Philosophy of Education

First published Tue Feb 11, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Randall Curren replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous authors.]

Philosophy of education was a prominent aspect of the philosophy of human affairs that emerged in fourth century BCE Athens, and it has remained an integral aspect of philosophy through much of its subsequent history (Rorty 1998; Curren 2018; Laverty & Hansen 2023). It established itself as a distinct subfield of philosophy in the 1960s (Peters 1973a; Doyle 1973; Kominsky 1993), and its growth since the 1980s has been dramatic (Hirst & White 1998; Curren 2003, 2023a; Siegel 2009; Bailey et al. 2010; Phillips 2014; Smith 2015).

Overviews of philosophy of education have adopted a variety of approaches. One approach has been to present it as a field of competing philosophical orientations or philosophies of education (N. Henry 1942, 1955; Passmore 1980: 3–7). A second approach has been to group works in philosophy of education according to the related subfields of philosophy from which they draw resources (Soltis 1981). A third approach has been topical, using different aspects of education as the organizing basis for the field (Peters 1973a). Hybrids of these approaches and historical overviews have also appeared (e.g., Blake et al. 2003; Siegel 2009).

No overview using any of these approaches can proceed without some conception of the object of study, any more than philosophy of science or philosophy of law can be defined and surveyed without a working conception of what science or law is. Philosophical efforts to demarcate science, law, and education—to clarify their natures by distinguishing them from other human endeavors—are a foundational aspect of the enterprise. As human endeavors, all three have natures that may be defined in part by specific practices and in part by purposes, aims, or aspirations. They are all highly institutionalized, diverse in the forms they take, and shape the ways we live. Important questions arise concerning the relationships between education, law, and science as institutions, as well as the relationships between education and other basic institutions: the family, economy, and religion. The questions concerning these relationships are to some extent normative, to some extent empirical, and to some extent matters of social ontology.

Philosophy of education is thus concerned not only with philosophical questions about education as such but with larger questions of education policy and the roles of educational institutions in societies. This entry adopts a topical approach organized around the nature of education and the kinds of normative questions that arise concerning education.

1. The Object of Inquiry and Most Basic Questions

The natural point of departure for philosophical investigations of education is a pre-theoretical identification of educational practices and the assumptions and aspirations, aims, or purposes that guide them. Education may be broadly characterized as the promotion of desirable forms of learning and personal development through practices that would provisionally include:

  1. supervision of study, exploration, experimentation, collaboration, play, and other forms of exertion of abilities through which desirable forms of learning and development typically occur;
  2. instruction or teaching;
  3. coaching, which combines supervision of practice, diagnosis of limitations of performance, and targeted instruction;
  4. habituation associated with coaching, supervision, and structuring of learning environments and activities;
  5. evaluation associated with all of these;
  6. mentoring and counseling;
  7. motivational and disciplinary (i.e., correctional) aspects of supervision, instruction, and coaching (cf. Hirst & Peters 1970: 19).

Education involving any number of these practices may occur more or less informally in diverse settings.

The institutionalization of education embeds such practices in para-educational practices that have become highly professionalized, notably:

  1. management of educational institutions;
  2. educational policy making;
  3. curriculum development;
  4. production of knowledge, including the evidential basis for educational policy making;
  5. student and community life practices (e.g., fairs, clubs, sports);
  6. occupational certification, credentialing, and placement in internships and jobs.

There are many questions about these educational and para-educational practices that are at least partly philosophical. As human practices with significance for the interests of everyone in the society, there are obviously ethical questions at stake, including questions of justice. A high-level typology of the kinds of ethical questions at stake can be predicated on the fact that supervision or governance of the activities of learners is a pervasive aspect of education. If there are distinct normative aspects of governance, there will be corresponding normative aspects of education. These arguably (Curren 2007; cf. White 1995a: 216) pertain to the:

  1. aims of education;
  2. content of education or what is communicated through institutional structure, norms, rules, and curricula;
  3. manner and methods of education (e.g., pedagogy, evaluation, and classroom management);
  4. grounds, limits, and distribution of educational authority;
  5. educational responsibilities, with respect to adequacy, equality, inclusion, and student well-being.

The five basic questions about the conduct of education are thus: What are its aims? What should its content be? How, or in what manner, should it be carried out? How is educational authority to be assigned? What responsibilities does educating entail?

Answers to these normative questions about education typically begin in conceptions of the nature of education, but they often rest on philosophical, empirical, and hybrid claims about human development, rationality, well-being, freedom, motivation, virtues, knowledge, understanding, language, communication, cooperation, measurement, expertise, democracy, a just society, work, and other matters. The pursuit of normative questions about education thereby leads one to further questions that are largely philosophical but spill over into psychology, sociology, psychometrics, political science, economics, and other disciplines. Philosophy of education thus stands at a complex intersection of philosophical sub-fields and other disciplines. It can choose to keep concrete matters of educational policy and practice at arms-length, but the trend in recent years has been toward actionable ethical analysis, sometimes referred to as “non-ideal theorizing” about educational justice (Brighouse, Ladd, et al. 2018; Levinson 2023b; Levinson & Fay 2016, 2019; Levinson & Theisen-Homer 2015; Levinson, Geron et al. 2024; Levinson, Reid et al. 2024; Schouten & Brighouse 2015; Swift 2008; Taylor & Kuntz 2021). It can similarly choose to sidestep the empirical questions, but it is no coincidence that another trend in recent years has been toward scholarship that is more empirically informed, cross-disciplinary, and collaborative than in the past.

2. The Nature and Aims of Education

There was a time, in the 1960s and 70s, when philosophers of education devoted much of their attention to analyzing the nature or concept of education. Richard S. Peters, the leading light in philosophy of education in the U.K. at the time, held that education is concerned with the transmission of worthwhile things and what distinguishes it from, on the one hand, training and, on the other hand, mere growth is that education promotes the development of students’ minds and their appreciation of what is valuable, through voluntary initiation into

modes of conduct and thought which have standards written into them by reference to which it is possible to act, think, and feel with varying degrees of skill, relevance and taste. (Peters 1965 [2007: 65]; cf. Oakeshott 1971)

What Peters envisioned was students being able to see, understand, and appreciate the world in powerful ways through the conceptual, analytical, and constructive resources of arts and sciences. He also envisioned students becoming willing participants in the ongoing life of the traditions of practice and inquiry into which they are initiated, carrying those traditions forward and revising the existing standards as reasons to do so come to light (cf. Scheffler 1973). They should become willing and capable participants in the “conversation” of mankind, as Michael Oakeshott (1959) put it. Conceiving of education in this way, Peters argued that it cannot be fully justified instrumentally through the further benefits to individuals or societies it might yield, but he acknowledged some doubt as to whether it could be fully justified non-instrumentally through the inherent rewards of inquiry and cultural pursuits—“goods which are constitutive of a worth-while level of life” (Peters 1973b: 247). Peters was grappling with something like Aristotle’s conception of a liberal education (Nussbaum 1997; Nightingale 2001) and the “Aristotelian Hypothesis” on which it rested—the hypothesis that the most admirable pursuits, which he took to be forms of theoretical or scientific inquiry, are also the most truly pleasant or rewarding (Reeve 2012). The most worthwhile life, or life most objectively and subjectively fulfilling for a human being or community, would be the defining or (alternatively) most ethically appropriate purpose of education.

Peters’ collaborator, Paul Hirst, framed a related conception of liberal education as initiation into forms of knowledge (Hirst 1965) but later retreated from this to a more expansive conception of education as initiation into human practices (Hirst 1993). In framing the latter view, he relied on Alasdair MacIntyre’s (1981) conception of a practice (i.e., “any coherent and complex form of socially established cooperative human activity” [1981: 175]) and goods internal to practices (i.e., goods attainable only in achieving “standards of excellence which are appropriate to, and partially definitive of, that form of activity” [1981: 175]). This yielded a less elitist—though still problematic (Hager 2011)—view of the worthwhile lives for which students might be prepared, as well as the idea that integrity in teaching involves fidelity to the goods internal to practices into which students are initiated (Strike 2003). However, the dominant focus of the ensuing discussion of education as initiation into practices was the question of whether teaching itself is a practice involving internal goods that warrant a granting of professional autonomy for teachers because such goods can only be appreciated by those engaged in the practice (MacIntyre & Dunne 2002; Dunne 2003; Higgins 2003; Hogan & Smith 2003). MacIntyre insisted that teaching is not a practice, others mostly disagreed, but the lesson of the debate is arguably that MacIntyre’s way of distinguishing “internal” and “external” goods obscured the relationships between the inherent goods or aims of education—goods or aims without which it would not be education—and the further goods or purposes that might be achieved through education (Hager 2011). Surveying the economic and civic aims that are often attributed to educational systems, Peters (1965) argued unpersuasively that all such talk of aims is confused, much as many have characterized liberal education as simply “learning for learning’s sake”—learning motivated by the intrinsic or non-instrumental value of knowing, or the intrinsic or non-instrumental value of activities of learning or inquiry, or the intrinsic or non-instrumental value of cultural achievements that students may come to appreciate. Yet, there is no obvious reason why education could not involve inherent goods or aims and also justifiably serve further student-centered aims, public aims, or both.

Related debates about the nature of education and idea of an educated person have played out in other work on liberal education (e.g., Nussbaum 1997, 2004, 2010) and a primarily German literature of Bildung, or self-realization and wisdom acquired through “culture” or the sciences, arts, and philosophy (Wood 1998; P. Watson 2010; Bakhurst 2011; Stojanov 2018a, 2018c). Both of these literatures accept the multiplicity of goods, purposes, or aims that might be achieved through education, much as Aristotle did in holding that the multi-faceted purpose of education is to equip the members of a society to live as partners in a flourishing life—a purpose served by cultivating intellectual virtues that are enacted in a flourishing life, virtues sufficient for collective wisdom in civic partnership in living well, and dispositions and bonds of civic friendship (Curren 2023b). Martha Nussbaum distinguishes an older conception of education that is liberal (liberalis; “fitted for freedom”) from a newer one, the older being an uncritical initiation of a small elite into the cultural traditions prized by their parents and the newer being a cultivation of ability to think for oneself that prepares rich and poor alike for collective self-governance (Nussbaum 1997). The latter, Socratic, form of liberal higher education is under attack today in the few countries where it exists, and Nussbaum’s defense of it embraces a multicultural preparation for global citizenship to address the global problems we all face (Nussbaum 1997, 2010; cf. Culp 2019; Kitcher 2021).

If education is the promotion of desirable forms of learning and personal development through instructional and supervisory practices, it could have non-instrumental formative aims and also be expected to serve any number of instrumental individual (i.e., student-centered) and collective (i.e., civic, social, or economic) aims. Numerous questions arise concerning the nature, justification, prioritizing, compatibility, and harmonizing of educational aims.

