that the identity of any psychological mode turns on the identity of the person that possesses it. What this implies is that psychological modes are essentially modes of persons, and correspondingly that persons can be conceived of as substances.

To say that, according to the bundle theory, the identity conditions of individual mental states must be independent of the identity of the person who possesses them, is to say that their identity is independent of the bundle to which they belong. Hume certainly thought something like this, for he thought that an impression might ‘float free’ from the mind to which it belonged, but it is not obvious that a bundle theorist is forced to adopt this position. Perhaps the identity of a mental event is bound up with the complex to which it belongs. That this is impossible certainly needs further argument.

Hume seems, however, in the main text to unconsciously make a concession to the opposing view, namely the view that there must be something more than the items in the bundle to make up a mind. He says:

The mind is a kind of theatre where several perceptions successively make their appearance; pass, re-pass, glide away and mingle in an infinite variety of postures and situations.

Talk of the mind as a theatre is, of course, normally associated with the Cartesian picture, and the invocation of any necessary medium, arena or even a field hypostasize some kind of entity which binds the different contents together and without which they would not be a single mind. Modern Humeans – such as Parfit (1971; 1984) or Dainton (2008) – replace the theatre with a co-consciousness relation. So the bundle theorist is perhaps not as restricted as Hume thought. The bundle consists of the objects of awareness and the co-consciousness relation (or relations) that hold between them. The modern bundle theorist might say that it is the nexus of co-consciousness relations that constitutes our sense of the subject and of the act of awareness of the object. This involves abandoning the second of Hume’s principles, that the mind can never perceive any connection between distinct existences, because the co-consciousness relation is something of which we are aware.

5. Problems for Dualism

By far the most influential objection to dualism is the problem of interaction, which we have already discussed in section 3.3. In this section we consider two other facets of dualism that worry critics. First, there is what one might term the queerness of the mental if conceived of as non-physical. Second there is the difficulty of giving an account of the unity of the mind. Important challenges not covered here include providing a dualist account of embodiment and explaining when immaterial minds arise in the gestation of individual organisms and in the evolution of species.

5.1 The Queerness of the Mental

Physical objects and their properties are sometimes observable and sometimes not, but any physical object is equally accessible, in principle, to anyone. From the right location, we could all see the tree in the quad, and, though none of us can observe an electron directly, everyone is equally capable of detecting it in the same ways using instruments. But the possessor of mental states seems to have a privileged access to them that no-one else can share. That is why there is a widely recognised sceptical ‘problem of other minds’, but no comparably well established ‘problem of my own mind’. This suggests to some philosophers that minds are not ordinary occupants of physical space.

Physical objects are spatio-temporal, and bear spatio-temporal and causal relations to each other. Mental states seem to have causal powers, but they also possess the mysterious property of intentionality – being about other things – including things like Zeus and the square root of minus one, which do not exist. No mere physical thing could be said to be, in a literal sense, ‘about’ something else. The nature of the mental is both queer and elusive. In Ryle’s deliberately abusive phrase, the mind, as the dualist conceives of it, is a ‘ghost in a machine’. Ghosts are mysterious and unintelligible: machines are composed of identifiable parts and work on intelligible principles. Considerations of this kind motivate many philosophers to avoid dualism if possible.

Arguably, this contrast holds only if we stick to a Newtonian and common-sense view of the material, however. Think instead of energy and force-fields in a space-time that possesses none of the properties that our senses seem to reveal: on this conception, we seem to be able to attribute to matter nothing beyond an abstruse mathematical structure. Whilst the material world, because of its mathematicalisation, forms a tighter abstract system than mind, the sensible properties that figure as the objects of mental states may constitute the only intelligible content for any concrete picture of the world that we can devise. So, perhaps the world within the experiencing mind is, once one considers it properly, no more – or even less – queer than the world outside it.

5.2 The Unity of the Mind

Whether one believes that the mind is a substance or just a bundle of properties, the same challenge arises, which is to explain the nature of the unity of the immaterial mind. For the Cartesian, that means explaining how we should understand the notion of immaterial substance. For the Humean, the issue is to explain the nature of the relationship between the different elements in the bundle that binds them into one thing. Neither tradition has been notably successful in this latter task: indeed, Hume, in the appendix to the Treatise, declared himself wholly mystified by the problem, rejecting his own initial solution (though quite why is not clear from the text).

5.2.1 Unity and Bundle Dualism

If the mind is only a bundle of properties, without a mental substance to unite them, then an account is needed of what constitutes its unity. The only route appears to be to postulate a primitive relation of co-consciousness in which the various elements stand to each other.

There are two strategies which can be used to attack the bundle theory. One is to claim that our intuitions favour belief in a subject and that the arguments presented in favour of the bundle alternative are unsuccessful, so the intuition stands. The other is to try to refute the theory itself. Foster (1991, 212–9) takes the former path. This is not effective against someone who thinks that metaphysical economy gives a prima facie priority to bundle theories, on account of their avoiding mysterious substances.

