Experimental Philosophy of Art and Aesthetics

First published Tue Oct 22, 2024

Experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics is the application of the methods of experimental philosophy to questions about art and aesthetics. By taking a scientific approach to experiences with art and aesthetic phenomena, it is continuous with the longstanding research program in psychology called empirical aesthetics (see Nadal & Vartanian 2022 for overviews of work in this program). However, it is also continuous with traditional research in philosophy of art and aesthetics because it is centered on many of the same timeless questions. Like other branches of experimental philosophy, such as experimental moral philosophy, it involves gathering data using empirical methods and bringing analyses of the data to bear on theorizing on a wide range of topics in philosophy of art and aesthetics: definition of art, ontology of art, aesthetic properties, aesthetic judgments, aesthetic adjectives, morality and aesthetics, and emotion and art. In this entry, we briefly examine the history prior to the current movement’s emergence in the 2010s, extensively survey extant works in this movement on each of the topics, and consider methodological debates regarding this movement.

1. History of Empirical Research on Art and Aesthetics

Modern scientific approaches to art and aesthetics find their origins in Germany in the nineteenth century, in some of earliest works in experimental psychology. Most notably, with his Vorschule der Aesthtik (1876), Gustav Fechner pioneered what came to be known as “bottom-up aesthetics”, which tried to discover general laws of taste by examining preferences for simple geometric shapes such as rectangles of varying proportions, colors, and arrangements of lines (for a summary of “bottom-up” aesthetics, see Nadal & Ureña 2022).

In mid-twentieth century, art historian and philosopher Thomas Munro—who founded the American Society of Aesthetics in 1942 and served as the editor of the society’s publication The Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism between 1945 and 1964—continually expressed optimism about the prospect of integrating philosophical and scientific approaches to aesthetics (1928, 1948, 1951, 1956, 1963). In “The Psychology of Art: Past, Present and Future” (1963), Munro observes that philosophers have actually been asking, for a long time, questions about art and aesthetics that are at least partly empirical, such as how do artists come to create works? how does the experience of art affect the audience’s character? are there rules by which the arts can please and instruct? do some works universally please across epochs and cultures? how can different species of aesthetic pleasure be taxonomized?. In “Methods in the Psychology of Art” (1948), he notes that authors in The Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism often make empirical claims as part of their arguments, and so should use empirical methods more.

Not all philosophers have been as optimistic as Munro. George Dickie (1962) argued that psychology is not relevant to aesthetics. Some of Dickie’s worries echoed earlier ones: for example, he argued that the psychology of art was impoverished by simplified stimuli, such as the use of geometric shapes rather than real artworks (compare Arnheim 1952). Other worries were due to his specific conceptions of philosophy of art and aesthetics, and philosophy in general. First, Dickie believed that aesthetics is “concerned only with the language and concepts which are used to describe and evaluate works of art” (1962: 289), and so questions outside of this conception—such as how do artists come to create works?—are simply irrelevant. Second, Dickie believed that philosophy is discontinuous with science, such that “the problems of ethics are not solved by a scientific study nor are the problems of the philosophy of science” and aesthetics is no exception (1962: 301–302).

While Dickie’s criticisms, and hardline view, held considerable sway over philosophical aesthetics and the philosophy of art in the second half of the twentieth century, this has not continued. From the late 1980s onwards, philosophical aestheticians and philosophers of art have increasingly appealed to the findings of cognitive sciences (for a summary, see entry on aesthetics and cognitive science), and to a lesser extent to the findings of empirical aesthetics, and particularly evolutionary aesthetics (see, for example, Dutton 2009). Indeed, from around 2010 onwards, philosophers joined the psychologists of art and empirical aestheticians in conducting empirical studies.

In some ways, it is difficult to pinpoint exactly where modern empirical aesthetics and the psychology of art ends, and the experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics, begins. But a rough characterization can be made along the lines that Dickie suggested. Empirical aesthetics and the psychology of art is primarily concerned with characterizing the psychological responses to art and aesthetically significant objects. It answers questions such as: what is the nature of the responses (such as chills, pleasure, changes in self-conception)? what features of aesthetic objects and artworks tend to elicit these responses (such as curvature, certain colors, etc.)? are there systematic individual differences in relation to this? Whereas experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics—as a branch of philosophy—is primarily concerned with empirically studying conceptual distinctions. It answers questions such as: do people think that a moral demerit can also be an aesthetic demerit? do people think that something can be art if it does not have any aesthetically valuable properties? what is the nature of the folk’s concept of art and beauty—are they purely descriptive or evaluative concepts?

Nonetheless, it is important to stress that, at best, this way of carving up the distinction picks out a central tendency of the two fields. In reality, the work done by researchers in philosophy, including experimental philosophical aesthetics, and empirical aesthetics overlaps in many ways. To give a few examples. Philosophers have had a longstanding concern in trying to establish whether there is a distinctive kind of aesthetic state of mind, and empirical aestheticians have recently become interested in this question. A couple of influential ideas about this from philosophy are that the pleasure taken in beauty is of a disinterested kind, where this roughly means that it is not the result of desire satisfaction, or does not essentially produce desires (see Kant 1790); and that approaching objects aesthetically involves adopting a distanced attitude where we disengage from the object practically, and do not relate it to our standing desires or interests (Bullough 1912). More recently, empirical aestheticians have attempted to tackle this issue with the tools provided by neuroscience and psychology. For example, Marcus Nadal and Martin Skov (2018) have argued against the idea that there is a distinctive sui generis state of mind, on the grounds that, for example, the same neural hardware that is involved in responding to pleasant tasting food and sex have been shown to be involved in the appreciation of aesthetic objects. By contrast, Amy Belfi and colleagues (2019), for example, have shown that aesthetic appreciation involves activation of the Default Mode Network, which they suggest may show that self-reflection, rather than self-detachment, may form part of what makes aesthetic responses unique. Philosophers have also been interested in explaining beauty in terms of a harmony between the beautiful objects and our psychological faculties in some ways (as present in, for example, Hume 1757a and Kant 1790), and psychologists have sought to explain aesthetic appeal in terms of processing characteristics, such as the fluency with which an object is experienced (Reber et al. 2004). Both experimental philosophers as well as aesthetic psychologists have tried to elucidate the features of moral actions and traits that lead to attributions of beauty, as well as the kind of psychological state appreciation of this kind of beauty gives rise to (see, for example, Doran 2023; see §6).

Unfortunately, notwithstanding the many overlapping concerns, the fields of philosophical aesthetics (including experimental philosophical aesthetics) and empirical aesthetics have remained largely siloed. On the side of philosophical aestheticians, this has continued to lead to missed opportunities for testing the empirical aspects of their theories and for experimental philosophical aestheticians to methodologically innovate. And on the side of empirical aestheticians, this has led to a failure to benefit from the theoretical and argumentative sophistication that tends to be characteristic of the best work in philosophy. However, there are signs that this is changing. Empirical aestheticians are increasingly attempting to test claims drawn from philosophy (for example, Brielmann & Pelli 2017; Winner 2019), and experimental philosophers of art and aestheticians are increasingly working with psychologists, if not empirical aestheticians yet (for example, Humbert-Droz et al. 2020). Nowhere is this more clear than in the case of work on awe and the sublime, where philosophers have worked productively with psychologists, and where philosophical claims have informed the design of empirical studies and the resultant theory building in turn (for example, Clewis 2021; Keltner & Haidt 2003; Shiota et al. 2007; Arcangeli et al. 2020; Shapshay 2021).

2. Definition of Art

“What is art?” stands as one of the central questions in philosophical aesthetics. In fact, we can ask different questions about the concept of art. First, we may ask about its extension: which works count as art? Second, we may ask about its intensional structure: are there conditions necessary and sufficient for a work to count as art? Third, we may ask about its function: is calling a work ‘art’ a praise, or merely a classification? Since many philosophers of art agree that the definition of art should be compatible with art practices and the way ordinary people think about art, unsurprisingly, it was also one of the first questions in aesthetics to be empirically investigated.