2.1 Formative Aims

There are three distinguishable non-instrumental grounds on which formative aims of education have been defended. We can think of these as the inherent aim, categorical imperative, and intrinsic goods approaches. The inherent aim approach identifies a formative aim as an inherent or defining aspect of education as such. The categorical imperative approach identifies a formative aim as fulfillment of a non-instrumental, or categorical, imperative (i.e., duty) of educating. The intrinsic goods approach identifies a candidate aim (such as a virtue, epistemic good, or fulfillment of potential) as intrinsically valuable.

2.1.1 The Inherent Aim Approach

There are versions of the inherent aim approach that offer variations on Peters’ idea that it is through education that minds develop. One might argue that it is through education broadly conceived that human beings are able to function in “the space of reasons” (McDowell 1994 [1996]; Bakhurst 2011, 2020), be appropriately moved by reasons (Siegel 1988, 2003, forthcoming), or believe and act in light of reasons. One might argue that it is through education that human beings become self-conscious persons able to know what they think and are doing (Rödl 2020; Bakhurst 2023). Or one might argue that it is through education that human beings develop capabilities essential to having minds of their own and living with dignity (Nussbaum 2004, 2011). These arguments provide plausible grounds for regarding education as having an inherently humanizing character or aim. However, it is hard to say how much education could be justified on these grounds, if the ability to function as a rational being, know what one is doing, and have a mind of one’s own is incremental. One could defend the related claim that being educated inherently involves the acquisition of knowledge (Hirst & Peters 1970: 19; Siegel 2008; Sockett 2012), but identifying knowledge as an inherent aim of education would not resolve this “how much” question either.

The growth of culture—of languages, arts, and sciences—augments the space of reasons or domains of knowledge into which initiation, and with respect to which epistemic agency, are possible. In expanding the kinds of ideas we can have and act on, it also broadens the scope of epistemic responsibility we must shoulder in navigating complex conceptual, social, and built environments, while deepening our epistemic and practical dependence on experts in specialized branches of knowledge that we will never have time to master. The relationships between epistemic autonomy, epistemic responsibility, and epistemic dependence are thus important to clarifying epistemic ideals that have been regarded as inherent aims of education (Robertson forthcoming).

Philosophical conceptions of epistemic and practical autonomy and responsibility have been bound up historically with closely linked conceptions of reason and judgment. As Aristotle was founding a handful of sciences modeled on geometry, he championed a general education that would enable a person to judge what is and is not properly expounded in nearly all subjects but would fall short of conferring scientific knowledge of all subjects (Parts of Animals 639a1–6; Reeve 1998: 58). As Aristotelian sciences were being discarded in the seventeenth century, René Descartes held similarly that universal wisdom is the proper aim of education, but he defended natural reason as a common possession of human beings, guide for the conduct of life, and the very form of reasoning essential to science (see his Rules for the Direction of the Mind, Discourse on Method, parts I and II, The Search for Truth by Means of Natural Light, and Dedicatory Letter to the Principles of Philosophy). Descartes and John Locke both presented the use of natural reason in examining the basis of ideas as a natural standard of epistemic diligence in taking responsibility for the beliefs on which one acts and making them one’s own, or in other words as sufficient for both epistemic and practical autonomy and responsibility (Locke 1706: § 12). If autonomy is having and exercising a capacity to take responsibility for what one thinks, values, and does, natural reason was considered not only such a capacity but a way to know what is true, good, and prudent. These early modern views are widely seen as going astray by radically underestimating the extent of our epistemic dependence on the collective epistemic labor of others. No one could possibly have the time or intellectual capacity to adequately judge for themselves everything pertaining to their daily affairs or to know all they may wish to know. Attaining epistemic autonomy through an Aristotelian education in the sciences has meanwhile been pushed ever farther out of reach by the proliferation of sciences and their roles in shaping the complex world we navigate.

A common contemporary response to the realities of epistemic dependence has been to argue that epistemic autonomy is compatible with extensive epistemic dependence (Adler 2002; Elgin 2002, 2013, 2022; Siegel 2005; Bakhurst 2014; D. Pritchard 2016b; Fricker 2022). Accounts of what is sufficient for epistemic autonomy or agency include good intellectual character (D. Pritchard 2023: 128), or a combination of epistemic virtue and taking responsibility for one’s beliefs in a way that involves fidelity to an epistemic counterpart of Kant’s categorical imperative (Elgin 2013). Fidelity to this “epistemic imperative” would involve believing only what one could accept on the basis of reasons that can be justified to other members of an epistemic community. A second response has been to abandon epistemic self-reliance as an educational aim (Hand 2006), and a third has been to shift the focus from autonomy to responsibility (Robertson forthcoming), understanding epistemic responsibility as exertion of “controlling intelligence” (Coady 1992: 248) that displays the motivation and skills characteristic of intellectual virtue. Taking epistemic responsibility in this sense would involve some thinking for oneself that is intelligent in the sense of being well informed and thoughtful about the trustworthiness of epistemic methods, sources, reasoning, and evidence. It would involve epistemic agency or setting and adhering to self-imposed rules for determining the basis on which one can endorse beliefs as one’s own. If autonomy is in this way a product of taking responsibility, then epistemic agency or responsibility might be seen as the primary educational end.

2.1.2 The Categorical Imperative Approach

The categorical imperative approach to identifying a formative aim as non-instrumental invokes a duty to respect students as rational agents. Functioning as a rational being, knowing what one is doing, and having a mind of one’s own all pertain to agency, and as much to practical rationality as to epistemic rationality. Recognizing this, one might discern a non-instrumental basis for identifying the promotion of autonomous rational agency (both practical and epistemic) as a fundamental aim of education, the argument being that educators’ duty of respect for students as rational beings entails an obligation to cultivate their rationality or ability to be appropriately moved by reasons. An epistemic variant of this argument has focused on students’ development as critical thinkers (Scheffler 1973; Siegel 1988; 1997: 24–25, 73–87; 2016: 108–109), and a practical variant of it has focused on competent self-determination (Locke 1690: § 69).

If there is a threshold of adequacy in such non-instrumentally justified formative education, it might be conceptualized as the educational prerequisites for competent self-determination, assigning primacy to practical rationality and a supporting role to epistemic rationality. What bodies of knowledge or understanding would be essential to reaching this threshold is unclear. From a curricular standpoint, the question is whether fulfilling the fundamental formative aim of rational empowerment, or competent self-determination, requires the kind of initiation into forms of knowledge that Peters envisioned. How much ability to understand the world in the manner of a biologist, historian, anthropologist, geographer, economist, psychologist, epidemiologist, or climatologist can be defended as foundational to competent self-determination or being competent to manage one’s affairs in an immensely complex world? How much understanding of these and other fields would be enough to facilitate epistemic responsibility in determining what sources to trust for guidance on relevant features of the contexts in which one must make decisions?

2.1.3 The Intrinsic Goods Approach

The intrinsic goods approach is evident in recent work in philosophy of education stimulated by the virtue epistemology and virtue ethics movements and related developments in intellectual and moral character education. It identifies intellectual virtues, moral virtues, epistemic goods, and fulfillments of potential that partially or fully constitute human flourishing as intrinsically good, and it defends these as aims of education on the grounds that they are intrinsically valuable.

Intellectual virtue theorists distinguish virtue reliabilism from virtue responsibilism. Virtue reliabilism regards intellectual virtues as valuable because they are reliable sources of truth (e.g., Sosa 1991), which is to say instrumentally valuable. Virtue responsibilism conceives of intellectual virtues as analogous to moral virtues, and similar to them in having intrinsic value and involving love or valuing of epistemic goods, such as truth, knowledge, understanding, and wisdom (Zagzebski 1996; Roberts & Wood 2007; Baehr 2011). Responsibilist intellectual virtue theorists who regard intellectual virtues and goods as intrinsically valuable can, and sometimes do, identify virtuous intellectual character, specific intellectual virtues (such as open-mindedness, intellectual courage, and inquisitiveness), and epistemic goods (such as truth, knowledge, understanding, and wisdom) as intrinsic goods that should be pursued as non-instrumental aims of education.

In practice, there has been considerable debate about the relative merits of knowledge (Hirst 1965; Goldman 1999; Adler 2003; Bakhurst 2023), understanding (Elgin 1999, 2007, 2023; D. Pritchard 2013, 2016a), critical thinking (Ennis 1962; Scheffler 1973; McPeck 1981; Lipman 2003; Siegel 1988, 1997, 2003, 2017), and intellectual virtue (Baehr 2011, 2016, 2021; Battaly 2006, 2016, 2023; D. Pritchard 2013, 2023) as the primary aim (or primary epistemic aim) of education (Bakhurst 2023; Robertson 2009b; L. Watson 2016). These may all be seen as intrinsic goods and as deeply interrelated educational aims, but also as aims that can pull apart and be justified in a variety of ways. Knowledge may be foundational to understanding (Bakhurst 2023) but not confer understanding (Zagzebski 2001; Kvanvig 2003; Elgin 2007, 2023). Understanding may be possible without knowledge (Elgin 1999, 2017), and students may be able to acquire understanding in some domains of knowledge many years before they could understand the complexities of evidence in those domains well enough to have knowledge (Elgin 1999). Knowledge may also be foundational to thinking critically about the matters addressed in a domain of knowledge (Peters 1965; McPeck 1981; Siegel 1988), but knowledge without intellectual virtues (D. Pritchard 2023) or broader skills of critical thinking and a “critical spirit” (Siegel 1988, 1997) would not suffice for epistemic rational agency.

Moral virtue theorists take a similar path to a non-instrumental justification of good moral character as an important aim of education. From a broadly Aristotelian perspective, genuine moral virtues and a comprehensively morally virtuous state of character are intrinsically good attributes—complex cognitive, perceptual, motivational, emotional, and behavioral dispositions that involve proper valuing of persons and are coordinated by practical wisdom (Sherman 1989; Carr & Steutel 1999; Moss 2011; Kristjánsson 2015). From this perspective, morally good character is hard to tease apart from intellectually and civically good character, and the nature of practical wisdom and relationships between moral, intellectual, and civic virtues play important roles in clarifying the educational aims at stake.

The nature of practical wisdom has been an object of disagreement reflecting different readings of Aristotle’s pronouncements about phronêsis in Nicomachean Ethics (NE) Book VI, and ethics as a science (epistêmê) or foundational component of political science (hê politikê epistêmê) in NE Book I. Some readings have accepted the idea, promoted by the virtue ethics movement, that Aristotle sees no role for knowledge of universal moral truths in virtuous decision-making (Nussbaum 1986; Dunne & Pendlebury 2003), while other readings deny this (Jaeger 1957; Lloyd 1968; Westphal 2012; D. Henry & Nielsen 2015; Curren & Park 2024). Aristotle describes phronêsis as “concerned not only with universals but with particulars, which become familiar from experience” (NE VI.8 1142a13–15), implying roles for both perception and universal moral truths in wise decision-making. If moral virtue is an important aim of education, and practical wisdom is an essential aspect of genuine moral virtue, then moral knowledge and moral perceptiveness (i.e., discernment of morally relevant “particulars” or aspects of situations) would be sub-aims. This is consistent with Aristotle’s presentation of the Nicomachean Ethics itself as a path from facts (to hoti) that are starting points of ethical inquiry to ethical epistêmê or science.

