Mexican Existentialism

First published Sat Mar 29, 2025

Mexican existentialism grows out of the encounter, engagement, and appropriation with French and German existentialist philosophies in Mexico mid-way through the twentieth-century. Key players in this tradition were José Gaos (1900–1969), Antonio Caso (1883–1946), and, especially, el grupo Hiperión (the Hyperion Group). Members of Hyperion, but particularly Emilio Uranga (1921–1988), Leopoldo Zea (1912–2004), Jorge Portilla (1918–1963), and Luis Villoro (1922–2014), focused their efforts on existential reinterpretations of that which is Mexican (“lo mexicano” or Mexicanness), a focus that lends this tradition its historical and conceptual uniqueness and importance.

1. Brief Historical Background

European existentialism made its way into Mexico in the late 1930s. A growing enthusiasm among young Mexican intellectuals for philosophical analyses of situated existence helped its spread. By the early 1940s, popular seminars on Martin Heidegger’s Being and Time fueled a growing interest into a “Mexican Dasein,” or Mexican existence. These seminars were led by recent European arrivals, Spanish exiles fleeing the Spanish Civil War (1936–1939). Crucial amongst these are José Gaos and Juan David García Bacca (1901–1992) who, through lectures, books, and translations laid the groundwork for a unique and impassioned appropriation of existentialism that would come to define Mexican philosophy for years to come. Ultimately, what is now called “Mexican existentialism” emerges from readings and reaction to Heidegger and the French existentialists (particularly Sartre, Merleau-Ponty, and others) originally introduced by Gaos, Bacca, and others. Key to its growth were the efforts of el grupo Hiperión, or the Hyperion Group (named after one of the twelve Greek Titan gods [Reyes 2004: 15]). Between 1947 and 1952, Hyperion read, interpreted, and promoted a version of French and German existentialism that they then applied to their own and unique historical, cultural, and existential moment. Some members of the Group believed that existentialism offered the conceptual resources necessary to bring about “moral, social, and religious transformations” in Mexican society (Uranga 1952 [2021: 94]) and “the very instrument with which to interpret Mexican reality” (Zea 1968: 12). Others, like Portilla, were a bit more dramatic, suggesting that the existentialist attitude was the natural attitude of Mexicans, especially given their history of struggle and overcoming, writing, “it might be said that we Mexicans are existentialist from birth” (Portilla 1949 [2017: 186]).

The Mexican appropriation of existentialism was never meant to be faithful to any one (European) approach. Early on, Luis Villoro (1919–2014) referred this appropriation as a “partial acceptance of existentialism in our day” which, he emphasized, “responds to a concrete situation” (1949: 233). This was an important qualification because Mexican philosophers could not expect their philosophical conclusions to perfectly echo those of their European counterparts. So the acceptance of existentialism was to be “partial” or, said differently, ultimately to be determined by the concrete realities of the Mexican social, cultural, and historical situation.

What follows will not be a detailed historical outline of this effort (a lot of this history is included in the entry on philosophy in Mexico—see also Hurtado 2006; Merrim 2023). Instead, we consider its results, presented here as a (non-exhaustive) conceptual inventory referencing some of the most important insights of this tradition—the contents of what has previously been called “(M)existentialism” (Sánchez 2019, 2023).

2. Conceptual Inventory of Mexican Existentialism

2.1 Freedom, Circumstance, and Responsibility

Søren Kierkegaard’s definition of freedom as “the possibility of possibility” prefigures what 20th century existentialists will say about this topic (Kierkegaard 1844 [2015]). In broad strokes, it is said that freedom makes possible a subject’s capacity to choose one course of action among many. This freedom to choose, however, is constrained, according to existentialists such as Simone de Beauvoir and Jean-Paul Sartre. In her view, de Beauvoir thinks the possibilities afforded by freedom are always limited by something external to the agent, e.g., traditions, situations, history (Beauvoir 2004). Mexican existentialists further particularize this view, proposing that for the Mexican subject freedom is enacted in a conscious choosing among possibilities availed to it by the Mexican circumstance. For Mexican existentialists, the goal of thinking of freedom in this way (as a movement toward possibilities) is freedom itself, or the intellectual liberation from the colonial inheritance and its various manifestations. Mexican existentialists thus understand freedom in the context of historical determinations (colonial oppression) and as the capacity to transcend them, which happens when they are affirmed in acts of criticism, commitment, and responsibility. In this sense, freedom only makes sense as a choosing to commit oneself to the circumstance into which on is thrown and assuming the responsibilities that this thrownness requires. Freedom, commitment, and responsibility thus go hand in hand. Let’s consider these ideas one at a time.

2.1.1 Freedom

Freedom reveals itself in the willingness both to commit and to assume responsibility for our commitments. Because commitment requires taking an exclusionary position on certain values or norms, and because making such choices is only available in freedom, choosing to commit oneself to the right values or norms is the best expression of our freedom. The right values or norms will be those that, in choosing to commit ourselves to them, make us responsible for the wellbeing of our neighbors, for the future of our community, or for the health of our circumstance. Leopoldo Zea says: “our freedom is expressed in the form in which we assume the inevitable commitment to our circumstance” (1952 [2017: 126]). In this way, the end of freedom is something other than freedom. Freedom is not an end in itself (Muñoz 1953: 78), but always a means to empower our circumstance, conceived not as an abstract, universal ideal, but as a real and concrete place.