Which works count as art? In his first empirical study on intuitions about the extension of the concept of art, Richard Kamber (2011) presented participants with a large number of descriptions and images of objects and asked whether they would classify these objects as art. The main focus of this study was putting to test prominent definitions of art: aesthetic definitions claim that art is created with an intention to be aesthetically appreciated; institutional definitions claim that art is created by an artist and presented to an artworld; and historical definitions claim that art is created with an intention to belong to the same set of objects as previously created works of art. Kamber’s approach was to examine a variety of “hard cases” discussed in the aesthetics literature, such as objects of low aesthetic value and objects that were made prior to social art-making practices. He concluded that none of the art theories succeed in fully tracking people’s intuitions about the various hard cases, but the aesthetic definition of art, which holds an artwork to be an object created with an intention to provide people with aesthetic experiences, was somewhat more successful than others. In a follow-up study, Kamber and Taylor Enoch (2019) also asked participants to justify their decisions of what is art by selecting some of fourteen possible reasons, which included those that emphasized intentional creation, the creator’s consciousness, beauty or evoking imaginative experiences. In this study, justifications involving intentionality were the most often chosen. Nevertheless, this study again indicated that none of the main definitions of art fully aligned with what the study participants, predominantly art professionals or art lovers, found intuitive.

However, these studies have received some criticism. While Annelies Monseré (2015) is sympathetic to Kamber’s criticism of philosophers’ reliance on intuitions in defining art, she is equally skeptical of reliance on ordinary people’s intuitions. Instead, she advocates for a more indirect role for intuitions, on which they are not used to directly justify any specific definition of art, but as elucidations of how the concept gets invoked in practice. Ellen Winner (2019: 21) notes that Kamber “designed his study very informally, testing a grab bag of theories, using only one or two examples to test each one”, and that it might benefit from a more sensitive measure than a dichotomous choice of ‘yes’ or ‘no’, as was used.

Although neither folk nor expert intuitions strictly require a work to have high aesthetic value for it to be classified as art, more beautiful (or more liked—a more common concept in the psychological literature, which nowadays tends to steer clear of discussions of beauty) works do tend to be classified as art more often. Matthew Pelowski and colleagues (2017) investigated the relationship between ratings of liking and attributions of art status. Participants were shown a set of 140 digital images of abstract paintings, hyperrealistic paintings, poorly-executed paintings and ready-made sculptures, and were asked to spontaneously classify them as ‘art’ or ‘not art’. They were also asked to rate the extent to which they liked those images. Pelowski’s findings revealed a positive correlation where higher ratings of liking were associated with a greater likelihood of being categorized as art, which provides some support for the aesthetic definitions of art.

Can art be defined by necessary and sufficient conditions at all? Elzė Mikalonytė and Markus Kneer (forthcoming) investigate whether the folk concept of art is an essentialist or a non-essentialist one; in other words, whether it can be defined by a set of individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions. In contrast to Kamber’s studies mentioned earlier, they asked people who were not art professionals. In two vignette studies, Mikalonytė and Kneer manipulated three properties of artworks—namely, being intentionally created, having aesthetic value, and being institutionally recognized—aiming to see whether any of those properties, corresponding to the main essentialist art definitions, are seen by the folk as necessary conditions for an object to be classified an artwork. The results, similar to Kamber’s, also suggest that the folk concept of art is not an essentialist concept, but rather a cluster concept. Interestingly, none of the three properties were considered necessary—there were cases where art status was ascribed even to accidentally created objects. This finding is surprising considering the role that intentional creation and the creator’s intentions are thought to play in this context in the literature on philosophical aesthetics (Mag Uidhir 2013), as well as some studies in the psychology of art. For example, Jean-Luc Jucker et al. (2014) discovered that when people are asked to classify artefacts into art and non-art, their decisions are guided by inferences about the creator’s intentions. George Newman and Paul Bloom’s (2012) results showed that participants’ beliefs about whether an object was intended to be an artwork or not had an important effect on how they see a physically identical copy of the same object. More generally, it is widely believed that people classify objects into artefact kinds by making inferences about the creator’s intentions (Bloom 1996). Mikalonytė and Kneer’s study, however, is not the only one showing that intentional creation is not seen by the folk as necessary—they have also discovered that although people consider AI-generated paintings to be art to a similar extent as human-created paintings, they are not very willing to consider AI-creators artists. In the context of artistic creation, mental state (including intention) ascription to AI agents is relatively low, and this might partially explain why AI robots are not accepted as artists (Mikalonytė & Kneer 2022). However, another study by Mikalonytė and Kneer suggests that the phenomenon of art without an artistic intention might not be confined to the realm of AI-generated art: even human creators are seen as capable of creating artworks without intending to do so (Mikalonytė & Kneer forthcoming).

Is calling a work ‘art’ to praise it, or to merely classify it? Shen-yi Liao, Aaron Meskin, and Joshua Knobe (2020) take a different tactic to understand the concept of art. Their aim is not to uncover its extension, or to defend any specific concept of art, but to clarify its nature. Descriptivists about the concept of art contend that to call something ‘art’ merely conveys a classificatory status, whereas evaluativists contend that to do so is to convey a positive evaluation. Liao, Knobe, and Meskin use linguistic patterns to argue that the concept of art is neither. Instead, it is a “dual character concept”, which involves characteristic values that are realized by concrete features (Knobe, Prasada, & Newman 2013). To diagnose the nature of the concept of art and other art concepts, they examine participant responses to sentences of the following schema:

That is not good, but it is true [concept].

Extant research shows that dual character concepts, but not descriptive concepts, tend to sound fine when combined with the “true” modifier (Knobe, Prasada, & Newman 2013). So, for merely descriptive concepts, the sentence makes little sense. For example, it sounds weird to say “that is a true sonnet”. Moreover, for positive evaluative concepts, the sentence also makes little sense because of the explicit negative evaluation. For example, it sounds weird to say “that masterpiece is not good”. Since participants think that the sentence “that is not good, but it is true art” sounds fine, Liao, Meskin, and Knobe argue that the concept of art is neither descriptive nor evaluative, but dual character.

3. Ontology of Art

Ontology of art (see entry on history of the ontology of art) aims to discover what kind of things works of art are, which ontological category or categories they belong to, whether it is possible and what it means to create or destroy them, and what it means for two different objects to be ‘the same’ work. Works of art can be divided into two categories: repeatable and non-repeatable. The former category consists of musical works and other kinds of works that exist in multiple instantiations. The latter category consists of singular works of art where there is only one original instance of that work and all others are merely copies of the original, for example, paintings or sculptures. This distinction also has implications for the way people evaluate work of art.

For repeatable artworks, the most pressing ontological question concerns the conditions under which two performances are of the same work. Christopher Bartel (2018) investigated intuitions on the repeatability of pop songs. He presented study participants with three scenarios describing three pairs of musical performances, with each of these pairs reflecting one of the following differences: a difference in provenance (two identically sounding performances are played by two different bands), in affect (one performance sounding humble, and one sounding dramatic), and in connotation (the two performances are played by different bands, with different lyrics and expressive of different emotions). Bartel found that a difference in provenance does not make a difference to whether the song is identical across different performances, but differences in affect and in connotation do.

Elzė Mikalonytė and Vilius Dranseika (2020) focused on works of classical music. They created scenarios that reflected the main points of disagreement among theories of the individuation of musical works, such as sonicism (which claims that identity of musical works depends on their acoustic properties only), instrumentalism (which also adds the instrument used to perform the musical work to the list of identity-conferring properties), and contextualism (which also emphasizes the importance of musico-historical context). In contrast to many other studies, Mikalonytė and Dranseika target intuitions about the identity of two performances at the same point in time. They presented the participants with seven scenarios, including, for example, two identically sounding performances of two identical scores which were independently created by two composers, or two performances that differ only with respect to their emotional expressivity. They concluded that folk intuitions correspond most with pure sonicism, the theory which claims that work identity depends solely on its (non-timbral) acoustic properties, although the identity of the composer is also an important factor. While Bartel concludes that pop music songs are not easily repeatable—in many cases, participants were inclined to deny that two performances were of the same song—Mikalonytė and Dranseika’s study points in the opposite direction: people consider works of classical music to be quite easily repeatable.

Nemesio Puy (2022) has criticized this approach for relying solely on textual vignettes, lacking real musical stimuli (for more on this discussion, see section 8). Puy’s experiments show that, compared to Bartel (2018) and Mikalonytė and Dranseika (2020), when study participants have the chance to hear musical works, they are even more likely to answer the individuation (or repeatability) question in the sonicist way. This tendency is especially apparent if the question is asked immediately after hearing two musical samples, without any contextual information being provided.