A further notable example of the intrinsic goods approach arises from the neo-Aristotelian claim that possession of virtues is partially constitutive of human flourishing. Regarding virtues and flourishing as intrinsic goods provides the basis for non-instrumental justifications of not only intellectual character education (D. Pritchard 2023: 130) and moral character education (Kristjánsson 2015: 8), but also well-being education (Morris 2015). It brings us back to Peters’ conception of education as initiation into worthwhile pursuits that make for a worthwhile life. Initiation into activities of a flourishing life might qualify as an inherent aim of education on Peters’ conception of education, but identifying flourishing as an intrinsic good defends it not as a defining or inherent aim of education but as an ethically appropriate one.

A notable feature of non-instrumentally justified formative education is that it seems to escape the dilemma, aptly framed by Jean-Jacques Rousseau (1762 [1979: 37–42]), of how it can be equally for the individual student and for the society. By contrast, instrumental justifications of educational aims may appeal to the good of the student, the good of the society, or both. The prospect of tensions between what is good for the individual student and what is good for the society has long been an animating theme in philosophy of education.

2.2 Student-Centered Aims

Several student-centered educational aims have been addressed in recent years. Classifying them as “student-centered” identifies them as pertaining to the individual well-being of students. The term “well-being” signifies that a life is going well for the person living it (Parfit 1984; Raz 2004; Tiberius 2008), and since there are several aspects to how a life goes, there are bound to be a variety of possible aims of education for which student-centered justifications can be offered.

In this vein, Harry Brighouse, Helen Ladd, Susanna Loeb, and Adam Swift identify

six capacities that everyone should have in modern societies and which … will tend to support the flourishing of both the educated person and others: the capacities for economic productivity, personal autonomy, democratic competence, healthy personal relationships, treating others as equals, and personal fulfillment. (Brighouse, Ladd, et al. 2018: 22)

The significance of most of these capacities for the student’s own well-being is easy to discern. Autonomy is understood as individuals’

ability to make and act on well-informed and well-thought-out judgments about both how to live and what to do in their everyday lives. (2018: 23)

Democratic competence equips students to protect their interests through democratic processes (cf., Levinson 2012; Allen & Kidd 2023). Capacity for personal fulfillment equips individuals with interests and competence that enable them “to find joy and fulfillment” in life experiences and activities (Brighouse, Ladd et al. 2018: 27). Brighouse, Ladd, Loeb, and Swift refer to these capacities as conducive to “the flourishing of both the educated person and others” (2018: 22). Other defenses of flourishing as an overarching aim of education are similarly sensitive to the relationship between individual and collective well-being. The relationship is perhaps most widely perceived with respect to capacities for economic productivity and mutual benefit in market transactions, but the identification of flourishing as an overarching aim of education requires a reconciliation of the individual’s and others’ opportunities to live well that is as broad as the education in question. This can show up in how the educational aim is defined (e.g., as equipping the members of a society to live as partners in a flourishing life), in how flourishing itself is defined (e.g., as a life of activity that is both admirable and personally fulfilling), and in reliance on empirical claims about prerequisites of human well-being (e.g., that enactment of social virtues is a necessary condition for happiness).

Brighouse, Ladd, et al. write that educators aim to instill knowledge, skills, dispositions, and attitudes (2018: 19), implicitly identifying these formative “educational goods” as inherent aims of education, while holding that “what matters, ultimately, is the creation and distribution of opportunities for people to flourish” (2018: 21). It is appropriate to focus on opportunities for flourishing, they say, “because the most that educational goods can do is equip people with what they need for their lives to go well” (2018: 21). In saying this, they use the term “flourishing” to refer—as the term “well-being” does—to a life going well, all things considered, in both its objective and subjective dimensions. This is typical of recent defenses of flourishing as an overarching aim of education, in assuming that there is an open-ended variety of ways in which people can live well and that the task of educators is to promote learning that facilitates students’ pursuit of lives that are personally meaningful and satisfying for them while also contributing to others being able to live well (Brighouse 2006, 2008; Curren 2013; de Ruyter 2004, 2007, 2015; de Ruyter & Wolbert 2020; de Ruyter, Oades, et al. 2022; Kristjánsson 2020; Schouten 2023; White 1995b, 2011). Flourishing is typically understood to involve fulfillment of potential that exhibits admirable qualities and is personally meaningful, satisfying, and enjoyable (Darwall 1999; de Ruyter, Oades, et al. 2022; Kraut 2007). Helping students fulfill their potential in such ways is a common aspiration of teachers, and the simplest justification for regarding flourishing as an overarching aim of education is that having this aim in view is indistinguishable from educating students with a view to their well-being or life-long interest in living well. Curren, Boniwell et al. (2024) have argued that shaping students’ development without this in view is unethical.

Critics argue that the open-endedness of ways in which it is possible to live well implies that aiming to equip students for flourishing lives is either devoid of actionable content (Carr 2021) or illegitimately favors a predetermined conception of living well (Siegel 2015, forthcoming). Another objection is that only things that are teachable can be aims of education, flourishing is not teachable, so flourishing is not the kind of thing that can be an aim of education (Hand forthcoming). A response to this is that educating with a view to students being able to live better lives than they could otherwise live is still educating—it is still promoting desirable forms of learning and personal development through familiar kinds of educational practices. The fundamental distinguishing feature of education for flourishing is its conception of what makes forms of learning and personal development desirable.

Alternative conceptualizations of educational goods and capacities favorable to living well have been proposed, such as Nussbaum and Amartya Sen’s Capability Approach (Nussbaum 2004, 2011; Unterhalter 2003, 2016; Walker & Unterhalter 2007; Hart & Brando 2018; Terzi et al. 2023), and debates have played out regarding student-centered defenses of specific educational aims, such as autonomy and labor market success. Student-centered defenses of education for autonomy have rested on affirmations of children’s rights, the instrumental value of autonomy in enabling individuals to choose lives that can be good ones for them, and its constitutive role in living well (J. Feinberg 1980). By contrast, John Rawls (1993: 199) and others have argued that state mandated autonomy education is inconsistent with civic respect for members of religious sects that perceive autonomy as alien to their ways of life. One response to this concern has been to argue that autonomy must be acknowledged as a political good and “providing citizens the means and freedoms to exercise it” is a requirement of justice even in Rawls’s “political” form of liberalism (Levinson 1999: 22). Another response concedes that mandating education in robust autonomy (i.e., engagement in independent reflection and judgment) would not be legitimate from this political liberal standpoint, but argues that educational facilitation of autonomy (Brighouse 2000) or education in a minimal form of autonomy (Reich 2002) would legitimately secure children’s instrumental interest in being able to critically evaluate their prospects of having a good life if they accept the conception of a good life with which they have grown up. A more recent response defends universal education in robust autonomy by arguing that it is a precondition for all citizens being able to obtain the fair value of access to the goods that liberal principles of justice distribute in the interest of fairness in the opportunities diverse citizens have to live lives that are good for them (Schouten 2018: 1091).

While no one disputes the claim that a capacity for economic productivity is helpful to living well, there has been much debate regarding specific forms that the aim of labor market success has taken. Regarding secondary schools, the goal of “college for all” has inspired debate, in part because the functional aim is often to maximize college admission at any cost. Neglect of civic education, student well-being, and viable alternatives to college have been identified as important costs to consider (Ben-Porath 2013; Lamboy & Lu 2017). A related debate is underway regarding a recent emphasis on colleges and universities having a special role to play in providing individuals with socio-economic mobility. Here too, there are costs of upward mobility to students who seek it and to their home communities, especially for college students who experience cultural alienation and tensions between their support roles within their families and pursuing their individual success (Voigt 2017; Laden 2022, 2023, 2024; Morton 2019, 2021b, 2023; Curren 2023c). There are also civic costs entailed by institutions pitting people against each other in high-stakes competitions (Hussain 2020) mediated by academic credentials (Sandel 2020, 2022; Brighouse 2022). It is also arguably costly to universities themselves to be deflected from the educational goods of “knowledge, personal transformation, and value acquisition” that are “inherent to [their] mission” (Morton 2023: 289; cf. Martin 2022; Higgins 2024).

2.3 Social, Civic, and Economic Aims

Schools have been expected to play a variety of civic, social, and economic aims, from nation building (i.e., civic unification predicated on a common national identity) and promoting national security, to eliminating poverty, disease, and crime, to facilitating economic growth and competitiveness. The dominance of economic aims in global educational policy in recent decades has been a focus of critique, as much for what it has eclipsed as for its false promises and damaging consequences. Debates about the compatibility of these economic aims with other educational aims, the soundness of their rationales, and the damaging consequences of their modes of pursuit are substantially empirical. A founding supposition of the educational pursuit of economic growth and competitiveness has been that high rates of economic growth can be sustained for all countries through high levels of achievement in STEM (Science, Technology, Engineering, and Math) education (Hanushek & Woessmann 2010), but there is evidence suggesting it is impossible to sustain high economic growth in developed countries with populations that are already highly educated (Tamir 2023). The use of high-stakes and international comparative exams in Reading, Math, and Science in an attempt to compel higher achievement in the interest of economic aims has been criticized as very costly in its consequences for quality of instruction and learning, student well-being, teacher demoralization, and (consequently) teacher shortages (Deci 2009; Ryan & Brown 2005; Pelletier & Sharp 2009; Santoro 2018; Tamir 2023). While some of the tension between the aim of sustaining economic growth and other educational aims might be seen as avoidable, a case has been made for regarding the former as fundamentally at odds with the existentially important aim of preparing students to engage in global civic cooperation to address climate destabilization, future pandemics, and other problems that require globally coordinated responses (Kitcher 2021, 2023).