Historical systems of oppression operative since the time of conquest and colonization of Mexico have rendered the Mexican person indecisive and “unwilling” (see below). Liberation from these long-standing oppressions requires reclaiming one’s power, understood as the subject’s ability to properly choose and to act on those choices. Emilio Uranga says that liberation is possible when we “dislodge [ourselves] from systems of inferior motivations” (1951 [2017: 170]), while Jorge Portilla writes that it involves dismantling the totalizing and objectifying “perspective of the stranger” (1949 [2017: 182]). Being properly free or liberated thus involves a recognition of one’s oppression (Macgregor 1948: 278) and, on this basis, the performance of “morally determining” actions (Uranga 1951 [2017: 170]) that "dislodge" us from it (our various constraints or objectifications) so that we may positively contribute to the well-being of our neighbor or our circumstance. Because they are to be morally determining, our actions will take the form of responsible commitments to concrete others and not to ideals or abstractions—for instance, to “humanity in general.” Freedom is thus to be understood, then, as “situated” and “committed” (Zea 1952 [2017: 135]). This is a “[r]esponsible freedom, [one] aware of its limits” (135). On such an account, freedom and responsibility are two sides of the same coin; or as Zea puts it, “[w]here there is no responsibility, there is no freedom” (135). Portilla concurs: “To the extent that this person becomes responsible,” he writes, “he or she becomes free, and to the extent that this person becomes free, he or she affirms themselves as a human being” (Portilla 1966 [2012: 162]). In other words, liberation from oppression—physical or psychological, colonial or otherwise—depends on taking responsibility for, and acting on behalf of, the concrete situation or circumstance in which one finds oneself. Choosing responsible and committed action is the essence of freedom.

2.1.2 Circumstance

Mexican existentialism responds to a particular Mexican crisis. It is a historical crisis of identity, of belonging, and of values. The philosophical models and approaches needed to address this crisis must be rooted in the Mexican circumstance. “After all,” writes Leopoldo Zea, “if we are to be faithful to our calling, we have to affirm that our situation is not that of Jean-Paul Sartre. Our situation is not that of the European bourgeoisie” (1952 [2017: 137]). Zea’s point is two-fold: the first, which is an obvious point, is that both the Mexican and the European situations are qualitatively different; and two, that given its own moral failings, central among these the catastrophe of the Holocaust, Europe has lost the moral authority to serve as a model to anyone, but especially Latin American philosophers seeking a philosophical orientation. The general idea motivating Zea is that human existence is necessarily situational, conditioned by space and time, and that philosophy itself emerges from reflecting on that situation—on its past, present, and future. These reflections constitute the core of Mexican existentialism.

Existentialism in Mexico grows in popularity in the late 1940s. The groundwork for this growth, however, was laid decades before, with the introduction into Mexico of José Ortega y Gasset’s (1883–1955) notion of “vital reason” in the 1920s. Ortega’s doctrine of vital reason privileges perspective and situatedness over abstractness and rational detachment, proposing that what matters is how human beings respond to their own particular circumstance. In his Meditations on Quixote, written in 1914, the Spanish philosopher introduces the centrality of circumstance in his anti-Cartesian “circumstantialist” principle: “I am myself and my circumstance, and if I don’t save it, I don’t save myself” (Ortega 1999: 45; see also Romanell 1951). What this principle conveys is that what is truly meaningful about one’s life is not something intangible, but something concrete, namely the place where one stands, the everyday details that make one up, or those things that create one’s identity in context. In a brief, illuminating phrase, it describes the nature of one’s identity (which is a marriage of self and circumstance) and, also, what one needs to do on its behalf (namely, “save it,” or preserve it by understanding it, advocating for it, or loving it). Circumstance, or in its Latin, circum and stantia, refers to that which stands around, including mountains, streets, forests, sky, or the totality of the environment…these are all “circumstance.” But “circumstance” is also language, culture, tradition, history, existing social relations. In sum, the circumstance is the totality of that habitat in which I find myself and that could identify me, inform me, or constitute me.

Ortega’s “circumstantialist” principle takes the form of an equation where the “I am” is the sum total of a “self” and the self’s “circumstance” (myself + circumstance = I am). The suggestion here is that the “I am” is not reducible merely to an “I think” or identical merely to itself. The “I am,” that is, is a product of an ego in a circumstance, in that situation in which it finds itself. The second part of the principle, moreover, says that if the circumstances cannot be “saved,” then the “myself” cannot be saved. This simply points back to the essential connection between myself and the circumstance that inform the “I am,” and the commitment and responsibility this implies. The circumstance limits me, but also affords me the ways in which I can respond to it. Mexican existentialists centered this principle in their philosophical project, imagining their identities as irrevocably tied to their circumstance, both in crisis and both demanding to be saved.

To be free is to become aware of my determination in a circumstance and choosing to commit myself to it in responsible ways—in other words, to engage my world. This means that freedom cannot be radical in the sense of a being unconstrained by any obstacle; the circumstance is an obstacle, it stands before us and must be dealt with—the way we deal with it determines us as free (Uranga 1947: 6). Thus, in freedom I affirm my subjectivity and I do this in responsibility committing myself to my circumstance. For Mexican existentialists, this takes the form of choosing to commit myself to the world as I find it and taking responsibility for it (for the sake of “saving” it) precisely because of the state in which I find it.

2.1.3 Responsibility

Of course, in one’s exercise of freedom, one can choose not to choose. But in Mexican existentialism, this unwillingness to choose (desgana: see below), rather than an expression of freedom, is seen as a form of withdrawal from the world, a refusal to be free. Freedom requires the willingness to choose, along with the willingness to commit oneself to what is chosen. 

But how does one choose one’s commitments and responsibilities? Leopoldo Zea proposes a hierarchy of commitments and responsibilities, where commitment to and responsibility for one’s concrete situation or circumstance sits at the top, while commitment to or responsibility for ideas or abstractions fall somewhere below that. He writes: “Committing ourselves to the universal and the eternal, without making a single concrete commitment, does not commit us to anything” (Zea 1952 [2017: 138]). For instance, as philosophers, it is possible to commit ourselves to ideals or abstractions, such as universal moral imperatives. However, it is more valuable and worthwhile, Zea proposes, if we commit ourselves to ideas and concepts connected to what we actually see and experience. This is because for Zea, “existentialism does not wish to elude reality, does not evade it, it confronts it, assuming it with all of its consequences” (Zea 1949).