Two more empirical studies in this area of inquiry investigate people’s intuitions regarding the persistence of musical works—in other words, their identity over time. Mikalonytė and Dranseika (2022) explored the hypothesis that musical works’ identity crucially depends on their purposes: different versions of a musical work remain versions of the same work if and only if they retain the same overall point they were created for. Their results provide some support for this hypothesis, but purpose was not considered to be a necessary condition. Again, this study shows that people have mostly sonicist intuitions—they believe that the identity of musical works mostly depends on their acoustic properties, and this is considered to be a much more important criterion in judgments of identity compared to the overall purpose of the work as intended by the composer.

Elzė Mikalonytė and Clément Canonne (forthcoming) found that judgments of the identity of artworks—both musical works and paintings—are partially normative. Their results provide some support for the Phineas Gage effect—according to which, changes in valued qualities, and especially moral properties, change identity judgments—suggesting that if a musical work undergoes some changes and becomes more aesthetically valuable, people are more likely to say that it is still the same musical work compared to the condition when the musical work becomes less aesthetically valuable. However, the effect observed was easily overridden by changes in material identity or moral value and for this reason it does not seem sufficient to claim that musical works are essentialized in terms of their aesthetic value.

All of the empirical studies in the ontology of musical works so far have focused on their identity conditions. Many other topics remain unexplored by experimental philosophers, such as the way musical works come into existence and cease to exist. An overview of such topics and a systematic survey of philosophers’ appeals to ordinary intuitions regarding musical works is presented in Mikalonytė (2022), where she also discusses how the ontology of musical works could benefit from further empirical research.

Unlike repeatable artworks that can have many genuine and potentially equally valuable instances, other works of art, such as paintings or sculptures, can only have one physical object. The relationship between different instances of these artworks is of copy and original, where only one physical object can count as a given artwork. This has important implications both for identity judgments and aesthetic evaluation.

Given that many non-repeatable artworks share similarities with ordinary, non-artistic artefacts, it is helpful to compare studies that explore the role of material continuity in judgments of artefact and artwork persistence. Sergey Blok, George Newman, and Lance Rips (2005) investigated people’s intuitions about the persistence of various types of objects, including persons, animals, plants, and artefacts. Participants were presented with a vignette about each of these objects either (a) being disassembled into individual particles, transported and reassembled again, or (b) being replaced by an identical material copy, the original of which is destroyed. People were inclined to see artefacts as the same after being ‘copied’. In a related study, David Rose and colleagues (2020) have investigated intuitions about the Ship of Theseus puzzle across different cultures. Their results suggest that people are ambivalent about whether it is the continuity of form or the continuity of material that is decisive in matters of identity. Results of both studies suggest that material identity might not be the main criterion for judgments of persistence of artefactual objects. However, extant empirical research suggests that judgments of the persistence of artworks are different from those of other artefacts. When presented with a scenario about someone creating a copy of either an artwork or of a tool and destroying the original object, people are not willing to see the copy as ‘the same’ object, even if the only difference between the tool and the artwork is labeling them as such (Newman, Bartels, & Smith 2014).

Some philosophers, such as Arthur Danto (1973), claim that a copy of a non-repeatable artwork is always aesthetically less valuable. Empirical research also suggests that people tend to value a copy of an artwork less than the original, even if the two are perceptually indistinguishable (Rabb, Brownell, & Winner 2018). George Newman has conducted a series of studies to explain this effect. One possible reason is that the created object is evaluated as the result of a unique creative act; another is that there is a perceived physical contact between the object and the original creator (Newman & Bloom 2012). When a duplicate object is made by someone other than the original creator, people are less inclined to see it as the same object (Newman, Bartels, & Smith 2014). Since people believe that an object’s or person’s essence can be transferred by means of physical contact, Newman and Smith (2019) hypothesized—and confirmed—that differences in evaluation between a copy and an original painting are mediated by the artwork’s perceived anthropomorphism; that is, feelings that the artwork seems alive and expresses emotions. In some cases, physical contact is not necessary for beliefs in contagion: intentional contact may be enough (Stavrova et al. 2016). Shen-yi Liao, Aaron Meskin, and Jade Fletcher (2020) examined the contagion effect in the museum context. They asked the participants (a) whether the objects in the gallery embody “the very being” of their creator, and (b) whether they are unique, and they found that contagion has an effect on perceived aesthetic value both in the museum and laboratory context, while uniqueness matters only in the latter.

Finally, there is one more way aesthetic information has an effect on ontological judgments, even if this kind of research does not speak directly to the ontology of art: aesthetic preferences may influence judgments of personal identity. Previously, it had been thought that we consider humans and their ‘true selves’ to be fundamentally morally good, and that changes to someone’s moral character influence judgments of a person’s identity. Joerg Fingerhut and colleagues discovered that changes in our aesthetic taste are also seen as profoundly transformative changes: when someone’s aesthetic preferences change, they cease to be the same person (Fingerhut et al. 2021).

4. Aesthetic Judgments

A particularly fruitful area of experimental philosophical research has centered around the question of how objective our aesthetic judgments are, and related issues such as the possibility of aesthetic testimony. This has principally been done by either examining meta-aesthetic intuitions, or by examining the amount of agreement in aesthetic matters, and the source of this agreement.

With respect to the issue of objectivity, many philosophical aestheticians have thought that aesthetic judgments intend to express truths about the way the world is, and that some people have better access to these truths than others. David Hume (1757a) suggests that some people are better able to detect and weigh the aesthetic merits of a work than others—they have delicate taste—and that works that are reliably appreciated over time and across cultures are those which are truly good. Immanuel Kant (1790) suggests that while our judgments of beauty are based in pleasure, they command universal agreement—that is, we expect others to make the same judgments as us. In this respect, aesthetic judgments have been thought to be unlike statements of personal taste, such as ‘broccoli is delicious’, about which there can only be blameless disagreement; and like empirical judgments, such as ‘there is a piece of broccoli on my plate’, about which there can be genuine disagreement. Indeed, some have thought that the way the folk act presupposes such a realist conception of aesthetic judgments, with Noël Carroll (1999), Nick Zangwill (2005), and Peter Kivy (2015) noting that we argue with each other about aesthetic matters.

Taking this as a starting point, a number of psychologists and experimental philosophers have presented findings that suggest realism cannot be given special status as the commonsensical view, and philosophical accounts of aesthetic judgments do not need to accommodate realist intuitions. This line of research started with Geoffrey Goodwin and John Darley (2008), who asked people to determine whether comparative aesthetic judgments—such as ‘Shakespeare was a better writer than Dan Brown’—were true, false, or a matter of opinion. Most participants described aesthetic statements as opinions (despite the strength of agreement with each statement) and they did this more frequently than in the case of comparable moral, factual statements, or statements reflecting social conventions.

Then, in a series of studies led by Florian Cova, the folk’s meta-aesthetical views were further tested by presenting participants with an aesthetic disagreement—such as where someone finds a sunset beautiful and the other does not—between two interlocutors (or between the participant and an interlocutor), and asking participants whether one person is correct, both are correct, or neither is correct. Across different kinds of objects (including natural objects and art widely recognized to be beautiful, as well as objects that study participants personally find beautiful), type of aesthetic judgments (including judgments of beauty and ugliness), and across a wide range of different countries, it has been found that most select the option “Neither is correct” (Cova & Pain 2012; Cova, Olivola, et al. 2019; for further studies utilizing the disagreement method, see Andow 2022).

Returning to the comparative method, Nathaniel Rabb, Alex Han, and colleagues (2022) have presented further evidence against the idea that the folk are aesthetic realists by explicitly asking participants whether aesthetic judgments are matters of opinion or matters of fact. They showed that people believe that aesthetic judgments are subjective even after learning that one of the two works has been historically acclaimed, or even when they liked one artwork much more than another (though, for criticisms of this study, see Moss & Bush 2021).