The core objection to bundle theories (e.g. Armstrong 1968, 21–3) is that, because it takes individual mental contents as its elements, such contents should be able to exist alone, as could the individual bricks from a house. Hume accepted this consequence, but most philosophers regard it as absurd. There could not be a mind that consisted of a lone pain or red after-image, especially not of one that had detached itself from the mind to which it had previously belonged. Therefore it makes more sense to think of mental contents as modes of a subject.

Bundle theorists tend to take phenomenal contents as the primary elements in their bundle. Thus the problem is how to relate, say, the visual field to the auditory field, producing a ‘unity of apperception’, that is, a total experience that seems to be presented to a single subject. Seeing the problem in this way has obvious Humean roots. This atomistic conception of the problem becomes less natural if one tries to accommodate other kinds of mental activity and contents. How are acts of conceptualising, attending to or willing with respect to, such perceptual contents to be conceived? These kinds of mental acts seem to be less naturally treated as atomic elements in a bundle, bound by a passive unity of apperception. William James (1890, vol. 1, 336–41) attempts to answer these problems. He claims to introspect in himself a ‘pulse of thought’ for each present moment, which he calls ‘the Thought’ and which is the ‘vehicle of the judgement of identity’ and the ‘vehicle of choice as well as of cognition’. These ‘pulses’ are united over time because each ‘appropriates’ the past Thoughts and ‘makes us say “as sure as I exist, those past facts were part of myself”. James attributes to these Thoughts acts of judging, attending, willing etc, and this may seem incoherent in the absence of a genuine subject. But there is also a tendency to treat many if not all aspects of agency as mere awareness of bodily actions or tendencies, which moves one back towards a more normal Humean position. Whether James’ position really improves on Hume’s, or merely mystifies it, is still a moot point. (But see Sprigge (1993), 84–97, for an excellent, sympathetic discussion.)

5.2.2 Unity and Substance Dualism

The problem is to explain what kind of a thing an immaterial substance is, such that its presence explains the unity of the mind. The answers given can be divided into three kinds.

(a) The ‘ectoplasm’ account: The view that immaterial substance is a kind of immaterial stuff. There are two problems with this approach. First, in so far as this ‘ectoplasm’ has any characterisation as a ‘stuff’ – that is, a structure of its own over and above the explicitly mental properties that it sustains – it leaves it as much a mystery why this kind of stuff should support unified conscious experience as it is why ordinary matter should. Second, and connectedly, it is not clear in what sense such stuff is immaterial, except in the sense that it cannot be integrated into the normal scientific account of the physical world. Why is it not just an aberrant kind of physical stuff? One answer to the latter question would be that the immaterial stuff is fundamentally mental and therefore not physical in the sense relevant to physicalism (Wilson 2006, 92, fn 1).

b) The ‘consciousness’ account: The view that consciousness is the substance. Account (a) allowed the immaterial substance to have a nature over and above the kinds of state we would regard as mental. The consciousness account does not. This is Descartes’ view. The most obvious objection to this theory is that it does not allow the subject to exist when unconscious. This forces one to take one of four possible theories. One could claim (i) that we are conscious when we do not seem to be (which was Descartes’ view): or (ii) that we exist intermittently, though are still the same thing (which is Swinburne’s theory, (1997, 179)): or (iii) that each of us consists of a series of substances, changed at any break in consciousness, which pushes one towards a constructivist account of identity through time and so towards the spirit of the bundle theory: or (iv) even more speculatively, that the self stands in such a relation to the normal time series that its own continued existence is not brought into question by its failure to be present in time at those moments when it is not conscious within that series (Robinson, forthcoming).

(c) The ‘no-analysis’ account: The view that it is a mistake to present any analysis. This is Foster’s view, and Vendler (1984) and Madell (1981) appear to have similar positions. Foster argues that even the ‘consciousness’ account is an attempt to explain what the immaterial self is ‘made of’ which assimilates it too far towards a kind of physical substance. In other words, Descartes has only half escaped from the ‘ectoplasmic’ model. (He has half escaped because he does not attribute non-mental properties to the self, but he is still captured by trying to explain what it is made of.)

Foster (1991) expresses it as follows:

…it seems to me that when I focus on myself introspectively, I am not only aware of being in a certain mental condition; I am also aware, with the same kind of immediacy, of being a certain sort of thing…

It will now be asked: ‘Well, what is this nature, this sortal attribute? Let’s have it specified!’ But such a demand is misconceived. Of course, I can give it a verbal label: for instance, I can call it ‘subjectness’ or ‘selfhood’. But unless they are interpreted ‘ostensively’, by reference to what is revealed by introspective awareness, such labels will not convey anything over and above the nominal essence of the term ‘basic subject’. In this respect, however, there is no difference between this attribute, which constitutes the subject’s essential nature, and the specific psychological attributes of his conscious life…

Admittedly, the feeling that there must be more to be said from a God’s eye view dies hard. The reason is that, even when we have acknowledged that basic subjects are wholly non-physical, we still tend to approach the issue of their essential natures in the shadow of the physical paradigm. (Foster 1991, 243–5)

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