Echoing Sartre and the European existentialist tradition, Zea says that “every person is a committed agent, that is, inserted, thrown, or placed in a world in which they must act and for which they must be responsible” (Zea 1952 [2017: 126]). Where Zea diverges is in suggesting that the world in which we are thrown is not “the world,” or that abstract landscape where “mankind” or “humankind” makes its home; the world of Zea and the Mexican existentialists is the non-European world, the conquered, colonized, and peripheral world of the non-European “other”—the Americas (Larroyo 1951). As Uranga puts it: “There is no world which is pure, neither is there pure consciousness; rather, there is always a consciousness in a situation, or commitment, which means at once a thrownness toward the world and the possibility to return to it so as to acquire a consciousness of the sense and essence of our commitment” (Uranga 1949: 227). Once consciousness of the particularity of this, Mexican, world is “acquired” then the choice becomes clear: to commit or to flee, to be responsible or to be unwilling. For Zea, as with the rest of the Mexican existentialist, fleeing and unwillingness are not authentic options: “We have to take responsibility for a past not of our making: yet at the same time, with our attitude, whatever it might be, we commit and take responsibility for a future that must be made by us. In this way, we are responsible for others in the presence of others. This, in short, is the essence of commitment” (1952 [2017: 127]). In Mexico, as in other historical geographies with a defined colonial inheritance, the sort of commitments and responsibilities that Zea and Uranga have in mind involve confronting the colonial past, challenging it, and, ultimately overcoming it, while keeping a firm grasp on the future. This sort of work is done via political action, journalism, speaking for those who cannot speak for themselves, and the kind of critical unmasking of which philosophy is capable. In this sense, commitment to philosophy is a form of responsibility.

2.2 Accidentality

A key concept in Mexican existentialism is “accidentality.” Accidentality refers to the being of the accident, or to the mode of existence belonging to concrete beings lacking in “substantial consistency” (Portilla 1949 [2017: 186]). In the context of this tradition, what is substantially consistent is unaffected by space, time, or circumstance (by “history”); importantly, substantial consistency is central to the Eurocentric ideal of humanity, or the idea of “the human” or “humanity in general” (Uranga 1952 [2021: 107]). To be an accident in relation to this ideal is thus to be an insufficient, and even dependent, instantiation of that ideal. Accidentality—insubstantial inconsistency—is a being “less than” the ideal of humanity and any of the ways this ideal is represented in culture, history, or society.

Emilio Uranga describes the accident as “fragility” due to its relation of dependency to the ideal, or to “substance.” He writes:

The accident is fragility: oscillation between being and nothingness. This means that its “fit” in being, its adhesion to being expressed in the modality of being-in, is not protected by an inalienable right, but rather whatever may be the form of its inherence, it is always revocable. The accident is constantly threatened by displacement [desalojamiento]. Attached to being, it can always be torn off from its “there,” exterminated. Whatever it holds on to, whatever handle it grabs on to, can be removed. It was born to be-in and at the same time to not-be-in. (Uranga 1952 [2021: 116])

While Uranga proposes that accidentality, as this fragile relation to being (to substance), characterizes the Mexican experience in particular, what he means is that Mexican persons recognize it as such, and they do so as a result of sharing in the trauma of their own history, which is one of violence, uprootedness, marginalization, and hardship. Such recognition demands thinking of life itself as revocable, finite, subject to precarity or extermination.

Accidentality has an established philosophical historiography. Aristotle says that substance is primary and self-sufficient and that the accident is secondary and dependent. Accidents are accidental attributes of substance. Applied to persons, these categories and distinctions mean that those who are substantial are self-sufficient and necessary while those that are accidental are inessential, dependent, and insufficient. Persons defined by accidentality will be those that “through a thousand accidents of history, of culture or society, have been framed by the catastrophic” (1952 [2021: 185]). Those framed by the catastrophic are familiar with historical violence and finitude and understand the world through their accidentality, that is, as precarious and finite. Uranga suggests that Mexicans in particular, but also, and in general, peoples living in the peripheries of world history, in its margins and undersides, have been framed—and frame themselves—in this way. (An alternative reconstruction of accidentality is offered by Vargas 2020).

We can think of accidentality, then, in a metaphysical sense as a deficiency or a lack-of-being before substance. Mexican existentialists, like Uranga, explicitly reject substance metaphysics in favor of a metaphysics of the accident where accidentality is all there is, thus revealing individual human life as indeterminate, ungrounded, and always already abandoned onto its context. No matter how connected I feel to substance, whether that comes in the form of God, the State, Capitalism, and so on, this relation will always be fragile, breakable, and uncertain. This uncertain relation to what only seems substantially independent ultimately exposes my temporality, my finitude, and my accidentality.

A prescriptive upshot in Uranga’s existential philosophy of accidentality is that keeping one’s accidentality firmly in mind is good for the business of life, and this for at least two reasons. One, in recognizing it and affirming it, we become more sensitive to our finitude or our human limitations. This in turn refocuses our existential concerns to what is most important, such as the needs of others, our own well-being, and our determinate circumstance. And two, recognizing our accidentality strips us of the self-delusion that we can ever achieve “substantiality”—i.e., absolute self-independence or perfection.

2.2.1 Substantialization

Substantialization is the opposite of accidentality. It is the (illusory) belief that one’s being, identity, or purpose is stable, determined, and self-sufficient. According to Uranga, “substantialization” [sustancialidad] is an obstacle to the liberation of the Mexican mind. “Substantialization” remains today as an aspirational ideal by those who believe in the superiority of classes, cultures, races, or ideals. Uranga thinks that the ideal of substantialization is “inhuman.” It is inhuman because it needlessly and harmfully divides people into those who are "substance" and those who are "accident," which is a false division because it is not humanly possible for anybody to actually be substance in the sense described. Liberation from this ideal means awakening Mexican consciousness to the recognition of what is most human and most true about human existence, namely, “accidentality.” In Analysis of Mexican Being, Uranga proposes that what distinguishes Mexicans from other peoples (especially Europeans) is the fact that they have “an ear” to their accidentality, to the terrifying realization that their lives are both a product of chance and always on the brink of “extermination” (116).