Turning from economic growth and national competitiveness to the role of knowledge and expertise in public policy and the professions, some related themes in philosophy of education are the nature and acquisition of expertise and the role of educational institutions in the production and dissemination of public knowledge (i.e., knowledge that is publicly enabled and intended to serve the public interest). Societies cannot meaningfully address the problems they face without investing in the creation and dissemination of public knowledge and the cultivation and certification of related forms of expertise. The benefits of the resulting epistemic division of labor can be widely shared if the society is democratic, if certification of expertise is based on the possession of expertise and related professional integrity, and if members of the public are able to discern who the relevant experts are and trust them appropriately (Kitcher 2011a, b). Educational institutions play key roles in systems of public knowledge, and the trust vested in them is foundational to the enterprise (Laden 2024). Civic polarization, the politicization of knowledge, and declining trust in universities and other institutions of public knowledge has rekindled philosophers’ interest in the aims of science education: If widespread support for science-based policy is important to the common good, should the aim of basic science education for all students be a kind of scientific literacy that enables them to identify trustworthy scientific experts or institutions? Would such literacy involve having scientific knowledge, having historical and philosophical knowledge of how science works (M. Matthews 2000, 2015), being able to distinguish trustworthy from untrustworthy sources of scientific claims, or something else? Anjan Chakravartty has argued that basic science literacy should focus on the astonishing instrumental success of science as a basis for public acceptance of science-based policy (Chakravartty 2023). By contrast, Matt Ferkany points to evidence that knowledge of the basic mechanism of anthropogenic global warming makes a difference to climate policy stances across the polarized political spectrum, concluding that it is too early to abandon the aim of teaching for basic knowledge of science (Ferkany 2023: 359, 362).

Somewhat related to this debate about public acceptance of scientific expertise as a basis of public policy are long-running debates about the nature of expertise as an aim of education, especially professional education, and the general problem of how consumers of expertise can discern the possession of expertise that they themselves lack. There are cognitive accounts of the nature of expertise that identify its key aspect as knowledge, intellectual insight, or understanding of how things within some domain work (Fricker 2006; Goldman 2018; J. Watson 2021). There are skill-based accounts that regard expertise as a kind of embodied practical mastery that can be fluid and intuitive in its operation (Dreyfus & Dreyfus 1986). There are also hybrid accounts that combine knowledge and skill in one package (Addis & Winch 2019; Winch 2010a, b). The significance of these accounts for the education and recognition of expertise are debated, but it has been plausibly suggested that an important sub-aim of education in professional expertise is to promote ethical attributes and competence in communication that would enable experts to establish and retain the trust of non-experts (Quast 2018; Kotzee 2023).

There have meanwhile been long-running debates about the aims of civic education, focused on democratic deliberation, civic motivation, identity, and advancing justice. John Dewey’s conception of democratic education has had enduring influence (Dewey 1916; Riley & Welchman 2003; Kitcher 2021, 2023), and his concerns about fascism and respect for norms of public reason (what he called “social intelligence”) are as relevant today as when he wrote them (Dewey 1939). He conceived of democratic societies as engaging in mutually respectful collective inquiry and problem-solving, guided by shared respect for scientific methods and the plurality of concerns of their members (Dewey 1927). He thought it was in a democracy of this kind that human beings can “grow” or flourish, so democratic education would not simply aim to prepare students for democratic citizenship, it would accomplish this by initiating them into the kind of civic life through which they can grow or flourish both as adults and as children.

The recent era of work on the civic aims of education began with Amy Gutmann’s Democratic Education (1987), William Galston’s Liberal Purposes: Goods, Virtues, and Diversity in the Liberal State (1991), and John Rawls’s Political Liberalism (1993). It has included notable works by Eamonn Callan (1997, 2000, 2006), Stephen Macedo (1995, 2003), Rob Reich (2002), and Victoria Costa (2011), as well as volumes edited by Robert Fullinwider (1996a), Macedo and Yael Tamir (2002), and Kevin McDonough and Walter Feinberg (2003). Gutmann argued that democracies have a right to preserve themselves through education that cultivates virtues of democratic citizenship—virtues that bring together moral character and reasoning, enhancing students’ individual freedom while making them willing and able to reason together critically and respectfully about matters of public concern (Gutmann 1987, 1995, 2002, 2003). Education that enables everyone to participate “effectively” in democratic deliberation (1987: 136–137) is both an investment in the survival of democracy and a requirement of justice associated with a right to politically meaningful speech, according to Gutmann.

Norms of public reason play a similarly important role in Rawls’s Political Liberalism and Justice as Fairness: A Restatement (2001), which address political legitimacy, justice, and the norms of political discourse in multicultural democracies. To be capable of social cooperation, citizens are regarded as having two “moral powers”, a “capacity for a sense of justice” and “the capacity to have, to revise, and to rationally pursue a conception of the good”—i.e., a conception of “what is of value in human life”, normally grounded in comprehensive “religious, philosophical, or moral doctrines” (Rawls 2001: 18–19). Citizens who subscribe to different comprehensive conceptions of the good (CCGs) but are willing to accept fair terms of cooperation would have reasons to endorse constitutional principles of justice and associated premises of public reason that provide a “shared basis for citizens to justify to one another their political judgments” (2001: 27, 89–94). “Citizens must be able… to present to one another publicly acceptable reasons for their political views in cases raising fundamental political questions” (2001: 91), and they must accept what Rawls calls the burdens of judgment as conditions on “the use of public reason in directing the legitimate exercise of political power” (Rawls 1993: 54; 2001: 35–36). Publicly acceptable reasons pertaining to the factual basis of political judgments come to rest in scientific methods, evidence, and consensus, to the extent these are relevant, so the education that prepares citizens to engage in democratic deliberation must be in part an education in deference to scientific methods and expertise, so far as public matters are concerned (cf. Gutmann & Thompson 1996: 15). The burdens of judgment are factors that give rise to differences of judgment among reasonable people and acknowledging them when faced with beliefs and judgments different from one’s own is fundamental to respectful engagement with others in the enterprise of public reason.

Callan and others have argued that Rawls glosses over the extent to which this requires civic education that brings diverse children together, so they can learn to accept the burdens of judgment and respectfully engage each other in the practice of public reason (Callan 1997). Rawls’s theory of justice would thus imply that children can be required to participate in civic education, in settings that nurture respectful dialogue between students of diverse backgrounds, in the interest of securing the social basis for a legitimate scheme of democratic cooperation. A foundational aspect of such a scheme of cooperation is the civic, democratic, or relational equality entailed by Rawls’s underlying conception of free and equal citizenship. So there are evidently two closely related aims of education at stake: cultivating the understanding, capabilities, and virtues foundational to a political order regulated by public reason and enabling citizens to function as civic equals (Anderson 2007, 2010a, 2010b; Satz 2007; Curren 2023c).

Visions of deliberative democracy rest on the idea that democracy mediated by citizens giving each other reasons that reasonable people could accept is more attractive than democracy mediated by brute majority power. Critics have argued that compliance with norms of reason would constrain progress in confronting injustice masked by a semblance of good faith reasoning. When opponents willfully violate the cooperative norms of democratic deliberation and do so in pursuit of ends that could not be publicly justified, reasoning may offer no remedy. A response to this criticism has been to hold that students must be prepared for both ideal contexts, in which compliance with fair terms of cooperation (hence norms of public reason) is universal, and non-ideal civic contexts, in which such compliance is not universal (Robertson 2000, 2009a). Students must learn how progress toward more perfect justice has been achieved in non-ideal circumstances, how they themselves can contribute to such justice, and how to enact mutually respectful civic relations whenever possible. In conditions of racial domination (Blum 1996, 2012, 2024; Thompson 2023; Wheeler-Bell 2023) and domination of less powerful peoples and states in international relations (Gutmann 2002), civic and moral education would thus rightly enlighten students about the conditions in which they live and how progress is possible, while promoting informed critical reflection about what is just and ethical.

Equipping and disposing students to promote justice is thus a further and distinct civic aim of education that is defended by philosophers of education (Bialystok 2023). Variations on this theme include promotion of global justice (Culp 2019; Curren & Dorn 2018; Kitcher 2021) and sustainability-related intergenerational justice (Bell 2004; Curren & Metzger 2017; Zwarthoed 2015). While education for sustainable development has been promoted as conducive to both global and intergenerational justice, it has also been criticized as failing to respect liberty rights and other democratic values (Ferkany & Whyte 2013; Schinkel 2009; Schlottmann 2008). Another noteworthy focus has been the contributions of universities to the unjust advantage of the most advantaged and what professors can legitimately do to educate students in a way that mitigates unjust advantage (Brighouse 2010; Morton 2021a; Schouten 2022).

Civic aims of education concern not only students’ civic understanding and capabilities (such as to function as civic equals and participate in processes of public reason) but also attitudes, dispositions, virtues, and sources of motivation that can sustain constructive civic engagement. Ideas about such motivation have focused on patriotism, identity, and civic friendship (or solidarity; Kitcher 2021, 2023). A common starting point has been the assumption that ideals of justice and democracy are either too abstract or “thin” to motivate civic responsibility, or that enabling students to develop a rational appreciation of the merits of these ideals will, for some other reason, rarely succeed in motivating them to act in defense of those ideals (Galston 1991: 243–244). Instilling a motivating commitment to these ideals is then taken to require something “thicker”, such as providing inspirational tales of mythologized national heroes or cultivating a shared national identity. Discussions of civic motivation as an aim of education have consequently revolved around the propriety of teaching patriotism (Archard 1999; Ben-Porath 2006; Blum 2007; Brighouse 2003; Callan 1997, 2006; Fullinwider 1996b; Gutmann 2002; Hand 2011; R. Miller 2007; Nussbaum 2012) and to a lesser extent civic friendship (e.g., Allen 2004) and the “thick” social (e.g., racial) identities that citizens bring to their civic roles (Allen & Kidd 2023). Galston and Callan have defended mythologizing education in non-nationalistic forms of patriotism as facilitating commitment to norms of justice, while Sigal Ben-Porath has made a similar argument for the usefulness of patriotic education in enabling societies to endure the hardships of war. Critics have countered that publicly sponsored cultivation of sentiments of loyalty and partiality toward compatriots undermines the legitimacy of governments (Brighouse 1998, 2003; cf. Callan 2000), is inconsistent with equal basic moral respect for non-compatriots and requirements of global justice (Gutmann 2002; R. Miller 2007) and ignores a variety of other ways in which actual patriotism “all too often cuts against justice” (Brighouse 2003: 163). Habermas’s conception of constitutional patriotism, involving ongoing scrutiny of a country’s constitutional tradition in light of universal norms (Habermas 1992) has inspired forms of “best traditions patriotism” (Blum 2007), and been incorporated into a conception of virtuous patriotism as ethically appropriate valuing of a country’s inhabitants and what is conducive to them living well together (Curren 2021, Curren & Dorn 2018). These latter views deny the common assumption that abstract civic and moral ideals are too “thin” to be motivationally potent and in doing so undercut the premise that just societies require education that aims to cultivate patriotic sentiments. They may, however, attach motivational significance to educating diverse children together as equals, so they can form intergroup friendships that facilitate broader intergroup trust and cooperation.

Philosophical justifications of educational aims have obvious significance for the content, manner, and methods of education, and it is to these matters that we now turn. Questions of educational authority and educational responsibilities will follow, and these too are relevant to curriculum, teaching, educational administration, and a host of related matters.