Supporters of the presumption in favor of realism have, however, fought back. Zangwill (2019) argues that Cova and his colleagues’ studies are not about whether people think aesthetic judgments can be true or false, but rather about whether a given person is right or wrong, and so leave the presumption in favor of realism unscathed. The distinction Zangwill is aiming at is as follows: Someone who guesses correctly that it is raining outside would be saying something true when they say that “it is raining outside”, but they cannot be described as right. Being right is a matter of being justified in saying something. In addressing Zangwill’s critique, in the same design where participants are asked to consider an interlocutor disagreeing with them in making various kinds of judgments, including aesthetic judgments, Cova (2019) asked participants whether one, both or neither person said something true or false. The results here were quite different from those of the studies conducted to date: with the modal response being that only one person says something true (40%), followed closely by the response that says that both say something true (39%). Despite these differences, Cova suggests that these do not support the idea that the folk tend to be realists about aesthetic judgment on the grounds that the pattern of responses did not match the pattern for paradigmatic factual judgements (that is, a disagreement about whether something is steel, where 71% of participants selected the response that only one person said something true).

A further objection has been raised to this work on folk meta-aesthetics by Filippo Contesi and colleagues (2024). They point out that all the studies discussed above reveal that the folk’s explicit meta-aesthetic views are subjectivist, and that this is consistent with what supporters of aesthetic realism say. These supporters—such as Carroll (1999), Zangwill (2005), and Kivy (2015)—claim that the folk are implicitly realist in arguing about matters of taste, even if they hold explicit subjectivist attitudes, as expressed by hackneyed proverbs such as “there’s no accounting for taste”. As such, Contesi and colleagues suggest that Cova’s results are inconclusive, and that disproving folk aesthetic realism as it has been conceived of by realists to support the plausibility of their position would require a different methodological approach.

Turning away from critiques of aesthetic realism to positive accounts of folk meta-aesthetics, experimental philosophers have also suggested that folk meta-aesthetical views might nonetheless allow for some degree of objectivity, and have found that the concept of good taste might behave differently from that of aesthetic truth.

Cova (2019) suggests that the folk might be expressivists about aesthetic judgments, and that they may think that there can nonetheless be correctness conditions for aesthetic judgments, insofar as people can, for example, be mistaken about the cause of the feelings they express. In one study to begin to test this position, Cova presented participants with a case where someone judges the Eiffel tower to be beautiful as a result of being high on drugs, or as a result of seeing the Eiffel tower unimpaired. The results reveal that participants were less likely to say that a judgment of beauty was true and more likely to say that the judgment was false when the experience was the result of drugs. Similarly, across five studies that manipulated the type of disagreement (cross-cultural or intercultural, or internal disagreement of one individual over time) and asked participants about the possibility of error in aesthetic judgments, James Andow (2022) found that while people do not hold realist beliefs, they do believe that they have correctness conditions (though see Murray 2020 for results suggesting that people do not think that disagreement implies that they are seen as incorrect).

Moreover, although most studies on aesthetic judgments point in the direction of subjectivism, research on aesthetic taste suggests that people believe aesthetic taste can be good or bad. Constant Bonard et al. (2022) asked participants whether it makes sense to distinguish between good and bad taste, and then asked to define what it is. The majority of participants agreed with the distinction, and although a significant part defined good taste in terms of the ability to detect aesthetic properties, expressing the view compatible with aesthetic realism, for other participants, good taste was compatible with aesthetic subjectivism, since ‘good taste’ was defined simply as something corresponding to their own personal preferences. Another phenomenon that has been thought to be relevant to the issue of whether good taste exists, is that of ‘guilty pleasures’—enjoying aesthetic objects one feels one should not enjoy. As Kris Goffin and Florian Cova (2019) observe, the existence of guilty pleasure at first sight might be considered evidence for the existence of good taste among the folk. However, they present evidence suggesting that the guilt people experience should be understood as guilt for violating social norms, not aesthetic ones, and therefore should not be seen as evidence for folk aesthetic realism.

In addition to the meta-aesthetical method outlined above, psychologists and experimental philosophers have also examined realism about taste by considering the mechanisms that result in people’s aesthetic judgments.

Some philosophers have suggested that the idea that there be objective aesthetic value might be demonstrated simply by pointing to the fact that some artworks and not others are universally judged as aesthetically valuable. For example, Hume (1757a) suggests that some works are, truly, better than others, and that those works will pass the test of time: they will be judged to be good across cultures and epochs, and they will do this in virtue of truly having aesthetically good-making features.

However, James Cutting (2003) has presented evidence that has seemed to put pressure on this Humean view. Having found that merely exposing people to impressionist works made them like them more, Cutting suggests that we may like canonical works because they have been continually broadcast to the world. Armed with Cutting’s findings, the aesthetic skeptic might argue that passing the test of time isn’t an indication of aesthetic quality, but rather an indication that people have merely experienced the works more frequently.

In defense of the Humean view, Meskin et al. (2013) suggest that mere exposure might not indiscriminately improve liking of works, irrespective of their aesthetic quality; but rather, help us to more accurately appreciate their true aesthetic merits and demerits. As a corollary, they also suggest that works may enter the canon because they are truly better. Putting their Humean defense to the test, they merely exposed participants to works that the authors and many critics consider good and bad (namely, works by John Millais and Thomas Kinkade, respectively). The results revealed that participants liked the Kinkade paintings less the more they were exposed to them, and the results suggested a trend for participants to like the late Millais paintings more the more they were exposed to them (though this was not significant). Meskin and colleagues interpret this evidence as consistent with the existence of aesthetic value, as well as the reliability of the test of time: with repeated exposure, we are better able to appraise a work’s good- and bad-making features, and so those works that endure do so, at least in part, in virtue of having good-making features.

Bence Nanay (2017) has criticized the idea that mere exposure is relevant to aesthetic realism. First, studies on mere exposure target spontaneous reactions, while aesthetic judgments are traditionally thought to be reflective and unfolding in time. Secondly, the mere exposure effect seems to work only with good artworks and not with bad ones—exposure to good artworks makes positive aesthetic judgments more likely, but not the other way around. Most importantly, according to Nanay, experiments show that exposure to one artwork changes our preference for that particular artwork, but not for any other artwork. In order for these experiments to count as evidence against aesthetic realism, Nanay contends, we would need to demonstrate that exposure to one particular artwork can influence our preferences for other artworks of the same kind (for example, of the same artistic style).

Finally, another tightly related question is about the nature of aesthetic testimony: if our aesthetic judgments are similar to empirical judgments, we can reliably learn about aesthetic properties from what other people say—if during a phone call someone says that a piece of broccoli they are having for lunch ‘is beautiful’, should we trust their testimony to the same extent that we would trust their claim that ‘there is a piece of broccoli on my plate’?

Andow (2019) asked his study participants whether they think that forming aesthetic beliefs based on testimony given by a friend or an expert is less permissible and legitimate compared to forming such beliefs based on first-hand experience, and also compared to forming non-aesthetic beliefs, such as beliefs about size or price. Although his results confirm that there is an asymmetry between the extent to which people are inclined to trust aesthetic testimony, compared to testimony about non-aesthetic properties, interestingly, this effect was not moderated by the participants’ attitudes toward the status of aesthetic judgments. Moreover, another similarly designed study shows that aesthetic and moral beliefs based on testimony, in contrast to descriptive beliefs, are not seen as constituting knowledge (Andow 2020).

5. Aesthetic Adjectives

Aesthetic adjectives, such as ‘beautiful’ and ‘elegant’, are central to aesthetic communication: they are the most common tools with which we attribute aesthetic properties to works and communicate aesthetic judgments with others. Some philosophers contend that aesthetic adjectives constitute a segment of natural language that is interesting in its own right, for different reasons. Frank Sibley (1959, 2001) argues that aesthetic adjectives are distinctive in that they require taste to apply. By this, Sibley means that whether an aesthetic adjective applies to a work is never determined by any set of non-aesthetic properties. Tim Sundell (2017) argues that although aesthetic adjectives are not semantically distinctive, they are metalinguistically distinctive because of their role in coordinating and negotiating standards. By this, Sundell means that when you say ‘this artwork is beautiful’ and I say ‘no it is not’, we are not only attributing properties to the work itself, but communicating our different standards of beauty through our different applications of the term ‘beautiful’.

There is a nearby segment of natural language that has attracted much attention from philosophers and linguists: predicates of personal taste such as ‘tasty’ and ‘fun’. Indeed, some experimental philosophers have made valuable contributions to this debate (such as Kneer, Vicente, & Zeman 2017; Dinges & Zakkou 2020; Kneer 2021). However, scholars in this debate typically set aesthetic adjectives to the side in their investigations. For example, Peter Lasersohn (2005: 645) explicitly does so in order to avoid fundamental issues in aesthetics. In contrast to the lively scholarly activity on predicates of personal taste, there are only a few works that explicitly and primarily investigate aesthetic adjectives. As such, it remains an open question whether aesthetic adjectives are distinct from predicates of personal taste, or whether there exists a unified treatment of the two.