For finite beings, substantiality is not an aspirational ideal. No one can ever become substance. Now, while Uranga has in mind the harm caused by the myth of substantiality to the Mexican sense of self, today we can see it play out, for instance, in the United States, in those cultural and social conceptions of immigrants and refugees as “insufficiently” human, or insufficiently civilized, compared to “true” or “real” or “authentic” “American” citizens. As insufficient, immigrants and refugees are thus treated as inessential to life itself, and as accidental to it (see Mendoza 2016; Sánchez 2014). The truth is, however, that insufficiency is the essence of the concrete, so even the rich, the powerful, “Americans,” or “citizens,” and so on, can never achieve, nor can they aspire to, the substantial being that they may claim for themselves. We are all insufficient, inessential, and accidental to life, to the planet, to the universe.

2.2.2 Insufficiency

“Insufficiency” [Insuficiencia] is a mode of accidentality. It is the ontological correlate to the psychological “complex of inferiority.” The latter is the feeling of impotence and inadequacy that can overwhelm a person in the presence of something that appears superior or “better than.” It is originally posited in response to Samuel Ramos (1934) suggestion that an essential characteristic of the Mexican people was a shared feeling of inferiority explained much of their behavior toward themselves and one another. Against Ramos, Uranga argues that the Mexican inferiority complex is but a symptom of a much deeper human condition, namely, accidentality experienced as insufficiency. In other words, the Mexican experience as inferiority is really a foundational (or ontological) insufficiency that describes every finite, mortal, and bounded human experience (Uranga 1952 [2021]). Recognition of insufficiency is, as is the case with accidentality, empowering. By recognizing and accepting this existential and ontological insufficiency, Mexicans are always closer to the truth of being human and, in in doing so, are far more authentic than their European/North American counterparts. In short, insufficiency describes the mode of being of the human as always already deficiency in being—in existential terms, it describes the human being’s perpetual project of becoming.

2.3 Nepantla

The concept of “nepantla” has an established historiography in English-language Latinx scholarship. Primarily associated with Latinx/Chicanx feminism, and in particular with the work of Gloria Anzaldúa (1942–2004), it has come to name the social, political, and gendered status of those who live “in-between” cultures, in-between gendered and linguistic spaces, in-between differential sites of oppression and marginalization, and so on. However, the concept has a long history outside of that historiography, one intertwined with the Nahuatl experience of European colonization and displacement. It is from this tradition that it is appropriated by Mexican existentialist, where nepantla has one or all of the following meanings:

  1. Nepantla is an ontological concept that refers to a suspension between commitments or worlds that is indicative of the “postmodern” tendency toward indetermination, fluidity, and accidentality.
  2. Nepantla captures the always being on the way, i.e., the nomadism of those in-between worlds, but of also of the world-less, those who have been displaced by social, political, or other forces. It is sometimes referred to as a never again/never yet structure (Sánchez 2023, 53–68).
  3. Nepantla describes an existential refusal to commit, a neutrality regarding direct action on the circumstances in which some find themselves, circumstances which oftentimes offer no true living option. This can describe persons who exist with inherited oppressive existential situations and who, considering them as inadequate, refuse to commit themselves to them.
  4. Finally, nepantla is the “in between” temporalities, worlds, processes; it is being “in the middle,” as in “on the way,” in transit, from one place to another, or “in the middle” as in “in the midst of” a crisis or a paradigm shift.

These different ways to characterize nepantla revolve around a central axis, neatly summarized in the concept of “in-betweenness.” There are different kinds of “in-betweenness” across every imaginable human experience, and so nepantla can be considered a category of human being.

Nepantla is mentioned only twice in the main text of Emilio Uranga’s Analysis of Mexican Being (1952 [2021]), yet he argues that it is the key “ontological” concept in Mexican existentialism. Uranga writes that “[t]he Mexican character does not install itself over…two agencies, but between [entre] them. The nahuatl term ”nepantla“ captures this phenomenon perfectly; it means ‘in between,’ in the middle, in the center. We thus have before us, in all its purity, the central category of our ontology, autochthonous, one that does not borrow from the Western tradition…” (Uranga 1952 [2021]: 167). As “the central category” of this tradition, nepantla defies the Western philosophical tradition by insisting on the ontological priority of indeterminateness and fluidity. Proposing it as such is an important strategic move, since motivating Mexican existentialists is an attempt to confront and overcome suffocating colonial prejudices regarding who and what they are.

Mexican existentialism thus recovers and re-appropriates the Nahuatl notion of “nepantla” to designate Mexicans as “in-between” a seemingly endless journey that continues to take them further away from determinate and established identities. In a more general sense, this designation is also strategic, as it allows whoever defines themselves as nepantla to remain neutral in response to claims made on their identity by others—as napantla, that is, one can allow oneself to refuse the rigid of objectifications of the crowd.

2.4 Zozobra

About nepantla, Uranga (1952 [2013]) writes: “This is nepantla. Not a ‘synthesis,’ but an ‘oscillation,’ to ‘go from one end to another without rest.’ The mood [estado de animo] that communicates this structure of being is precisely ‘zozobra.’ In the mood of zozobra we do not know what to depend on, we vacillate between one and another ‘law,’ we are ‘neutral,’ ‘in between,’ ‘nepantla’” (149; emphasis added). What this tells us is that zozobra—a term Uranga inherits from the Mexican poet Ramón Lopéz Velarde (1888–1921), whose 1919 masterwork Zozobra serves as inspiration—and nepantla are not identical or interchangeable terms. Zozobra is the emotive expression of nepantla; it is the feeling of uncertainty, unease, anxiety, and despair that Uranga calls an “estado de animo” (a “mood”—see Gallegos 2023).

Finding oneself in this mood, or in the emotive state of zozobra, is not unlike finding oneself overcome with Kierkegaardian anxiety. Unlike Kierkegaardian anxiety, however, zozobra names the specific feeling of sinking and drowning (a going “over and under”), of being overwhelmed and undermined by thoughts of the future; or, what’s the same, it names the feeling of being pulled to pieces by the many possibilities of existence, none of which is presented as valuable or trustworthy. Uranga’s definition of zozobra highlights the accompanying feeling of hopelessness: is a “mode of being that incessantly oscillates between two possibilities, between two affects, without knowing on which of these to depend, on which of these to cling to for justification” (1952 [2021: 180]). In this way, Mexican existentialism posits that zozobra manifests the nepantla nature of Mexican identity, as unsettled, undefined, and accidental, while also free (see also Villoro 1949: 242). But it is a freedom that condemns us to a perpetual disquiet, feeling ourselves standing without “a fixed and solid ground” [punto fijo y roqueño], or always on “quicksand on which nothing firm can stand” (Uranga 1952 [2021: 181]).