3. The Content of Education

The content of education has long been understood broadly to include not only curricula (i.e., series of courses or subjects taught) that are expressly presented to students as what they will study and learn, but also what is communicated by aspects of institutional structure and norms, and by qualities of educational settings, materials, and practices. Plato wrote that we should be concerned not only that children learn stories that accurately depict the relationship between virtue and happiness, but that they “live in a healthy place” where buildings, pictures, and other works

are like a breeze that brings health from a good place, leading them unwittingly, from childhood on, to resemblance, friendship, and harmony with the beauty of reason—[this is] the best education for them. (Republic 401b–d)

In saying this, Plato regarded habituation as a mode of education and identified true beliefs about what is good and reasonable as important educational content. Today, such content might be referred to as “hidden curriculum” and elective learning opportunities in addition to courses or subjects taught might qualify as “extracurricular”. For present purposes we can limit “curriculum” to courses or subjects taught and recognize that there is more to the content of education than curriculum.

Philosophers have sometimes formulated, examined, or critiqued guiding principles for the design of curricula (Plato Laws, Republic; Locke 1706; Rousseau 1762; Dewey 1902; Scheffler 1958; Lewin 2018) or attempts to construct theories of the curriculum (Phillips 1998), but in recent years they have usually addressed the content of education in discussing aims of education, the respective merits of a common curriculum versus differentiated curricula, moral and character education, and other controversial topics, subject matter, or aspects of education.

3.1 Curriculum, Aims, and Ability

Regarding aims, some of those discussed above imply sweeping, if not comprehensive, approaches to educational content. If autonomy is an important aim of education and being autonomous is being able to form and act on one’s own well-informed judgments about how to live one’s life, then the content of education should include an array of subjects that enable students to understand aspects of the world that will matter to the kinds of decisions they will need to make. It should also expose them to diverse values and life goal orientations, and it should enable them to think critically and make good decisions. Meaningful encounters with diverse goods, conceptions of the good, and kinds of lives will be greatly enhanced if they are not merely curricular but include learning from diverse school peers and a school ethos that offers alternatives to the profit-seeking popular culture that dominates students’ attention (Brighouse 2005).

If equipping students to live well or flourish is the primary aim of education, then education for autonomy might be combined with opportunities to discover and develop competence in interests and pursuits that can contribute to a flourishing life. The content of education might in that case be determined less by a broadly autonomy enhancing grounding in disciplinary knowledge and understanding, and more by diverse opportunities to engage in activities of learning that can enable students to experience the inherent rewards of fulfilling their social, creative, and agentive potential in pursuit of things they care about (Noddings 1992). Knowledge, understanding, and intellectual virtue outcomes might be just as robust as what a disciplines-first approach would yield, but more tailored to students’ self-determined paths, while the development of competence in decision-making or practical wisdom might be stronger.

If education in democratic citizenship is prioritized, education for autonomy might be supplemented with more opportunities to learn what it is possible to learn from diverse fellow students through debate, collaborative problem-focused learning, and opportunities to form civically significant inter-group friendships. In a world of problems that can only be effectively addressed through global cooperation, education in democratic citizenship might also engage students in globally networked collaborative learning that is focused on global problems (Culp 2019; Curren & Dorn 2018; Kitcher 2021, 2023).

More specific educational aims could have more and less widely significant implications for school curricula. Meaningful sustainability education would require far-reaching changes in existing curricula, whether the aim is to facilitate a transition to a sustainable human footprint or simply to enable students to understand the complexly interacting human, built, and natural systems that shape everyday decisions and their collective impact. Achieving various aims of science education (M. Matthews 2000, 2015) or education in the arts (D’Olimpio 2022a, b, 2024; D’Olimpio, Pais, & Thompson 2022; Elgin 2009; Greene 2001; Nussbaum 1990, 2010) would involve significant but narrower ranges of school subjects. By contrast, the aim of promoting sexual self-determination and health through sex education would have limited curricular implications.

Philosophical work on the respective merits of a common curriculum versus differentiated curricula has been shaped by the aims at stake, ideas about differences in student ability and interests, and the importance attached to accommodating parents’ concerns that school content be consistent with their worldviews and values. In defense of democratic education, Dewey objected to tracking secondary students from privileged backgrounds into a liberal arts curriculum and others into a vocational curriculum, proposing a kind of hybrid of these for all students (Dewey 1916). Nussbaum has recently advanced something similar in her role as an architect of the curriculum of the Asian University for Women, which aims to educate women leaders for Asia and the Middle East, by integrating a liberal arts education with professional training and encouraging students to apply the analytical tools they acquire to regional problems (Nussbaum 2004). Contemporary work on ability grouping in secondary schools has meanwhile debated the ethical, conceptual, and empirical merits of predicating differentiated curricula on debatable conceptions of ability (Giesinger 2017; Harel Ben Shahar 2023; Mazie 2009; Merry 2008; K. Meyer 2014b; Schouten 2012; Thompson 2021).

3.2 Moral and Character Education

Moral and character education have been the subject of extensive philosophical and cross-disciplinary research in recent years. The distinction between moral education and character education may be clearest in the tension between theories of moral development inspired by Kant and conceptions of character formation inspired by Aristotle. The former focus on the principles that enter into moral judgments, ignoring Kant’s theory of virtue (Munzel 1999, 2012), while the latter focus on virtues, ignoring the role of universals in Aristotelian practical wisdom. The resulting polarization is to some extent an artifact of the perceived legitimacy that virtue-focused education has derived from the virtue ethics movement’s ambition to provide an alternative to deontological and consequentialist orientations in normative ethical theory. Taking this at face value, one would expect moral education to revolve around making decisions on the basis of moral principles and character education to be focused on the formation of virtue through habituation and emulation of exemplars (Croce & Vaccarezza 2017; Kristjánsson 2015, 2017; Zagzebski 2013). They do, to some extent, but the contrast is less simple than it appears.

One complicating factor is that the Kant-inspired theories of moral development, propounded by the psychologist Lawrence Kohlberg and his students, concern moral cognition and offer no account of moral motivation. Attempts to fill this motivational gap have turned to something like Aristotelian habituation through immersion in a just school community (Power 1988; Power & Higgins-D’Alesandro 2008) and the idea that if people form identity-defining moral commitments they will be motivated to act in ways that are consistent with their “moral identity” or conception of themselves as having specific moral commitments (Lapsley & Stey 2014). A school’s collective commitment to functioning in accordance with just principles would be an explicit aspect of the content of education, and predicating membership in the school community on sharing that commitment would promote students’ identification of those just principles as their own. This would shrink the distance between moral and character education, especially if character educators acknowledged that there are unavoidably rule-like elements in habituation and civic virtue.

As a theory of moral motivation, the “moral identity” construct arguably fails, however. Being motivated to preserve a morally positive self-understanding can undermine, as well as promote, moral conduct (Krettenauer 2022), and from a philosophical perspective it is too ego-involved to constitute genuinely moral motivation. An alternative view is that genuinely moral motivation involves responsiveness to both the value of what is at stake and considerations bearing on what is morally appropriate in the circumstances (S. Meyer 2016), and that educators can foster such motivation by modelling appropriate valuing and moral reasoning in ways that support students’ basic psychological needs for not only relatedness, as in early versions of the just school community model, but also autonomy and competence (Curren & Ryan 2020). A somewhat related strand of recent philosophy of education concerns the possibility of valuational progress or individuals coming to hold new values in a way that is agentive or autonomous (Annas 2011; Callard 2017, 2018).

A second complicating factor that shrinks the distance between moral and character education is the role of practical wisdom, and thereby moral universals, in an Aristotelian conception of virtue. Key questions are how such wisdom can be fostered, and how reasoning that is an outgrowth of habituation can be autonomous (Peters 1981; Sherman 1989; Annas 2011; Curren & Park 2024; cf. Copp 2016; Hand 2018, on moral indoctrination). “Intellectualist” forms of neo-Aristotelian character education originating in the work of Nancy Sherman (1989) have significant implications for the content of character education because they regard habituation that nurtures the development of genuine virtue as necessarily supervised in ways that are cognitively rich and autonomy supportive (Ferkany & Creed 2014).

Other philosophical orientations in the sphere of moral and character education include neo-Humean sentimentalist approaches (Noddings 2002; Slote 2010), and Philosophy for Children and Community of Inquiry approaches that were first introduced by Matthew Lipman (2003), Gareth Matthews (1980, 1984, 2009), and Michael Pritchard (1985, 1996).

Critics of moral character education have made a variety of arguments bearing on its compatibility with justice-promoting civic education (Boyd 2011; Suissa 2015; Sanderse 2019). When education in character virtue is presented as instrumentally helpful to addressing such problems as inequality, lack of social mobility, and unemployment (Paterson et al. 2014), critics have insisted that moral character education is at best a distraction from, and at worst incompatible with, civic education that prepares young people to fight for justice-enhancing structural reform. Inculcation of specific virtues, such as civility, has also been seen as delegitimizing appropriate responses to injustice, and to that extent incompatible with education for vigorous pursuit of justice (Ward 2017). A response to this is that genuinely virtuous moral, intellectual, and civic attributes would necessarily be aspects of a harmoniously integrated state of character. Alleged moral or civic virtues that cannot be fully integrated would not qualify as genuine virtues. So, civility would qualify as a virtue only if it is understood in such a way as to be compatible with appropriately vigorous (i.e., virtuous) response to injustice (Peterson 2019: 25–32).

3.3 Controversial Subjects

Philosophical work on controversial subject matter in education includes multicultural education (W. Feinberg 1998; Fullinwider 1996a; Levinson 2009; Reich 2002; Tamir 1995, 2003), race (Blum 1996, 2012, 2024; Mills 2007; Thompson 2018, 2023; Wheeler-Bell 2019a, b, 2023), sex (Archard 1998, 2000, 2003; Bialystok & Andersen 2022; Hand 2007; C. Mayo 2021; McAvoy 2013), religion (Clayton 2006, 2012, 2015; Clayton et al. 2021; Hand 2003, 2014; Justice & Macleod 2016; Macleod 2003; Swift 2020; Tillson 2019), evolutionary science (Laats & Siegel 2016; Midgley 2007; Pennock 2002), and climate and sustainability (Curren & Metzger 2017: 153–179; Ferkany 2015, 2023; Ferkany & Whyte 2013; Schinkel 2009; Schlottmann 2008, 2012; Zwarthoed 2015). What is and is not properly regarded as controversial in a way that makes teaching it “directively” or as something true is itself a matter of philosophical controversy (Drerup 2023; Hand 2008, 2014; Hess & McAvoy 2015; Tillson 2017; Zimmerman & Robertson 2017).