Louise McNally and Isidora Stojanovic (2017) argue that while predicates of personal taste are necessarily mind-dependent insofar as they entail an experiencer, aesthetic adjectives are semantically distinctive because they express evaluations without entailing an experiencer. McNally and Stojanovic’s diagnostic appeals to the fact that the verb ‘find’ tends to complement adjectives with an experiencer. For example, sentences like ‘I find him attractive’ tend to sound fine but sentences like ‘I find him tall’ tend to sound weird. Using the British National Corpus, they found that aesthetic adjectives do not tend to complement ‘find’, which they take to be evidence that “their evaluative component is not based directly on personal experience” (2017: 29).

Shen-yi Liao and Aaron Meskin (2017) argue that aesthetic adjectives are semantically distinctive because they exhibit a strange sort of context-sensitivity. Standardly, gradable adjectives are classified as absolute or relative. Absolute adjectives—such as ‘straight’ or ‘spotted’—have their standards of application built in, and do not rely on the context to fix this threshold. By contrast, relative adjectives—such as ‘warm’ or ‘long’—do rely on a context for its threshold of application. Through a series of experiments involving a diagnostic used to classify gradable adjectives, Liao and Meskin found that aesthetic adjectives behaved like neither absolute nor relative adjectives. Participants were presented with pairs of objects and asked to pick out ‘the [adjective] one’. The key to this diagnostic is that ‘the’ implies both existence (there is at least one) and uniqueness (there is at most one). As such, most participants are unable to pick out the spotted disc when presented with two discs that are spotted to different degrees because ‘spotted’, as an absolute adjective, has a context-insensitive threshold of application which is met in both cases. By contrast, most participants are able to pick out the long rod when presented with two rods that are long to different degrees because ‘long’, as a relative adjective, has a threshold of application that is sensitive to the context. In particular, participants are able to construct an implicit comparison class using the context of application: they pick out the longer rod as ‘the long one’. However, Liao and Meskin found that about half of the participants use ‘beautiful’ like ‘spotted’ and about half of the participants use ‘beautiful’ like ‘long’. Moreover, the same pattern holds also for negative aesthetic adjectives like ‘ugly’ and thick aesthetic adjectives like ‘elegant’. These results are difficult to explain for the standard typology of gradable adjectives.

Stojanovic (2019) argues that Liao and Meskin’s results do not provide grounds for drawing any interesting conclusions regarding semantic adjectives because the studies do not reveal a stable pattern. The 50/50 pattern in response to the request to pick out the beautiful / ugly / elegant object is just what would be expected if participants were answering by chance. Liao, McNally, and Meskin (2016) conducted further experiments and corpus observations to show the instability of aesthetic adjectives’ behaviors. On some diagnostics they pattern with absolute adjectives, but on other diagnostics they pattern with relative adjectives. In response to these results, they propose a different hypothesis: aesthetic adjectives are like relative adjectives insofar as both involve implicit comparison classes, but unlike relative adjectives insofar as their implicit comparison classes are not determined by the immediate context of application.

Where the studies described above have attempted to treat aesthetic adjectives as a homogeneous and sui generis class, more recent studies have pointed to important sources of heterogeneity amongst them. ‘Beautiful’ and ‘pretty’ are similar adjectives in that they can both express certain descriptive contents—namely, that an appearance is intrinsically pleasing, or that it is, for example, delicate, small, and soft. But they differ insofar as prettiness is thought to be more closely tied to appearances and less important than beauty. In trying to account for this patterning, Doran (forthcoming a) suggests that BEAUTY but not PRETTINESS is a dual-character concept, and that in addition to the descriptive senses they share, BEAUTY has a normative sense connected to our most cherished values, including, most prominently, moral goodness. In support of this claim, in one of the studies reported, he shows that ‘beauty’ but not ‘prettiness’ is judged to be able to felicitiously combine with the ‘true’ modifier, which is thought to be one source of evidence that the concept expressed by a given lexical item is dual-character (Knobe et al. 2013). “That is true beauty” sounds perfectly natural to native speakers of English, but “That is true prettiness” sounds decidedly odd.

6. Morality and Aesthetics

Morality and aesthetics stand as two prominent normative domains. How do the concerns in these two domains interact with one another? Drawing from a substantive philosophical literature on these interactions (see Harold 2023 for overviews), topics at the intersection have also been empirically investigated in recent years. Here, we roughly divide works into two aspects: concerning morality’s influence on aesthetics, and concerning aesthetics’ influence on morality.

In the first direction, concerning morality’s influence on aesthetics, philosophers have wondered about the influence of moral attitudes on aesthetic attitudes. In traditional philosophical aesthetics, this is sometimes known as the “value interaction” or “ethical criticism of art” debate (Clavel Vázquez 2018; Giovanelli 2007; Liao & Meskin 2018; McGregor 2014). There are three main positions: autonomists say that moral attitudes do not influence aesthetic attitudes; moralists say that negative moral judgments always negatively influence aesthetic judgments; and contextualists say that moral attitudes’ influence on aesthetic attitudes depends on the context.

This direction of value interaction might affect taste perception. Patrik Sörqvist and colleagues (2013) found that, between two qualitatively identical cups of coffee, participants whose attitudes are congruent with sustainability rated the one labeled as “eco-friendly” as tastier. However, Aaron Meskin and Shen-yi Liao (2018) were unable to conceptually replicate this result. Similarly, Beth Armstrong and colleagues (2019) found that the valence of ethical information affected consumers’ expected experience of food. Taken together, these results suggest that a folk psychology of moralism or contextualism is currently more plausible than a folk psychology of autonomism.

This direction of value interaction might also affect judgments of beauty. One longstanding debate in this context surrounds whether moral goodness can be beautiful in itself—with philosophers such as Plato (c. 370 BCE) and Shaftesbury (1711) claiming that moral beauty exists, and others such as Edmund Burke (1757) and Immanuel Kant (1790) denying this (though see Doran forthcoming d). Until recently, one of the principal ways that philosophers have tried to settle this matter is by examining the use of ordinary language from the armchair. Berys Gaut (2007), for example, argues in favor of the existence of moral beauty principally by noting that we call people beautiful when they are good. Gaut argues that this kind of talk cannot be intended non-literally, as was suggested by Burke (1757), as neither of the two defeators of literal use—obvious falsity (as in ‘my boss is a pig’) or trivial truthfulness (as in ‘I’m not over the moon’)—seem to apply to locutions that appear to express moral beauty. But as Ryan Doran (2021) notes, Gaut’s method of testing for non-literal use is too demanding, as it wrongly assumes that people are always truth-maximisers. To move past this apparent impasse from the armchair, and help to reveal the number of species of moral beauty that exist, Doran suggests that we turn to experimental studies. He shows that people tend to judge morally good people to be more beautiful, and that this cannot be deflated in terms of non-literal intent or an error (such as misattribution) on the grounds that making the source of the goodness salient, and giving people the opportunity to express their approval of the goodness prior to making the judgment of beauty, does not eliminate the effect of moral goodness on judgments of beauty. Doran also finds evidence that moral goodness can affect the beauty of physical appearances by affecting the determinants of thick aesthetic properties such as balance and delicacy, and that people’s moral character can be beautiful in itself, suggesting that beauty is not perception dependent.

Building on this work, experimental philosophy studies have also been used to help resolve apparent inconsistencies in the existing literature on which moral traits are beautiful, as well as reveal hitherto unacknowledged reasons why morally good traits and actions are beautiful, among other things.

Supporters of moral beauty can be divided into particularists about the beauty of traits—who tend to hold that only the ‘warmer’ virtues such as compassion are beautiful (for example, Kant 1764)—and universalists about moral beauty—who tend to argue that all virtues are beautiful, and indeed that certain colder non-moral traits such as intelligence can be beautiful too (Schiller 1793 [2003], 1793 [2005]; Gaut 2007; and Paris 2018).