2.5 Relajo

Relajo is a core concept in the existential philosophy of Jorge Portilla (Hurtado 2006, 2023; Sánchez 2012, 2016, 2023; Portilla 1966 [2012, 2023]). In a general sense, relajo refers to an action or behavior that undermines prescribed or expected attitudes toward established values (social, aesthetic, historical, legal, and so on). Portilla defines relajo as a “suspension of seriousness,” which is equivalent, he says, to saying “no” to values. To say “no” to values is to deny the demands of the social world itself. In normal situations, I attend to the values of the world, saying “yes” to them and doing as they demand—I behave appropriately. Doing so maintains a social status quo and things go on as they should. “The mere grasping of the value carries with it the fulfillment of that demand… [and its] realization in the world; and in order for this demand…to be realized, the subject, in turn, performs an act, a movement of loyalty [to the value] that is a kind of ‘yes’” (Portilla 1966 [2012, 129]). Relajo is a non-normal response to those same values. It is a rejection of their demands: “[t]he sense of relajo is precisely to frustrate the effectiveness of [a] spontaneous response that accompanies the grasping of the value. Relajo suspends seriousness; that is to say, it cancels the normal response to the value, freeing me from the commitment to its realization” (129–30).

The phenomenon of relajo involves the following three movements, which happen simultaneously. The three are related to a subject’s relation to a proposed value(s): (i) the displacement of attention away from what demands it, namely, a value or set of values; (ii) a dissolution of the relation between the subject and the value, or, Portilla says, a “lack of solidarity with the proposed value” and it is not identical to the displacement of attention; and (iii) a disruptive gesture or behavior, or an “action in the proper sense of the word that consists of outward manifestations of gesture or word that constitute an invitation to others to participate with me in this lack of solidarity [with the value]” (1966 [2012: 130]). Plainly put, relajo suspends a subject’s relation to value while demanding the involvement of others in the disruptions or suspensions. As a phenomenological fact, it reveals both the necessity of others and the primacy of the relation I-you, since without others, relajo is impossible.

2.6 Apretados and Relajientos

There are persons that appear to embody relajo. They are called “relajientos.” Relajientos are unserious persons who willfully suspend seriousness any chance they get. Relajientos have mastered the art of initiating chaos, displacing attention from what demands attention via actions or behaviors that both interrupt and invite. Relajientos can be anyone, but the primary characteristic of one is that in their behavior they exhibit a lackadaisical attitude that quickly morphs into a disdain of rules, authority, or customs. Their whole personality manifests an incapacity, and unwillingness, to commit to what society and others regard as valuable or worthy of commitment. Relajientos seek to live fully in the now; the past has no use for them and the future does not exist. Jorge Portilla says: “a relajiento is, literally, an individual without a future. …he or she refuses to take anything seriously, to commit to anything…assumes no responsibility for anything…a good humor witness to the banality of life” (1966 [2012: 147]).

At “the absolute opposite pole” of the relajiento is the “apretado.” The apretado, a term we can loosely translate as “goody-two-shoes,” “stick-in-the-mud,” or even “snobbish” is not just serious, but is burdened with seriousness. Colloquially we say that they are “tightly wound,” zealous, fully determined in and committed to their beliefs. We may even call them fanatics (Sánchez 2024b). According to Portilla, apretados are “afflicted with the spirit of seriousness” (1966 [2012: 190]). This affliction shows up as a commitment to being serious. Being serious set apretados apart. Unlike relajientos who do as they please, apretados do only what is demanded by their values. Ultimately, apretados value order and obedience more than freedom. One finds in this individual, Portilla writes, “no distance…between being and value”—the apreatado is what the apratado values, and this identity will be reflected in how they represent themselves to others. How they portray themselves is, moreover, is “an expression of [their] internal being” (191). Apretados “carry their value in the same way that they carry with them their legs or their liver: as a silent and solid cause of pleasure that they caress in their private moments” (191). They are, Portilla says, “[c]ompact masses of value.” (191).

Between the nihilism of the relajiento and the fanaticism of the apretado there is a politically, morally, and existentially preferable way to be. This middle ground will be the personality type that respects societal values, obeys communal rules, laws, and prohibitions, but is willing to question and challenge her situation, changing her mind if necessary. This middle ground personality will use irony and humor to her advantage as a means to reveal the right way to be and the right way to go, and not as weapon of disruption or suspension (she will not be a relajiento). Moreover, she will identify with values, but will not become them, and will always be willing to be rationally led to other, more enriching, values and ways of being (she will not be an apretado).

2.7 Death

Emilio Uranga contrasts a Mexican idea of death with the idea of death of the Anglo-American or “norteamericano” (Uranga 1950). For the Anglo-American, death is terrifying, something to be feared, and avoid thinking about. This is because, for the Anglo-American, when death comes, it takes everything away. For the Mexican, on the other hand, death takes nothing away from you for the simple reason that in life you never truly possessed anything. So death is neither feared nor avoided; and thinking about it is like thinking about any other of life’s facts—it is simply there. Uranga (1952 [2013]) puts it this way:

Death is not feared for the ends it brings nor because it impedes some mission, which doesn’t exist, nor is it feared for ripping away a self that also does not exist. This is opposed to that extreme case, the German, which is Heidegger’s, in which death is imagined as conferring upon life both individuality and totality. For the Spaniard and for the North American death takes away something, while for the German, it gives, but for the Mexican it neither gives nor takes because there’s nothing to take and there’s nothing to give (Uranga 1952 [2013]: 194).