There are a variety of reasons for thinking that only well-established truths should be taught directively or as true. Assumptions and commitments that are foundational to rational inquiry, a constitutional rule of law, and rights-respecting democracy should similarly be presented as such. Educators should thus exhibit intellectual honesty and diligence in teaching students what they need to know and should take care not to mislead them, yet it is also widely thought that education in rational (e.g., scientific) inquiry and for democratic citizenship are facilitated by engaging students in collective inquiry, debate, and deliberation that would sometimes address controversial matters. What should count as controversial for this purpose is itself controversial, and the debate has featured a number of proposed criteria (Drerup 2023; Hand 2008, 2014; Hess & McAvoy 2015; Tillson 2017; Zimmerman & Robertson 2017). From the standpoint of civic education, one might favor a criterion of political authenticity that allows students to debate controversies that have currency in political decision-making (Hess & McAvoy 2015). However, one would then need to decide whether empirical questions (e.g., about the causes and hazards of climate change) that are controversial in this political sense should be presented as controversial in schools, or whether an epistemic criterion that treats empirical claims as non-controversial if they are well-established within the most authoritative epistemic communities should be determinative (Hand 2007, 2008, 2014; Tillson 2017; Zimmerman & Robertson 2017). Consensus among climatologists would permit directive teaching of well-established climate science under an epistemic criterion, and the individual and collective interests of students and humanity would evidently require it. One could also object that there are things that should be debated that are not debated, and others that are debated but should not be debated because they are matters of fundamental rights. A recent example of the latter (in the U.S.) is same-sex marriage, and a specific concern regarding treating it as controversial in classrooms is the likelihood of dignitary harm to students with same-sex parents (Drerup 2023; J. Mayo 2016). In determining what can be taught directively and should not be presented as controversial, recognizing roles for both epistemic closure within relevant communities of experts and fundamental principles of justice would align with education in Rawlsian norms of public reason (see Drerup 2023).

Should the existence of racial injustice be taught as fact and as an aspect of promoting free and equal citizenship? Should it be debated as an open question or ignored because there is no public consensus that it should be addressed in schools? Anti-racist education qualifies as controversial (in the U.S.) under the political authenticity test, but it is typically regarded in philosophy of education as an important aspect of moral education (Blum 1996, 2012, 2024; Thompson 2018, 2023; Wheeler-Bell 2019a, b, 2023). It would challenge negative interpersonal values (e.g., racial stereotyping and antipathy), promote positive interpersonal values (e.g., positive interracial respect and appreciation), challenge negative systemic values (e.g., systemic racial injustice in the criminal justice system), and promote positive systematic values (e.g., interracial civic friendship and the achievement of free and equal citizenship) (Blum 2024). In Quentin Wheeler-Bell’s words, it would

provide students with the sociological and moral understanding essential to autonomously navigating unjust institutions and working collectively to advance democratic equality and human flourishing. (Wheeler-Bell 2023: 280)

Anti-racist education with these components would not be unacceptably controversial under a criterion for acceptable directive teaching consistent with Rawlsian norms of public reason, provided it is empirically well-grounded, affirms free and equal citizenship and related principles of justice, and fosters civic friendship, trust, and cooperation. Predicating education for racial justice on a specific controversial theory of the nature of race might put the legitimacy of the enterprise in doubt, but philosophical work on racial identity and anti-racist education has been more circumspect than popular discourse in this regard (see esp., Thompson 2018, 2023).

Education concerning anthropogenic climate change and other aspects of sustainability also qualifies as controversial (in the U.S.) under the political authenticity test, despite the overwhelming consensus of climatologists and sustainability science that human activities are destabilizing Earth’s climate and life-sustaining systems in ways that will be increasingly catastrophic. Education concerning these matters has seemed important enough to warrant a UNESCO Decade of Education for Sustainable Development (2005–2014), but there are disagreements about its content. A philosophically significant concern is whether the ethical content of climate and sustainability education is compatible with an appropriate standard of liberal neutrality (Ferkany & Whyte 2013; Schinkel 2009; Schlottmann 2008, 2012; Zwarthoed 2015). Sustainability has been perceived by many environmental ethicists as requiring a transformative moral perspective on the value of nature, and the educational promotion of such a perspective would evidently be inconsistent with liberal neutrality. An alternative view is that no such moral transformation is required; the ethical dimensions of climate and sustainability are applications of familiar principles of common morality. Climate and sustainability education are defended as foundational to legitimate global cooperation in addressing the problems and to fulfilling children’s right to know what is essential to living prudently and responsibly in the world they will face. These rationales suggest a need for integrated curricula that promote understanding of the ways planetary, economic, and social systems interact, critical thinking about well-being and life goal orientations, and education in collaborative problem solving and global citizenship (Curren & Metzger 2017: 153–179; Kitcher 2021, 2023).

4. Manner and Methods

The manner and methods of education and para-educational practices can be understood to include methods of instruction, structuring of learning environments, disciplinary practices, student evaluation, administrative practices, models of structural reform, and the justification of educational policies and practices. While historically important philosophical debates about pedagogy have waned in recent years, there has been greater interest in free speech, indoctrination, and disciplinary practices. Education ethicists have also focused on the complexity of teachers’ classroom decision-making and ethics of administrative practices. Policy-focused philosophers of education have addressed not only specific matters of education policy, such as high-stakes testing and school choice schemes, but the roles of values and evidence in justifying education policies and practices.

4.1 Instructional and Disciplinary Practices

Philosophical debates about instructional practices have revolved around competing views of inquiry, understanding, and learning. A fundamental debate concerning methods of inquiry is whether students’ mastery of these methods is essential to fulfilling the epistemic aims of education. Epistemic agency evidently requires some command of methods of inquiry, and philosophical interest in the role of these methods in education is at least as old as Plato’s attention to the limitations of Socrates’ method of questioning (elenchus) in his dialogue Meno. The elenchus is a method of refutation through which inconsistencies are exposed, and the dialogue also depicts a very different form of “Socratic method” through which a boy is led to deduce a theorem of geometry. Aristotle structured the sciences that he subsequently founded as axiomatic systems modelled on geometry, and acquiring knowledge of such a science would require a student to reason their way up from the foundational axioms and definitions through chains of theorems and back. Experiencing instances of the natural kinds that are the objects of the science would also be essential to grasping what it is about, and Aristotle’s works on biology and politics provide models of direct instruction on scientific methods (esp., schemes of classification) and findings (e.g., generalizations about the causes of stability and instability of different kinds of constitutions). The need for such direct instruction was put in question by Descartes’ identification of natural reason as the very form of reasoning essential to science, and Rousseau’s vision of learning through inquiry in Émile was predicated on this very assumption of identity between natural and scientific reason. Rousseau envisioned the eponymous boy Émile rediscovering astronomy and physics through his own observations, as if the methods of sciences were not inventions and precise measurement, mathematical models, and invented concepts played no role (M. Matthews 2000, 2015). Initiation into the established conceptual schemes, methods, and ideals of sciences and other disciplines remains today a different conception of how to promote active learning from constructivist pedagogies that take the relevant forms and norms of individual and collective thinking to be natural or intuitive (Elgin 2011; Grandy 1998; Phillips 1995; M. Matthews 1998, 2015). If one grants that learning to think critically about questions addressed by forms of disciplinary knowledge is enhanced by mastering the concepts, modes of inquiry and analysis, and standards of evidence and rigor that have been developed by these disciplines, then one may conclude that these elements of disciplines should be explained and modeled by teachers and mastered by students through supervised practice.

Critical thinking and intellectual virtues pedagogues have similarly assumed that there are teachable attributes of critical thinkers or intellectual virtues that transcend the various disciplines and are widely applicable. Competing models of critical thinking pedagogy have focused on methods of argument evaluation, dimensions and standards of thinking, and classroom communities of inquiry. Turning to intellectual character education, Heather Battaly has helpfully identified the elements of a standard approach as well as some limitations. The standard elements are

(1) formal instruction about the intellectual virtues; (2) exposure to exemplars of virtue; (3) practice in identifying actions that exemplars would perform and in identifying motivation and emotions that exemplars would have; (4) practice in performing actions that exemplars would perform and in having motivations and emotions they would have; (5) practice in recognizing situations in which the virtue in question is relevant; and (6) reflection on one’s development. (Battaly 2023: 138)

Battaly argues that this standard approach must be supplemented with ameliorative strategies to address the intellectual vices that many students may have, and that if tendencies to intellectual vices are widespread then ameliorative strategies won’t be enough. Addressing systemic causes of intellectual vices, including common features of schools (Kidd 2019), would also be essential.

Recognition of the obstacles to nurturing intellectual and civic virtues in an age of polarization has inspired related efforts to constructively address perceived threats to free speech and safety in speaking on college and university campuses (Ben-Porath 2017, 2023, 2024; Cudd 2019) and the role of trust in epistemic networks and the work of universities (Laden 2023, 2024). The significance of student speech and freedom from indoctrination have been concerns in the context of schools as well (Ben-Porath & Webster 2023; Callan 2011, 2016; Callan & Arena 2009; Warnick 2009, 2013), especially in connection with the value of debate and deliberation for civic learning (as discussed above).

Teachers’ minute-by-minute orchestration of students’ learning involves much more than teaching, of course. It may often be focused as much on students’ behavior as on academic learning, and their responses to students’ failures to meet behavioral expectations can take many forms, from educational and problem-solving interventions to restorative practices and various forms of punishment. While specific forms and aspects of surveillance (Warnick 2007), behavioral regimes (Ben-Porath 2013; Lamboy & Lu 2017), and punishment (e.g., corporal punishment and racial disparities) in schools have received some ethical scrutiny, it is only very recently that fundamental questions about the justification of punishment in schools have received sustained attention: On what grounds, with what procedural safeguards, and for what kinds of failures might specific forms of punishment of minor children in the custody of schools be dispensed, consistent with the formative purposes of schools and the limitations of decisional competence on which the need for custody is predicated (Lamboy, Taylor & Thompson 2020; Thompson & Tillson 2020, 2023)? Is a problem-solving approach that enlists students in understanding why they fail to meet expectations ethically preferable to punishment, on the grounds that it promotes self-regulation? Are restorative practices that qualify as punishment essential to upholding the norms of a just school community when offenses cause significant harm (Scribner & Warnick 2021)?

4.2 Administrative Practices and Policy Formation

Philosophical work on administrative and policy dimensions of education has been dominated by debates surrounding structural changes and reform movements in education, while also touching on an evolving variety of more specific practices. The former include school choice schemes (Ben-Porath & Johanek 2019; Blum 2023; Brighouse 2000; Schmidtz & Brighouse 2020; Crouch 2003; W. Feinberg & Lubienski 2008), the standards and accountability movement (Dwyer 2004; Tamir 2023), a small schools movement (Strike 2004), the rise of home schooling in the U.S. and other jurisdictions (Dwyer & Peters 2019; Kunzman 2009; Reich 2002), and the emergence of college-in-prison programs (Fantuzzo 2022). Work on the ethics of specific administrative practices and policies has addressed such topics as university admissions policies (Fullinwider & Lichtenberg 2004; Kotzee & Martin 2013; Levinson 2022; Warnick 2022), seniority-based rules for teacher lay-offs (Levinson & Theisen-Homer 2015), and the role of school authorities in the deportation of student families (Geron & Levinson 2018).