Doran (2023) proposes that these positions only appear to be inconsistent with one another, as they range over different kinds of beauty: with universalists targeting the beauty that is found in good form, and particularists targeting the kind of beauty that lies in things that have a disposition to lead to an emotion that is variously described as ‘love,’ ‘elevation’ and ‘ecstasy’—which is characterized by feelings akin to being moved, inspired, and of unity with the object of this state. To test this view, he presented participants with a story about two individuals who are equally well-formed—in the sense that their mental states are all working harmoniously to lead them to do the right thing—but differ in the kind of virtue they exhibit, with one individual being just, and the other being compassionate. Consistent with the idea that there is a beauty in some traits which resides in the disposition to give rise to this special emotion in addition to well-formedness, participants found the fully just and fully compassionate individuals to be equally virtuous and good, but the latter to be more beautiful to the extent that this individual tended to give rise to this special emotion to a greater extent.

Examining the link between internal harmony and beauty more explicitly, Doran (forthcoming b) has tested the idea—which is most prominently found in Friedrich Schiller’s On Grace & Dignity (1793 [2005]) and Kallias (1793 [2002])—that actions are beautiful if and only if they are expressive of freedom by being the result of a high degree of internal harmony, as in cases where our desires, beliefs, and will all seamlessly work together to produce the good action. While Doran finds some evidence which is consistent with actions being beautiful to the extent that they are expressive of freedom by being the result of a high degree of internal harmony, his results also suggest that the moral actions of conflicted individuals can be as beautiful, or even more beautiful, as those of internally harmonious moral agents, and so Schiller’s claim need to be weakened and supplemented with additional claims. In one experiment, for example, participants were presented with two individuals who both do the right and good action in making necessary redundancies and giving financial support to those affected, where the only difference is that where one individual makes the redundancies without any internal conflict, the other does so with a great deal of conflict due to a reluctance to afflict the necessary suffering. Consistent with his earlier findings, the results show that the latter individual’s action is considered to be more beautiful, and that this is due to the latter individual’s tendency to move us, and make us feel at one with them. As such, Doran suggests that it is not only the internal harmony of the agent who performs an action that determines its beauty, but also the degree to which the action tends to make us feel as though we are harmoniously related to the agent that performs the action. Further elucidating some of the reasons why morally good actions can be beautiful, Doran (forthcoming c) finds that people tend to think that morally good actions are beautiful when the action is seen as expressing who the person truly is (their essence), and as stemming from a location deep inside of them, and in turn tends to lead to feelings of being moved and inspired.

Imagination may play an especially important role in mediating moral attitudes’ influence on aesthetic attitudes. Imaginative resistance refers to the phenomenon in which “an otherwise competent imaginer finds it difficult to engage in some sort of prompted imaginative activity” (Gendler & Liao 2016: 405; see also Miyazono & Liao 2016). Imaginative resistance is puzzling because imagination is standardly unconstrained. Typically, a competent imaginer finds no difficulty in imagining factual deviations, such as a fictional world in which humans and dragons co-exist. However, it has been hypothesized that imaginative activities that involve moral deviations are especially prone to evoke imaginative resistance (Gendler 2000, 2006). For example, it has been suggested that a fictional world in which female infanticide is morally right is likely to evoke imaginative resistance (Walton 1994). Philosophers disagree about many aspects of imaginative resistance, such as: whether the resistance is special to imagining moral deviations, whether the resistance reflects an intrinsic limitation of imagination, and indeed, whether the phenomenon is real in the first place. Experimental philosophers and psychologists have sought to bring systematic empirical evidence to help resolve these disagreements.

As an early example of this kind of work, Liao, Strohminger, and Sripada (2014) conducted two studies on imaginative resistance and its driving factors. In the first study, they asked participants to engage with a story in the style of Greek myths, in which it is morally right to trick a person into entering a romantic relationship. They found evidence for imaginative resistance being a real phenomenon: the extent to which this fictional world is counter to participants’ moral attitude is correlated with the extent of their self-reported imaginative difficulty. However, they also found evidence against the resistance reflecting an intrinsic limitation of imagination: the extent to which participants are familiar with the genre conventions of Greek myths is also correlated with the extent of their self-reported imaginative difficulty. In the second study, they presented a fictional world in which it is morally right to sacrifice an infant, but varied the genre of the story such that some participants engaged with a story in the style of police procedurals but others engaged with a story in the style of Aztec myths. Sure enough, participants do have a harder time accepting that infant sacrifice really is morally right in the police procedural world, but an easier time accepting the same for the Aztec myth world. This contrast found in this study (replicated by Mark Phelan and colleagues in Cova, Strickland, et al. 2021) lends further support to the reality and the non-intrinsicality of imaginative resistance.

Subsequent investigations by other philosophers and psychologists have found additional support for the reality of imaginative resistance and further uncovered its contours. Jessica E. Black and Jennifer L. Barnes (2017) have designed and validated a scale for measuring imaginative resistance. With this scale, they have also found that participants do experience imaginative resistance in response to moral deviance, albeit with contextual and individual variations (Barnes & Black 2016; Black & Barnes 2020). However, Hanna Kim, Markus Kneer, and Mike Stuart (2019) found that the resistance is not special to imagining moral deviations. Instead, imaginative resistance reflects the “weirdness” of the claim that participants are asked to imagine, which is itself an amalgam of three factors: unusualness, counterfactuality, and surprisingness. Morally deviant claims, as a class, are not necessarily more weird than factually deviant claims, as a class. Moreover, given that surprisingness is a component, weirdness depends on expectations which might be modified by genre expectations and other contextual factors. Dylan Campbell, William Kidder, Jason D’Cruz, and Brendan Gaesser (2021) found that the resistance does not reflect an intrinsic limitation of imagination. Instead, imaginative resistance reflects individual differences in emotional reactivity: participants who experience less negative affect in response to harms also experience less difficulty in imagining moral deviance.

In the second direction, concerning aesthetics’ influence on morality, philosophers have also wondered about the influence of aesthetic attitudes on moral attitudes. This direction comes up too, albeit much more rarely, in the “value interaction” debate (Harold 2006; Stecker 2005). In psychology, however, aesthetic attitudes’ influence on moral attitudes has been systematically studied in an extensive literature on the beauty-is-good stereotype (Dion et al. 1972; compare the metaanalyses in Eagly et al. 1991 and Langlois et al. 2000). Roughly, the idea is that positive aesthetic judgments always positively influence moral judgments of persons. This stereotype holds in a surprisingly wide variety of domains, such as pedagogy and politics.

Philosophers have been equivocal in their answer to the question of whether aesthetic appreciation has a salubrious effect on us morally. Cynics about beauty have suggested that appreciating beauty might have a corrupting influence. J. Robert Loftis (2003), for example, suggests that beauty might lead us to focus on the superficial, “skin deep”, features of the world. But some philosophers have been more sanguine about the prospect of moral cultivation via beauty. Plato, in the Symposium, suggests that the appreciation of physical beauties leads to the appreciation of non-perceptual kinds of goodness; and Kant (1785) suggests that a love of natural beauty in particular is a “mark of the good soul”, and indicates that a person is susceptible to the “moral feeling”. Since this issue is an empirical one to an important extent, it is perhaps no surprise that experimental philosophers and empirical aestheticians have entered the fray. Providing correlational support for the optimistic view, Diessner et al. (2013) found that the tendency to be sensitive to beauty (that is, to notice it, and be moved by it), and particularly sensitivity to natural beauty, was associated with the moral attitudes towards close and distant others (in line with Kant’s suggestion). Providing evidence of a causal relationship, appreciation of natural beauty has been found to lead to more morally admirable behavior (Zhang et al. 2014; see Silvers & Haidt 2008 and Landis et al. 2009 for evidence concerning the morally salubrious effects of appreciating moral beauty). In addition to this work on beauty, the moral effects of appreciating the sublime have been explored in the context of empirical work on the nature of awe (see Piff et al. 2015).