In The Labyrinth of Solitude, published in 1951, Octavio Paz (1914–1998)—one of Mexico’s literary icons and a Nobel prize winner—echoes Uranga’s sentiment: “there are two attitudes toward death: one, pointing forward, that conceives of it as creation; the other, pointing backward, that expresses itself as a fascination with nothingness or as a nostalgia for limbo” (1985: 61). Paz goes on to say that the forward-pointing attitude belongs to the peoples of Europe and North America; the backward-pointing attitude to the peoples of Mexico and Latin America. We may call the forward-pointing attitude, the “instrumental attitude”; the backward-pointing attitude may be referred to as the “historical attitude”; the instrumental is Anglo-European, the historical, Mexican (Sánchez 2013).

To say that my attitude toward death is instrumental is to say that death, my death and death in general, has instrumental value or is a means to an end. The “end” is the vision, or ambition, I have for my own life, and the “means” is the thought that I’m going to die. The thought of death is what pushes me onward to the fulfillment of my goals. As such, death is thought of as an always “not yet,” as approaching, always on the horizon and always a possibility. The instrumental attitude is neatly described by Ernest Becker (1973) in The Denial of Death: “[T]he idea of death, the fear of it, haunts the human animal like nothing else; it is a mainspring of human activity—activity designed largely to avoid the fatality of death, to overcome it by denying in some way that it is the final destiny of man” (xvii). This instrumental view of death is the Western or North American attitude.

Again, the Mexican attitude toward death, on the other hand, holds that death has no such instrumental value but is merely a fact like any other. As fact, it is not a “not yet,” but an “always already,” a constant presence or a coexistence. This attitude is summarized by Uranga (1951 [2017]) when he writes: “Death is the only thing that the Mexican does not leave for ‘tomorrow’” (193). In other words, our being is not a “being-toward-death,” as Heidegger would say, but a “being-with-death” in the now and not in the future. In this way, Mexicans coexist with death as presence and fact. But coexistence does not mean that death cannot surprise you; death, like any other, can always catch you by surprise. Uranga says that “Constantly, Mexican lives [are] being ambushed by death” (167).

According to Mexican existentialists, then, the fear of death is removed with the thought that there’s nothing that I have that death wants. Our co-existence is not transactional, it is marked, rather by togetherness and conviviality. We thus co-live with death in acceptance. Uranga says, “We exist on the edge of death. There is in the life of the Mexican a permanent availability, or resolution, to death” (Uranga 2021: 511). Again, the focus is not on the forthcomingness of death, on its future, although death is both here and it can always kill me; the focus is, rather, on its presence, or on its persistence in the present (Carrion 1951).

2.8 Minor Themes

2.8.1 Irony

Irony is a key existential concept for philosophers like Jorge Portilla and Rosario Castellanos (1925–1974). Both of these thinkers recognize irony’s liberating function. For Castellanos, irony is capable of interrogating the authority of dogmatic (inherited) values, thus freeing us from them; and for Portilla, it represents a critical stance, both against the dogmatism of the apretado and the nihilism of the relajiento.

Portilla considers irony as a mean, or middle ground, between the excesses represented by apretados and relajientos. When related to tradition, or inherited value systems, relajo shows up as a negation of those values necessary to make sense of what is going on in the present; in contrast, the fanaticism of the apretado insists that the present only makes sense with, or can only be understood through, inherited values. The first, the relajiento, rejects the call of values, while the second, the apretado, embodies them. Irony, on the other hand, holds itself at a distance from them and neither rejects them nor accepts them. From a “will to truth” irony demands the taking of a Socratic posture toward inherited values, one in which a claim of ignorance allows the truth to come to light. Irony opens the door to truth, a door relajo sees but does not open and apretados see but nail shut. Portilla writes, “Irony is a liberation that founds a freedom for value…[while] relajo is a negation that founds a pseudofreedom that is purely negative and thus infertile” (1966 [2012: 176]).

Portilla’s idea is that a wholesale demolition of the way things stand (of “values”) does not lead to progress or truth or freedom. Neither is a fanatical seriousness about inherited values, which sticks one in place and traps one in the past—in a different kind of unfreedom. What Portilla calls an “ironic consciousness” is necessary to overcome both relajo and/or fanaticism, since only an ironic consciousness can confront meaning without destroying it. In the context of Portilla’s existentialism, irony is thereby the means whereby subjects create a future without either blindly undermining tradition (via the destructions relajo) or wholly internalizing it (via a dogmatic acceptance or substantialization characteristic of the apretadismo).

Rosario Castellanos (2017) similarly proposes that inherited values—this time in the form of patriarchal relations—oppress and marginalize. In this case, only an ironic attitude can liberate one (women, in particular) to a future freedom. Reflecting on how women have been excluded from both literature and philosophy, Castellanos ironically announces that such exclusion is appropriate because women “would be bored to death” by that sort of pursuit (2017). Castellanos’ ironic observation, however, is refuted by her own literary and philosophical endeavors. Her extensive bibliography attests to this. In saying that women would be bored to do such work, moreover, she is calling attention to the fact that this is the way that patriarchal narratives represent women’s attitudes towards learning and academic life. Irony is here a key existential moment in the liberation of the oppressed in general and women in particular (see Hierro 1997).

2.8.2 Charity

Antonio Caso’s Existence as Economy and Charity, originally published in 1916, and republished in expanded form in 1919 as Existence as Economy, as Disinterest, and as Charity, can be classified as a work in Christian existentialism. Influenced by the work of Pascal, Kierkegaard, and Bergson, Caso proposes that human existence in itself is pure egoism and selfishness, determined always by its biological need for self-preservation. In acts of aesthetic disinterest and Christian love, a person frees itself from its biological prison by doing what does not contribute to its immediate survival. A text written decades before the arrival of French and German existentialism to Mexico, the goal of Caso’s work is ultimately to persuade its reader that authentic human life is lived in service to others. He calls this “charity,” and believes that if anything distinguishes the human from the beast, it is their ability to “sacrifice” their own self-interests for the interests of their fellows.