In addition to work on such substantive issues of educational practice and policy, philosophers have devoted significant attention to related methodological issues: How are the respective roles of values and evidence in justifying educational policies and practices best understood? Why should the model of “evidence-based” education policy be replaced with the model of “values-led and evidence-informed” policy (Brighouse, Ladd, et al. 2018; Schouten & Brighouse 2015)? Why is the promotion of randomized controlled trials as the gold standard for the empirical basis of education policy and practice misguided (Biesta 2007, 2010; Cartwright & Hardie 2012; Joyce & Cartwright 2018, 2020, 2023; Kvernbekk 2016)?

5. Authority to Educate

Philosophical debates about educational authority have been largely in response to evolving challenges to the authority of states to regulate education. They have also been shaped by a variety of philosophical positions on the normative considerations that should determine assignments of authority over various aspects of education. The challenges to public educational authority include efforts to obtain exemptions from the normally required number of years of schooling (J. Feinberg 1980), the exemption of religious institutions from legal barriers to discrimination on the basis of sex (Dwyer 1998; Galston 2003), homeschool movements that have fought regulation of education provided in homes and requirements for children to be educated in schools (Dwyer & Peters 2019), parents’ and legislator’s efforts to prevent subjects from being taught in public schools (Bialystok & Andersen 2022; Laats & Siegel 2016; Pennock 2002), and parents’ assertions of a presumed right to selectively opt their children out of required educational content (Archard 2000; Bialystok 2018). The normative considerations adduced in debating these challenges include the respective rights and interests of parents, children, and the public (Archard & Macleod 2002; Brighouse & Swift 2006b, 2014; Dwyer 1998, 2003; Dwyer & Peters 2019; J. Feinberg 1980; Galston 2003; Gutmann 1987, 2003; Levinson 1999; Macleod 1997; Reich 2009), the consequences of distributing educational authority in different ways (Brighouse & Swift 2023), the right or responsibility of a constitutional democracy to provide for the educational basis of its continuity across generations (Gutmann 1987; Rawls 1971, 1993, 2001), applications of principles of liberal justice to families (Clayton 2006), and different conceptions of the parent-child relationship (Brighouse & Swift 2014).

Strands of Ancient Greek and Enlightenment Liberal thought play significant roles in recent debates concerning educational authority. Plato and Aristotle proposed public monopolies on the provision of schooling that would be compulsory for all citizen children. There was no semblance of public education in their world apart from compulsory enrollment in military training and service in Sparta and Crete, a context that is most evident in Plato’s Laws, where the point of having a system of public day schools is essentially to train and enlist citizens in individual and collective self-governance in accordance with reason—to “rule and be ruled as justice demands” (Plato Laws 643e–644a). Plato took a step toward this in the opening lines of the Republic, where he implicitly repudiates Socrates’ apparent view that education could safely remain in the hands of families if philosophers provided higher education in ethical inquiry. The implication is that only a society that invests in early education that strengthens the rational element in human nature can achieve the form of civic life mediated by reasoning together that Socrates envisioned (Curren 2000). Plato seems to predicate public educational authority on the desirability of this form of life.

Turning to Enlightenment Liberal thought, Locke argued that parents have a fundamental duty to provide their children the care and education they need to become rational beings who can govern and provide for themselves. He held that parents’ educational authority derives from their educational duties and is thus limited and contingent on ongoing fulfillment of those duties (Locke 1690: § 69). John Stuart Mill went farther than Locke in repudiating parents’ claims to “absolute and exclusive control” over their children’s education, insisting it is

almost a self-evident axiom that the State should require and compel the education, up to a certain standard, of every human being who is born its citizen. (Mill 1859 [1978: 104])

What has been recently quoted far more often, however, is Mill’s assertion in the next paragraph of On Liberty that “A general State education is a mere contrivance for molding people to be exactly like one another” (1859 [1978: 104–105]). Contemporary challenges to public educational authority quote this, and defenders of it respond by arguing that individuality and diversity are compatible with public provision of education and a division of educational authority.

Responding directly to Mill, Gutmann argued that dividing educational authority between parents, citizens, and professional educators is essential to fulfilling a democratic state’s commitment

to provide its members with an education adequate to participating in democratic politics, to choosing among (a limited range of) good lives, and to sharing in the several subcommunities, such as families, that impart identity to the lives of its citizens. (Gutmann 1987: 42)

Defending teachers’ professional authority as essential to their role in cultivating students’ capacity for critical deliberation (1987: 82), she established a point of reference for ensuing discussions of teachers’ authority and bureaucratic, legislative, and parental encroachment on their exercise of professional judgment (see Levinson 2023a, Levinson & Fay 2016, 2019, on the inescapable role of teachers’ judgment in good teaching). An alternative three-way division of educational authority was suggested by Rob Reich, who argued that, in addition to parents and states, children themselves should have a share of authority over their own education that is commensurate with their progress toward autonomy or prudence in making decisions about their own lives (Reich 2009). Children have a strong interest in their own education, just as parents and states both have legitimate interests in children’s education, and their respective interests might be well-served by recognizing each as having some authority. The line of argument here is typical of recent debates in combining consequentialist considerations with arguments from justice and rights, in this case an adolescent’s emerging right of self-determination and the absence of any countervailing parental right to determine the life course of a child.

Proponents of unregulated homeschooling typically hold that parents’ custodial authority entails an exclusive and unlimited right to control their children’s education (Dwyer & Peters 2019). Reich, Brighouse, Clayton, Dwyer, Levinson, and others deny that parents have any such right, while developing somewhat differing views of the basis and limits of parental and state educational authority. While most regard parents as free to educate children into their own comprehensive conceptions of the good (CCGs) but obligated to accept the legitimacy of state authority to secure children’s developmental interest in autonomy, an alternative view is that families are no different from public institutions in being barred from such “comprehensive enrollment” in CCGs by respect for free and equal citizenship (Clayton 2006, 2012, 2015). Recent defenses of public educational authority sometimes follow Gutmann in predicating it on a right or responsibility of constitutional democracies to provide for their own futures through civic education, but they often ground it in a collective responsibility to promote the autonomy foundational to legitimate governance and citizens’ pursuit of lives that are good for them. These philosophical defenses of state educational authority are pluralistic, in the sense that they favor limited and divided educational authority. They side with Mill in rejecting assertions of parents’ “absolute and exclusive” authority over the education of their own children, and they also reject any comparable assertion by states of “absolute and exclusive” or monopolistic authority over the education of children within their jurisdiction. Such authority would license an unlimited state role in the provision of education and unlimited regulatory authority over any education the state does not choose to provide.

While nihilist (i.e., anarchist or radically libertarian) stances toward state educational authority are comparatively rare (Suissa 2006), philosophical defenses of monopolist stances seem to be nonexistent. Contemporary assessments of Ancient Greek arguments for a state monopoly on education and Mill’s objections to a state monopoly (Curren 2000; Gutmann 1987) have led to much the same pluralist conclusions as contemporary liberal assessments of debates over school choice (Brighouse 2000). Adequate public provision of education and oversight of private schools and homeschooling have been defended as requirements of justice, but the defenses invariably assume that families and other private institutions will play largely unregulated roles in the education and development of children. Advocates of school choice schemes have sometimes presented them as alternatives to a state monopoly on schooling (Friedman 1962), but defenses of school choice have been largely predicated on predictions of their effects, and philosophical critiques of school choice have been similarly sensitive to evidence and projections of effects (Ben-Porath & Johanek 2019; Blum 2023; Crouch 2003; W. Feinberg & Lubienski 2008; Swift 2003). Some willingness to assign educational authority to a mix of private and public entities on the basis of the likely consequences of such assignments can thus be imputed to both sides of the school choice debate, even as innovations in school governance, such as charter schools (Blum 2023) have blurred the public-private distinction on which much of the debate over educational authority has been predicated.

6. Educational Responsibilities

It bears repeating that responsibility to provide education and authority over aspects of its provision may be closely related and bound up with specific aims of education. Governments, parents, educators, and students may all have educational responsibilities, just as they may all have some related educational authority. The nature, grounds, and extent of these responsibilities are disputed, giving rise to debates about who has what educational responsibilities. What grounds the educational responsibilities of governments, families, educators, and (possibly) students? How are these various responsibilities related to one another and to distributions of educational authority? Which of these responsibilities are ethical and which are (also) responsibilities of justice? Which are responsibilities of adequate provision, which are responsibilities of equal provision, and which are responsibilities to address forms of disadvantage? How should equality of provision of education—or equality of opportunity through education—be understood? What forms of justice (e.g., distributive, relational, or corrective) and forms of individual difference and group-based identity are involved, and how do they intersect? To what extent can these questions of justice be addressed through applications of theories of political justice? What might a comprehensive theory of educational justice entail?

6.1 Nature, Grounds, and Distribution

Parents, guardians, and educators with custodial authority over minor children are all widely regarded as having weighty ethical obligations or responsibilities to safeguard and promote the developmental and educational interests of the children in their care. These responsibilities may be seen as arising largely through voluntary acceptance of the relevant roles, but there are disputes regarding the ethical significance of procreation and whether the educational responsibilities and authority of educators of minor children derive from those of parents, derive from those of governments, or may be to some extent independently grounded (Ahlberg & Cholbi 2017). Parents might suppose that teachers in their children’s schools are simply agents to whom they conditionally delegate some of their own educational authority and responsibility, while the best ethical analysis might be that teachers have independent professional responsibilities to every student in their care, as well as ethically significant responsibilities they incur as government employees. These professional and state-actor responsibilities might include ones pertaining to civic education, such as cultivating virtues of democratic citizenship and promoting civic equality, and ones entailed by the educational provisions of international human rights conventions to which nearly all countries are signatories (i.e., equitably promoting the individual flourishing of every student; United Nations 1948, Art. 26; 1989, Art. 29). Whether or not governments in the jurisdictions in question have constitutional and legal systems that align with liberal-democratic principles of justice or with established human rights provisions, one might see such principles or rights as grounding educational responsibilities that states and state-actors should see themselves as having, even if their non-ideal circumstances preclude easy enactment of those responsibilities. This is more-or-less the assumption on which “non-ideal theory” or justice-focused ethical analysis of real-world educational decision-making rests: ideal theorizing about (political) justice has not reached consensus on a way to organize principles of justice into a defensible structure, but we can agree on the relevance of many such principles to deciding how to fulfill educational responsibilities in the non-deal world in which such decisions are made (see e.g., Levinson & Theisen-Homer 2015; Levinson, Geron, & Brighouse 2022).