Philosophers have generally held two main positions about the role that something’s beauty can play in grounding moral standing. On the one hand, optimists about beauty have argued that beauty confers intrinsic moral standing—that is, beautiful things are worthy of protection independently of their relationship to humans and other animals (for example, G.E. Moore 1903; Routley, 1973). Pessimists about beauty, by contrast, think that beauty at best provides a non-intrinsic kind of moral standing, insofar as it is but one source of pleasure for humans (for example, Passmore 1974). Experimental philosophers and empirical aestheticians have recently tried to cast light on some of the mechanisms that might be involved in beauty’s effects on judgments of moral standing, with a view to interrogating its normative significance in some cases. Doran (2022), for example, argues that both the optimists and pessimists are incorrect. Across two studies with beautiful plants, he shows that to the extent that people tend to experience the beauty of plants—and in particular to the extent that they tend to feel moved and inspired by the beauty—they tend to judge that the plant can feel pain and has intrinsic moral standing. As such, he argues that the intuitions that optimists appeal to should be debunked, and that beauty tends to give rise to a state that is more valuable than mere pleasure, contra the pessimists. Investigating the issue through the lens of Moral Foundations Theory, Klebl and colleagues (2022) found that purity intuitions tend to underlie people’s willingness to protect beautiful things.

7. Emotion and Art

There is a rich set of puzzles in philosophical aesthetics concerning emotional responses to fictions, and here, both psychologists and experimental philosophers have made contributions, in some cases moving the debate beyond the standard philosophical concerns. Here we discuss a few of those that have received the most attention from philosophers: How can fiction elicit emotional responses when we know that the characters do not exist? If certain works of art, particularly music, can evoke negative emotions, like sadness, which we typically aim to avoid in everyday life, why do we pursue such experiences in art contexts? Moreover, how can music be expressive of emotions, if there is nobody in the music itself experiencing them?

The ‘paradox’ of fiction is motivated by the following observation: if we were to learn that events in life that make us feel sad have not in fact come to pass, our sadness would disappear. But the same is not true in art. I may know that Tolstoy’s Anna Karenina does not exist, and yet may feel sad reading about her fate in the novel (Radford & Weston 1975). With this in mind, the paradox of fiction has standardly been formulated as a trilemma of three individually plausible but mutually inconsistent claims (for example, Currie 1990):

  1. We have emotional responses directed towards fictional entities and situations in literature and art;
  2. In order to have emotional responses we need to believe in the existence of the entities and situations that they are directed at;
  3. We do not believe in the existence of the fictional entities in literature and art.

Most philosophers have now jettisoned this paradoxical formulation, by rejecting proposition (2). But, even if there is no paradox per se, philosophers have noted that interesting questions remain here: Do our emotional responses to fictions differ from their real-life cognates? And, if so, what might explain this? Do our emotional responses to fiction involve different mental representations, for example? And are any differences that exist sufficient to constitute a different kind of emotional response?

In connection with this, some experimental philosophers have thought that the emotional responses that are had in response to fictional entities and events might differ in their intensity, as a result of differences in self-referential processes. Sperduti et al. (2016), for example, asked participants to watch clips of scenarios apt to elicit positive or negative emotions, or neutral video clips, presented as either mockumentaries (fiction), or documentaries or amateur films (non-fiction). Participants self-reported less intense emotions only in response to the negative clips when they were presented as fictions, and even here, there were no differences in the physiological responses (and specifically, in electrodermal activity). The authors interpret this as suggesting that the emotional responses to fiction are genuine emotions, on the grounds that there are no physiological differences, but that appraisals of fictionality might nonetheless cause people to psychologically distance themselves from the content (for discussion, see Pelletier 2019). Humbert-Droz et al. (2020), by contrast, found that longer clips of sad scenes lead to lower skin conductance when labeled as non-fictional versus fictional, as well as greater self-reports of sadness—suggesting that believing that the clip was real led to greater sadness. Given the mixed findings in this context, the issues of whether the emotions that we feel in response to fiction differ from those we feel in non-fictional contexts, and if so why, remain open questions.

The paradox of negative emotion (Hume 1757b), has intrigued philosophers since the time of Aristotle: why do we seek exposure to art arousing negative emotions if negative emotions is something that we tend to avoid in our everyday life? One important example is listening to sad music, which is often thought to evoke sad mood in listeners (though for dissent, see Kivy 1990). There is vast psychological literature on emotional responses to music that are relevant to this philosophical discussion (see Mitterschiffthaler et al. 2007; Juslin & Västfjäll 2008; Vuoskoski & Eerola 2012; Koelsch, 2014; Peltola & Eerola 2016; Juslin 2019), and it has received some attention from experimental philosophers as well.

Mario Attie-Picker and colleagues (2024) tested the hypothesis that people choose to listen to sad music because of the emotions music is expressive of: listening to sad music allows people to feel more connected. In the first study, participants were presented with vignettes describing musical pieces with differing levels of musical proficiency and emotional expressiveness. They were then asked to what extent they agreed that the described piece of music was good and embodied the essence of what music is ‘all about’. The results revealed that emotional expressiveness, more so than technical proficiency, influenced judgments on what are the characteristic values of music. In the second study, participants were asked to complete sentences about (a) the characteristic values of music, (b) feeling connected in conversations, and (c) pleasantness of music. They found an overlap between the emotions people listed as embodying what music is “all about” and the emotions that make people feel connected in conversations. Attie-Picker and colleagues thus try to explain the paradox by shifting the focus away from the traditional emphasis on the listener’s felt emotions and instead centering it on emotions one perceives in music.

The paradox of emotional expressiveness is related not to the emotions we feel when we listen to music, but rather emotions we hear in the music itself. In our everyday conversations, we often characterize music as joyful, sad or angry. We use those terms when discussing a piece of music—an entity that does not have mental states and is incapable of experiencing emotions.

One way to empirically study the relationship between music and emotional expressiveness is through cross-cultural research. Psychological literature suggests that cross-cultural recognition of emotions in music is quite limited. Some studies have shown that the list of cross-culturally recognizable emotions in music is limited to three basic emotions of happiness, sadness and fear (Fritz et al. 2009). Other studies suggest that even major and minor chords may not, after all, be universally associated with happiness and sadness (Lahdelma et al. 2021; Smit et al. 2022). However, at least aversion to dissonant musical chords appears to be cross-cultural (Lahdelma et al., 2021).

The question of cross-cultural recognizably has also been tackled in Constant Bonard’s experimental philosophy paper (2019). Bonard argues that the affective meaning of a musical piece depends on musical grammar, as there is an overlap of cognitive mechanisms constituting the capacity for language and capacity for music. According to him, listeners familiar with certain musical idioms and grammatical organizations are better able to perceive the affective meaning of a piece. Bonard presented his participants in Geneva and India with excerpts from Western classical music, South Indian music, as well as a set of atonal melodies that do not belong to either of these cultures. They were asked to identify musical excerpts that do not correspond to musical grammatical rules. For both Indian and Western participants, the Western and atonal (but not Indian) stimuli were easier to encode for those familiar with the musical idiom. Participants were also asked to listen to musical extracts and continually rate how much the music expressed a given emotion. The study confirmed that participants were better at recognizing the affective dimension of music that originated from their region. Taken together, these studies present tentative evidence that the recognition of emotions in music may depend on familiarity with local musical grammar rules (for more readings on musical semantics, also see Schlenker 2017, 2019, 2022).

The topic of art and emotion induction may also be relevant to discussions on art and morality. Angelika Seidel and Jesse Prinz (2013b) found that music can be used to induce positive or negative emotions, which in turn modifies moral evaluations. Roughly, happy music increases judgments of goodness, and angry music increases judgments of wrongness. Seidel and Prinz (2013a) further discovered that different negative musically-induced emotions, anger and disgust, can impact the severity of different kinds of moral judgments. A more complex result comes from Ansani and colleagues (2024), which shows that musical expertise is likely to lead to more individualizing moral foundations as opposed to binding ones.

8. Methodological Debates

Throughout this entry, we have generally focused on recent empirical research done by philosophers on topics in philosophy of art and aesthetics. However, this scope is admittedly arbitrary. As noted at the start, the research program that we have surveyed is continuous with empirical aesthetics in psychology, and comes from a long historical tradition that encompasses both philosophy and psychology. The principal reasons to draw boundaries are pragmatic ones.

Like other branches of experimental philosophy, experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics involves gathering data using empirical methods and bringing analyses of the data to bear on philosophical theorizing. As a matter of general fact, research in experimental philosophy is relatively replicable (Cova, Strickland, et al. 2021), and relatively free of scientific misconduct such as p-hacking (Stuart, Colaço, & Machery 2019). While experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics is bolstered by this general track record, it also inherits a number of methodological challenges from experimental philosophy and related areas of psychology regarding instruments, samples, and stimuli.