Caso identifies three possible forms of existence: existence as economy, existence as disinterest, and existence as charity. Regarding the first: Caso’s existentialism is situated in the context of Mexico’s anti-positivist movement of the first decades of the 20th century. In fact, Caso’s early texts responds to the positivism of August Comte, Herbert Spencer and the Social Darwinism popularized in Mexico toward the end of the 19th century. According to that tradition, existence is nothing but a “struggle for life,” that is, a struggle for survival and the continuation of the species—this is existence as mere transaction, power, or economy. All that the person does, in this case, is for self-benefit. This is the height of egoism: all accumulation and all excess of vital energy, material wealth, power and so on is re-invested in oneself or accumulated for one’s profit. Other selves are there for me and for my needs. The formula for this way of existing is this: “life=maximum benefit + minimum effort.” According to Caso, existence as economy is the most rational way to life.

Existence as disinterest and existence as charity are irrational ways to live. To live life as disinterest is to invest all excess vital energy not on the ego, but in things that have nothing to do with biology, such as art or the contemplation of beauty. This form of existence is not interested in the triumphs of the ego, or even survival. Living charitably takes this one step further: it is to sacrifice resources (what he calls “life energy”) that would otherwise benefit a subject’s own preservation and to do so for the sake of others. Reason is adamantly opposed to this. Reason says that any excess resources (or “energy”) that a subject may possess should be spent on that which may guarantee survival or reproduction. It is irrational to spend energy excesses in any other way. The formula for this way of existence: “sacrifice=maximum effort +minimum gain.” A charitable existence, that is, is one lived for others, in service of one’s neighbor, while doing the most with what one has and investing of oneself without expecting a return on that investment. Ultimately, it is the individual who sacrifices for others, who spends his excess energy, his surplus, on the well-being of others that has surpassed the tyranny of the self and is truly charitable.

Freedom is intimately involved in the choice between living life as economy, as disinterest, or as charity. One can chose to live life as economy and never care about others, about art, or about the world. But “goodness” itself depends on choosing charity over economy: “a good man sacrifices egoism in favor of helping his fellow man, and such a sacrifice is free.” (Caso 2017: 38). But, again, charity is irrational; no rational calculus can conclude that giving away what one has is good for the self. So existence as charity is both a free act and an irrational choice, since reason is fundamentally egoist. “Life says: do not give what is your own. Reason says: to give is foolish. The good says: give what your egoism asks you to hold on to because reason does not discover your true, deep self, your real, autonomous personality emancipated from biological life” (Caso 1986: 51). Charity is thus a category of existence to which person ought to aspire if they wish to be good. The moral imperative attached to this aspiration is simple: “Go, commit acts of charity!” (Caso 2017: 45).

2.8.3 Fragility, Melancholy, and Unwillingness

Emilio Uranga defines human fragility as “the quality of always being threatened by nothingness, by the threat of falling into non-being” (1951 [2017: 167]). Fragility is an “ontological condition” like insufficiency that defines the “being of Mexican being.” For Mexicans (or so say the Mexican existentialists), this fragility is manifested as “melancholy” and “unwillingness” (desgana). Importantly, melancholy is more fundamental than either fragility and unwillingness, as it exposes us as beings without ground and without reason for being (Ramírez 2022: 53). Unwillingness differs from melancholy in that it is a response to it; it does not refer to a lack of will, but to a willingness to refuse to exercise it because there is no point in doing so. Said differently, it is not that one lacks the will to do X, but that one refuses to do X for some reason, including “repulsion,” “disgust,” or procrastination—“leaving everything for ‘tomorrow’” (Uranga 1951 [2017: 167]). One sees the world as disgusting, for example, when participating in its rituals bring me closer to something that I hate or with which I don’t want to associate. “Unwillingness is precisely the disgust that overtakes us when we foresee that our action might contribute to a consolidation of the abject sense of things. All action is therefore valued, in unwillingness, within the horizon of its contribution to depravity and corruption” (168). Uranga’s notion of unwillingness could be interpreted as laziness, which the term seems to imply; but unwillingness here is thought to be imbued with power. It is a form of resistance to not participate in the world. The unwilling man, writes Uranga, “sees a meaningful process that beckons his collaboration, his decision, his action, and that demands to be fulfilled by a surplus of determination” (167); in spite of this call, however, or against it, the unwilling person refuses to act, or chooses not to choose. Unwillingness is an intentional indifference having less to do with incapacity or inability and more to do with power, or resistance. However, for the Mexican existentialists, the downside of unwillingness is that the unwilling lose out on the opportunity to be historical, to impact the world. On the other hand, the willing (or the “generous”) make “a determined choice to collaborate, a will to sympathize, to enter into auxiliary contact with things, with history, with social movements, of adding or synthesizing the capacity for teleological determination that emanates from freedom with the causality that weighs things down, with the dialectical course of the world that straightens itself toward a goal but which without that surplus of determination can degrade or minimize itself into inadequate compromises” (167). Mexican existentialists point to unwillingness so that it may be avoided. It should be avoided because nothing changes if one is unwilling to “collaborate.” And if nothing changes, everything stays the same, including whatever oppressive conditions one may be presently enduring.

3. Critiques of Mexican Existentialism

Critiques for Mexican existentialism abound and vary from rigorous critique of methodology (Gaos 1952 and Villegas 1979) to dismissal on political or other-than-philosophical grounds (Bartra 1987 and Santos Ruiz 2015). While Gaos himself helps articulate the Mexican existentialist project with his mentorship and courses on Heidegger and others, he’s also one of the first to critique their approach on the basis that the Mexican being to which the philosophers refer does not exist, calling their method “arbitrary” (Gaos 1952). Villegas likewise criticizes the method, observing that Mexican existentialist confuse history for being, historicism for ontology (Villegas 1979). Other critics simply propose that the Mexican existentialists didn’t understand existentialism (Díaz 2024).