Do students have responsibilities to contribute to the success of their own educations? The language of equal educational opportunity suggests that education is something offered to rational actors, who are at liberty to take advantage of it or not; and from a pedagogical standpoint it is important that students have some choice in the learning tasks they undertake. Their educational progress will undoubtedly depend on the quantity and quality of their efforts to learn, and it is important that they learn to take responsibility for the decisions they make. These considerations suggest that students should be regarded as having some responsibility to cooperate in their education. However, it is arguably inappropriate to think of students who are minor children as fully-formed rational agents who are offered opportunities (Schouten 2023: 189). Motivation and skill in converting educational offerings into desirable attributes are themselves largely products of education, and one does not need to be committed to a luck egalitarian perspective to think it is wrong to expect children to bear the potentially life-long consequences of making bad educational choices that could be prevented by adults setting safe boundaries and providing motivationally sound learning environments. It is thus only in a qualified, low-stakes sense that minor children should be regarded as having responsibility for the success of their own education.

6.2 Adequacy, Equality, and Disadvantage

How should the fulfillment of educational responsibilities be measured? The philosophical literature that engages this question has been overwhelmingly shaped by theories of political justice and the role of educators as state actors who are answerable to principles of justice. The theoretical debates have thus revolved around educational justice (Culp 2023), equality (Brighouse 1995; Brighouse & Swift 2009a; Harel Ben Shahar 2016), equal opportunity (Jencks 1988; Anderson 2012; Lewis 2012; Jacobs 2016; Schouten 2023), or equity (Levinson, Geron, & Brighouse 2022; Levinson, Geron, O’Brien & Reid 2024). There are aims, aspects, and conditions of education for which adequacy, equality, and the prioritizing of efforts to enable students to overcome disadvantages are relevant dimensions of fulfilling educational responsibilities. Debates over the relative merits of sufficientarian, egalitarian, and prioritarian principles of justice in political philosophy (Rawls 1971, 2001; Anderson 1999, 2007, 2010a; Arneson 2000; Macleod 2012) have consequently informed debates about educational justice, equality, equal opportunity, equity (Gutmann 1987; Brighouse & Swift 2006a, 2009a; Walker & Unterhalter 2007; Anderson 2007, 2010b; Reich 2013; Schouten 2012, 2023; Shields 2015; Voigt 2017), or responsibility. Debates concerning the merits of distributive and relational conceptions of equality (Anderson 1999, 2007, 2010a; Satz 2007; Brighouse & Swift 2009a) and alternative metrics of justice—primary goods, capabilities, welfare (Brighouse 2001; Walker & Unterhalter 2007; Macleod 2010; Nussbaum 2011)—have also played roles.

There are clearly respects in which the adequacy of education matters. Education should be adequate with respect to enabling graduates to be well employed and function as civic equals (Anderson 2007, 2010b). It should also be adequate with respect to the ongoing quality of students’ lives at school, both because this matters ethically from a non-preparatory perspective (Brennan 2014; Gheaus 2015; Bagattini & Macleod 2015; Macleod 2018; Hart & Brando 2018) and because need-supportive educational environments are more conducive to learning (Curren, Boniwell, et al. 2024). Prioritizing the educational interests of those disadvantaged by poverty, racism, differences of ability (Ahlberg 2014; Brighouse 2001; Robeyns 2006; Terzi 2008; Warnock 2005), language, or other factors will similarly seem most important when such disadvantages threaten to deny children the adequate or comparable education they might otherwise obtain and when entire sectors of a population might otherwise remain a dominated class unable to function as free and equal citizens (Blum 2002; Anderson 2010b; Blum & Burkholder 2021; Wheeler-Bell 2023).

Conceptions of educational equality (EE) or equal educational opportunity (EEO) divide along several dimensions, so there are many forms that EE or EEO might take. The various dimensions can be framed as questions:

  1. Is it equal opportunity for education or equal opportunity through education that matters? If EE or EO for E is at issue, the concern might be equality with respect to the quality of educational experiences—e.g., of experiencing a growth of competence and deepening of interest in things that make for a meaningful life—or development of understanding, judgment, and virtues that contribute to prudent self-determination and civic cooperation. Educational goods of these kinds are not inherently competitive or positional, though there are contexts in which they may confer positional advantage. By contrast, the idea of EO through E is associated with the inherently positional, high-stakes role that educational qualifications have come to play as work and labor markets have been transformed by the growth of educational systems across the globe. Building on the idea that access to desirable positions and offices should be based strictly on bona fide job qualifications, Rawls introduced the idea of fair equality of opportunity (FEO), which would require

    not merely that public offices and social positions be open [to all, in accordance with talent] in the formal sense, but that all should have a fair chance to attain them…. Those who have the same level of [natural] talent and ability and the same willingness to use these gifts should have the same prospects of success regardless of their social class origin, the class into which they are born and develop until the age of reason. (Rawls 2001: 73)

    Rawls argued that FEO would require, among other things, “equal opportunities of education for all regardless of family income” (2001: 44). Some have argued that FEO is an ethically defective measure of educational justice because it is impossible to achieve without intruding too far into family life and suppressing natural and desirable differences between children (Gutmann 1987: 131–133). Others have defended EE as a good that should be pursued within the limits implied by what is right in such objections (Brighouse 1995; Barry 2005; Levinson, Geron, & Brighouse 2022). The question of how to distinguish between legitimate and illegitimate intrusions into family life has been addressed primarily by defining ethical limits to legitimate parental partiality (i.e., parents’ favoring of their own children in ways that confer competitive advantage) (Macleod 2002; Brighouse & Swift 2009b, 2014).

  2. Does justice require that governments ensure all children receive equally good schooling or that all children receive equally good education in all of its many aspects, both in and outside of school? The former would constitute a form of marginal equality, while the latter would constitute a form of global equality (Rae 1981). FEO would require that all children have equal chances to acquire the bona fide job qualifications required for the most coveted employment, hence a form of global educational equality. Brian Barry (2005), Gina Schouten (2023) and others have noted that achieving such global EE would require policies to sharply reduce inequality of family resources.

  3. What is the relevant scope of comparison in determining whether EE or EEO has been achieved? The students within a school? A school district? Municipality? State? Country? The world? Rawlsian FEO would require education that is equal for the students of an entire country. Whether FEO could be meaningfully applied globally is debatable (D. Miller 2007: 62–68), but in a densely interdependent world of large-scale migration and global mobility in higher education and labor markets, there are increasingly urgent questions of global educational justice that philosophers are only beginning to address (Culp 2019, 2023; Culp & Zwarthoed 2020; Geron & Levinson 2018; Stojanov 2018b; Brando 2023; Zwarthoed 2023).

  4. What is the relevant measure of equality? Is it inputs, such as per student funding, teacher qualifications, class size, extent of college preparatory curriculum, or quality of school facilities? Is it outcomes, such as graduation or college acceptance, employment outcomes, or life-time flourishing? Students will not all benefit equally from the same inputs or from outputs that are primary goods—all-purpose means to living a good life—so it is important to distinguish lot-regarding equality (i.e., students getting the same things) with respect to things that may not benefit everyone equally with person-regarding equality of benefit (Rae 1981). Ethically significant person-regarding measures of EE would include student experiences such as experiences of equal respect, a relevant variety of learning experiences, and childhood pleasures (Levinson, Geron, & Brighouse 2022).

  5. Is EE with respect to individual students most ethically relevant or equality with respect to specific categories (or blocks; Rae 1981) of students, who may be disadvantaged by reason of race, sex, language, culture, ability, or social class? Concerns arise regarding both. FEO is a form of block-regarding EE in which children are grouped by social class of origin and by “level of [natural] talent and ability and the same willingness to use these gifts” (Rawls 2001: 73). It has been criticized for its singular focus on equalizing life-prospects across social classes while tolerating the prospect of a self-perpetuating aristocracy of the talented and motivated (D. Miller 1996; Clayton 2001; Satz 2007; Schouten 2012). If the underlying ethical consideration is that children’s life-prospects should not be hostage to morally arbitrary luck, then why would justice require efforts to compensate children for bad luck in the socio-economic class into which they are born, and not efforts to compensate them for bad luck in their natural endowments (Jencks 1988; Harel Ben Shahar 2016; Levinson, Geron, & Brighouse 2022; Schouten 2023)? Block-regarding educational strategies designed to overcome systems of racial, gender, and caste domination have been extensively debated, and ones that are designed to prevent the extinction of language groups are beginning to receive attention (Weinstock 2023).

6.3 Educational Justice

Applications of principles of distributive justice have figured prominently in philosophical work on educational justice, but the landscape of educational justice and injustice is complicated in ways that make this inadequate. For one thing, there are often other forms of justice—such as corrective justice—at stake in decisions that have distributive significance, and children’s immaturity and developmental interests are fundamental to the intersection of distributive and corrective justice in education. There are also matters of relational equality, racial domination, linguistic justice, educational justice for migrant and working children, and others that complicate—or require more than—a distributional perspective on justice. There are other values at stake in educational policies and decisions, such as choice and efficiency, a variety of institutional decision-makers, and a spectrum of granular to system-level decisions that are significant for justice. A comprehensive theory of educational justice would presumably address all of the diverse forms of injustice that can converge in educational institutions and practices, and it would ideally offer guidance for the full range of educational decisions for which considerations of justice are significant. There have been gestures toward such a theory in recent years, including not only work on a comprehensive approach to integrating values and evidence in educational decision-making (Brighouse, Ladd et al. 2018), but also work at the interfaces of inclusion and choice in education (Merry 2020), distributive, formative, and corrective justice (Curren 2013), and corrective justice, racial justice, and gender equity in education (Thompson & Tillson 2020, 2023). There have also been efforts to provide groundwork for a conception of educational justice as justice in the development of children’s potentialities (Thompson 2016), and to develop cases and case analyses in which various aspects of educational justice intersect (Levinson 2023a; Levinson & Fay 2016, 2019; Levinson, Geron, et al. 2024; Levinson, Reid, et al. 2024).

7. Emerging Issues

The immense volume and range of publications in philosophy of education in recent years compounds the difficulty inherent in identifying any handful of recently introduced topics as issues that are “emerging” or destined to be more widely discussed in the future. Developments in philosophy, education, and the wider world will all make a difference to the issues that are addressed. Focusing on developments in the wider world, climate related mass migration and developments in artificial intelligence will pose philosophically rich questions about educational justice, civic education, education and work, and what education should be in a world of AIs. Climate driven migration and information technology are already civically disruptive forces that figure significantly in the present threats to democracy and educational institutions posed by authoritarian movements, nationalism, and civic polarization. These threats to democracy and education are already attracting a great deal of attention in philosophy of education—attention that is informed in varying degrees by research in social epistemology, political science, and social psychology. This work has been mostly focused on free speech, academic freedom, and accusations of indoctrination, which are the manifestations of these threats most acutely felt in classrooms and on campuses. Where we go from here is anyone’s guess.

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