By far, the most common instrument used in experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics is—like other branches of experimental philosophy and related areas of psychology—the questionnaire. Participants’ responses are measured by their answers to questions posed by the researchers. Nick Zangwill (2019) expresses a general skepticism toward studies that use questionnaires, and criticizes experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics for its wide use of this specific measurement instrument. Drawing inspiration from Wittgenstein, Zangwill is pessimistic about the questionnaire’s attempt to use language to reveal agents’ thoughts generally. In addition, he is pessimistic about the questionnaire’s capacity to reveal agents’ normative judgments, such as judgments of beauty, as opposed to non-normative judgments, such as judgments of agreeableness. Zangwill’s critique could be taken as an invitation for experimental philosophers to explore methodological tools beyond the questionnaire. In fact, some philosophers have already experimented with eye movement tracking (Wright et al. 2019), virtual reality (Francis et al. 2016), electroencephalography (Bricker 2020), and corpus analysis (Liao, McNally, & Meskin 2016; McNally & Stojanovic 2017; Sytsma et al. 2019; Chartrand 2022; Doran, forthcoming a). Some of these or other proposed methods (see Fischer & Curtis 2019; Fischer & Sytsma 2023) might also enrich experimental aestheticians’ toolboxes.

The most common sample used in experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics is—once again, like other branches of experimental philosophy and related areas of psychology—WEIRD: participants from Western, Educated, Industrialized, Rich, and Democratic countries (Henrich, Heine, & Norenzayan 2010). Whether responses from these WEIRD participants are representative of people in general remains an open question. Within experimental philosophy (and related areas in psychology), there is an ongoing debate about the legitimacy of making theoretical generalizations based on empirical results from WEIRD samples (for criticisms, see Stich & Machery 2023 and Peters & Lemeire 2024; for defenses, see Knobe 2019, 2021). Clearly, this ongoing debate impacts the evidentiary value of existing research in experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics as well.

That said, it is important to highlight a couple of cross-cultural works in experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics. In one work, Florian Cova, Christopher Olivola, and colleagues (2019) extend Cova’s earlier research on the intersubjective validity of aesthetic judgments to a sample that includes participants from 19 countries on four continents. Across six geographical areas (Europe, Middle East, Central and North America, South America, East Asia, and South and Southeast Asia), they found both variations and convergences in patterns of responses. While participants from East Asia tend to endorse ‘subjectivism’ about aesthetic judgments (when two people disagree, both can be correct), participants from other geographical areas tend to endorse ‘nihilism’ (when two people disagree, neither is correct or incorrect). At the same time, people everywhere tend to not endorse ‘realism’ (when two people disagree, at most one can be correct). In another work, Constant Bonard (2019) conducted studies in Switzerland and India to vindicate the hypothesis that musical idioms have grammatical structures. The grammar of Western classical music was found to be more recognizable to Switzerland participants than Indian participants, but no reverse asymmetry was found for South Indian classical music. Another study investigated aesthetic judgments of mathematical beauty between Chinese and British mathematicians and found that they do not seem to be strongly influenced by cultural differences (Sa et al. 2024). As things stand, these three cross-cultural works remain the exception, and not the norm, in experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics. The fact that the vast majority of work has been conducted with Western European and American samples is not dissimilar to the situation in empirical aesthetics (see Che, Sun, Gallardo, & Nadal 2018) or music cognition (see Jacoby et al 2020). As such, this is a problem that needs to be addressed in all fields that empirically study art and aesthetics.

In addition, samples used in experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics tend to be ordinary people with no special expertise in philosophy or the relevant arts. One criticism of experimental philosophy’s relevance for philosophical theorizing, commonly called the expertise objection, endorses privileging experts’ responses over ordinary people’s. While the existing debate primarily concerns the expertise of philosophers—insofar as the objectors privilege philosophers’ intuitions from thought experiments—in the domain of philosophy of art and aesthetics, expertise in the respective artforms might be relevant as well. Many psychology studies have shown differences between ordinary people and art experts in aesthetic judgments and preferences (Hekkert & Van Wieringen, 1996; Leder, Ring, & Dressler 2013), as well as emotional responses to art (Silvia 2013; Leder, Gerger, et al. 2014), and these differences are relevant to at least some of the topics experimental philosophers are interested in. As such, we want to highlight a few works in this domain that use experts as samples.

Three studies in experimental philosophy of aesthetics have compared expert and non-expert samples. In one empirical study based on moral foundations theory, Alessandro Ansani and colleagues (2024) found that musical experts tend to have a higher preference for individualizing moral foundations, Harm and Care. Elzė Mikalonytė and Vilius Dranseika (2020) compared intuitions on the individuation of musical works between musicians and non-musicians and found that although they tend to be similar, musicians’ intuitions are usually more pronounced. However, Mikalonytė and Dranseika (2022) found no notable differences between professional singers and orchestra musicians working in the opera and participants with no music education. Most of Richard Kamber’s (2011) study participants were art professionals or ‘art buffs’, so the study itself does not allow us to compare experts’ and non-experts’ responses. Kamber explains this methodological decision by stating that if there is a consensus between professional artists on what counts as art, philosophers are inclined to agree with professional artists.

In other branches of experimental philosophy, many studies rely on intuitions that arise from thought experiments. This is less so in experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics. Indeed, Cova and Réhault (2019b: 3) speculate that it is because intuitions play a much less prominent role in philosophical aesthetics that the field did not draw the initial attention of experimental philosophers. With that said, it is important to stress that there is variation with respect to this within this branch of experimental philosophy too. Emanuele Arielli (2018) distinguishes studies that solicit intuitions and other cognitive responses and studies that solicit aesthetic reactions and other perceptual and phenomenological responses. While critical of the former type of studies, he finds the latter type of studies more promising insofar as they are more continuous with empirical aesthetics in psychology.

Others have remarked on this difference between experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics and other branches of experimental philosophy. Clotilde Torregrossa (2020, 2024) argues that insofar as experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics is more reliant on reactions to aesthetic phenomena, standard objections against experimental philosophy that turn on the reliance on intuitions from thought experiments are less applicable. Jonathan Weinberg (2019) argues that the availability of artworks means that experimenters need not rely solely on descriptive vignettes. The presentation of actual artworks can fill in gaps that are usually left by the short textual vignettes that are typical of philosophical thought experiments. We should note, however, that in actuality such studies remain relatively rare (some examples are Kamber 2011; Meskin et al. 2013; Liao & Meskin 2017; Bonard 2019; Puy 2022; Mikalonytė & Canonne forthcoming).

There is ongoing debate about whether studies about music should depend on the use of acoustic stimuli. Building on Weinberg’s argument, Nemesio Puy (2022) contends that ontological judgments about artworks involve an aesthetic dimension and must therefore be grounded in the experience of real works of art. This contention receives indirect support from a study that shows people are generally unwilling to base their beliefs about aesthetic dimension of an artwork on testimony alone, without first-personal perceptual access (Andow 2019). Moreover, this contention receives direct support from two studies that show that the decision to include or exclude acoustic stimuli has an effect on the results of studies investigating ontological judgments, even if the descriptive part of the stimuli is kept as consistent as possible (Puy 2022; Mikalonytė & Canonne forthcoming). Notwithstanding this, Elzė Mikalonytė (forthcoming) points out several reasons why purely textual vignettes are so widely used and might not always be easily replaceable. Such vignettes might help the participants to focus on the most relevant aspects and filter out irrelevant factors. In fact, additional perceptual information may actually distract participants, as may occur, for example, in making judgments in the ontology of art, which arguably should be made on the basis of conceptual rather than perceptual information (such as information about the artist’s intentions). Especially in the case of music, presenting the participants with short descriptions without corresponding works of music might help to avoid relying on sustained attention over extended periods of time.

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Acknowledgments

All authors contributed to this entry equally. Work on this entry was supported by grant TRT-2021-10448 from the Templeton Religion Trust; and grants CEX2021-001169-M (funded by MICIU/AEI/10.13039/501100011033/), PID2023-150569NB-I00 and RYC2023-045407-I from the Ministerio de Ciencia e Innovación de España.

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Elzė Sigutė Mikalonytė <esm53@cam.ac.uk>
Ryan Doran <ryan.p.doran@ub.edu>
Shen-yi Liao <liao.shen.yi@gmail.com>

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