There were more dismissive critiques. One of Mexico’s most important and influential philosophers, José Vasconcelos, was an early, and vociferous, critic of the Mexican existentialist movement. In interviews given in 1950, Vasconcelos laments that existentialism in Mexico “is as sterile as the nothingness from which it takes its point of departure” (1950). The crux of his critique is that existentialism doesn’t really introduce anything new or interesting to either philosophy or culture: “the method is simplistic, almost infantile and its conclusions obvious” (1950). The obvious conclusions of existentialism (that man is free, that God does not exist, that one is thrown into the world) don’t inspire purpose or the sort of commitment that Zea, Uranga, and the rest, believe that they inspire. What it inspires, instead, is the abandonment of those ideals that make life worth living—another way to say that existentialism breeds unwillingness. And without ideals, man is lost. “Existentialism,” he says, “is the terminus of a decadence that in philosophy begins when thought lacks God and turns to itself” (1950). Such egoism is at the heart of existentialism and, Vasconcelos hopes, Mexican existentialist realize this sooner rather than later.

A few decades after Vasconcelos, the Mexican cultural critic Roger Bartra dismisses the Mexican existentialist project on political grounds. In The Cage of Melancholy (1987), Bartra suggests that as its apex, during the moment of la filosofía de lo mexicano, Mexican existentialism was ultimately rooted in “the disdain of the dominant classes for the lives of those who find themselves in conditions of misery” (60). In other words, the existential analysis that found Mexicans as accidental, indifferent to death, relajientos, or insufficient was political and ideological and was meant to justify existing social conditions (unequal and oppressive as they were). Existentialism, Bartra says, was an expression of a “nationalist romanticism” that sought to “generate a tragic sense of the opposition between the barbarian and the civilized man, and to create for modern man a mythical past, so that his very modernity could, apparently, shed such myths and confront rationally the construction of the future” (53).

Similarly, Ana Santos Ruiz’s Los Hijos de los dioses: El Grupo filosófico Hiperión y la filosofía de lo mexicano reaffirms Bartra’s suspicion that Mexican existentialism was not philosophy at all, but a form of state ideology. According to Santos Ruiz, Mexican existentialism sought to essentialize Mexican identity through various mechanism and strategies, thus solidifying and authenticating that identity as an accomplished, historical, fact. Santos Ruiz thus connects the philosophical project of autognosis, of knowing who and what the Mexican was, with a broader political project:

The filosofía de lo mexicano, for its part, created a discourse that sought to erase ethnic, cultural, social, political, and economic differences so as to offer a unique project of nation building based on an identity equally unique that, in turn, rested in one character, one history, and one shared culture (Ruiz 2015: 325).

In other words, the subject of Mexican existentialism—the person that takes responsibility, that commits, that exists in nepantla, that suffers relajo, that deploys irony, and so on—is itself abstract and ideal. Mexican existentialism does not account, according to this critique, for the multiple identities and ethnicities that make up the historical and social space which is Mexico. This is a fair critique and much more can be said about it as well as other critiques levelled against the tradition (Pereda 2006).

4. Current Scholarship

Mexican existentialism is currently in a state of recovery. In Mexico, the recovery process begins in earnest at the turn of the present century with Guillermo Hurtado’s edited volume El Hiperión (2006), which brings together the most significant figures of this movement as well as fragments of their best-known writings. This is followed by Jaime Vieyra’s “Emilio Uranga: la existencia como accidente” (2007) and Guillermo Hurtado’s edition of Emilio Uranga’s master work, Análisis del ser del mexicano together with various other of Uranga’s writings (1952 [2013]). Most recently, works by Hurtado, Aurelia Valero, José Manuel Cuéllar, Mario Teodoro Ramírez, Jaime Vieyra, and Hector Aparicio offer contemporary interpretations of existential writings of Portilla, Uranga, Villoro, and Zea (Hurtado 2019; Pie 2012; Cuéllar 2020; Ramírez 2022; Aparicio 2023; Garcia Torres 2024). The Mexican project of recovery continues and it is sure continue well into the 21st century.

In the US, this project of recovery is simultaneously a project of discovery. It involves a synergistic approach to Mexican philosophy involving translation, interpretation, publication and teaching. These efforts include Carlos Alberto Sanchéz’s introduction and translation of Jorge Portilla’s La fenomenología del relajo (1966 [2012, 2023]) and Emilio Uranga’s Analysis of Mexican Being (1952 [2021]), as well as Sánchez’s Contingency and Commitment: Mexican Existentialism and the Place of Philosophy (2016). These works begin a conversation of Mexican existentialism, it’s breadth, scope, and also its blind-spots—Andrea Pitts (2016), for instance, points out the complete lack of the feminist perspective internal to this project. The project is spurned on by the editorial work of Robert Eli Sanchez and Carlos Alberto Sánchez, who publish Mexican Philosophy in the 20th Century: Essential Readings in 2017 and launch the Journal of Mexican Philosophy a few years later in 2022. More recent scholarship seeks to engage Mexican existentialism with a less historical, more analytical, approach. Stephanie Merrim’s A Latin American Existentialist Ethos (2023) zeroes in on the influence of Mexican existentialism on literary figures of the time, including Juan Rulfo and Rosario Castellanos; Sergio Gallegos-Ordonica engages Uranga’s humanism (2020); Manuel Vargas offers an analysis and interpretation of “accidentality” (2020); Juan Carlos Gonzalez (2024) thinks of Mexican existentialism in relation to the various crises plaguing “America” in the 21st century; Francisco Gallegos gives us a contemporary reading of the phenomenology of zozobra (2023); and Juan Garcia Torres (2023) brings these Mexican existentialists into conversation with the popular decolonial approaches. It is thus safe to say that Mexican existentialism is a not merely a historical artifact, but a living, breathing philosophical archive with much to offer contemporary scholars.

Bibliography

A. Selected Bibliography in English

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  • –––, 1951. “Dos precursors del existencialismo: Kierkegaard y Unamuno,” Filosofía y Letras, 22(43): 203–219.
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Acknowledgments

Special thanks to Manuel Vargas, Robert E. Sanchez, Mariana Alessandri, Jorge Montiel, and Morgana Lambeth for helpful comments and criticism.

Copyright © 2025 by
Carlos Sánchez <carlos.sanchez@sjsu.edu>

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