Feminist Philosophy of Language

First published Fri Sep 3, 2004; substantive revision Fri Jul 4, 2025

Feminist philosophy of language has come a long way in a very short time period. Initially, most work in the area was critical, calling for changes either to language itself or to philosophy of language. More recently, however, the dynamic has changed, with the advent of several major positive research programmes within philosophy of language. In this entry, we first discuss the critiques that constitute the first phase of feminist work in this area, before moving onto the positive research programmes that have recently come to the fore. Our focus in this entry will generally be on the analytic tradition. For continental approaches, see the entries on feminist approaches to the intersection of analytic and continental philosophy, feminist approaches to the intersection of pragmatism and continental philosophy.

1. Early work on language and philosophy of language

1.1 False gender-neutrality

One of the earliest issues that feminists writing about language discussed was the supposedly gender-neutral use of terms like ‘he’ and ‘man’. It is commonly said that these terms have both gender-specific meanings, as in sentences (1) and (2), and gender-neutral ones, as in sentences (3) and (4).

He drank the wine.
A man went into a bar.
When a student comes into the room, he should pick up a handout.
Man is a primate.

Feminists, however, have pointed out that even the supposed gender-neutral meanings of these terms are not really gender-neutral. Janice Moulton (1981a) and Adele Mercier (1995) provide examples in which there is no doubt that a gender-neutral meaning is intended, but this meaning seems unavailable. As a result, the sentences seem ill-formed:

Man has two sexes; some men are female.
Man breastfeeds his young.

We are, then, making a classificatory error if we claim that ‘man’ and ‘he’ are gender-neutral terms. In order to avoid such a classificatory error, we need to do more careful work on what the meanings of these terms actually are. Perhaps the meaning of ‘he’ that has been called ‘gender-neutral’ is not really gender-neutral, but something much more complex. Mercier suggests, for example, that we should understand the ‘gender-neutral’ use of ‘man’ as referring to either (a) a person or persons of unknown sex; or (b) males or a combination of males and females. This explains why ‘men’ in (5) and ‘man’ in (6) are anomalous: these terms are being used to refer exclusively to persons known to be female.

The supposed ‘gender-neutral’ meaning of these terms, then, is not truly gender neutral. But, on its own, this does not show that there is a problem with those uses that have traditionally been classified as gender-neutral, as in sentences (3) and (4). (Discovering that we have misclassified an adjective as an adverb would not show anything wrong with actual uses of the term in question.) Further reasons are needed in order to object to the use that is made of these terms.

1.2 Invisibility of women

Feminist concerns, however, go beyond mere classificatory ones. Feminists have also argued that terms like ‘he’ and ‘man’ contribute to making women invisible—that is, to obscuring women’s importance, and distracting attention from their existence. Fighting the invisibility of women is an important feminist project in many areas, and language that makes one less likely to think of women clearly contributes to this invisibility. (See, for example, analytic feminism; feminist perspectives on the self; feminist ethics; and feminist history of philosophy.) There is good psycholinguistic evidence that those who encounter sentences (like (3) and (4)) using the terms ‘he’ and ‘man’ think more readily of males than of females. (See, for example, Erlich & King 1998: 168; Gastil 1990; Martyna 1978; Moulton, Robinson, & Elias 1978; Wilson & Ng 1988.) There have been some criticisms of this research in Cole, Hill, & Dayley 1983. But see also the response to these criticisms in Gastil 1990. If this is right, then the use of these words can be seen as contributing to the invisibility of women. This gives feminists a good reason to object to the ‘gender-neutral’ use of these terms. (For more on these issues see Cameron 1985, 2023; McConnell-Ginet 2020.)

1.3 Maleness as norm

If one’s only worry concerned the obscuring of women’s presence, however, it would be difficult to object to certain other terms to which feminists do commonly object: gender-specific occupational terms like ‘manageress’ (used until recent decades in the UK) or ‘lady doctor,’ sometimes called ‘feminitives’ in comparative linguistics when the occupational term in question is designated female as with the previous examples (see Pulijana and Stevens 2023). These terms certainly do not contribute to the invisibility of women. Instead, they call attention to the presence of women. Moreover, they call attention to women’s presence in positions of authority—doctor and manager. Nonetheless, most feminists who think about language find these terms objectionable. See Pulijana and Stevens 2023 for an argument that feminitives like ‘manageress’ are both useful when it comes to the semantic exclusion of women, and harmful insofar as they pragmatically reinforce presuppositions about gender.

The clearest reason for objecting to ‘manageress’ and ‘lady doctor’ is that the use of these terms seems premised on the idea that maleness is the norm, and that women filling these jobs are somehow deviant versions of doctors and managers. This is also a key objection to the use of ‘he’ and ‘man’. Moulton (1981a) understands these terms on the model of brand names, like ‘Kleenex,’ ‘Velcro,’ ‘Hoover’ (UK) or ‘Scotch tape’ that become generic terms for a product type. The message of such terms, she suggests, is that the brand in question is the best, or at least the norm. According to Moulton, terms like ‘he’ and ‘man’ work in the same manner: they are gender-specific terms for men whose use has been extended to cover both men and women. This, Moulton argues, carries the message that maleness is the norm. As a result, the use of these terms as if they were gender neutral constitutes a sort of symbolic insult to women. Laurence Horn and Steven R. Kleinedler (2000) have disputed the details of this, noting that ‘man’ did not begin its life as gender-specific and then get extended to cover both women and men. Rather, ‘man’ actually began its life as ‘mann’, a gender-neutral term, which only later acquired a gender-specific meaning. The temporal sequence, then, cannot support the claim that a gender-specific term has been extended to cover both genders. Nonetheless, Horn and Kleinedler agree that the use of terms like ‘he’ and ‘man’ as if they were gender-neutral perpetuates the objectionable idea that men are the norm for humanity. (For a recent discussion of this, see McConnell-Ginet 2020.)

1.4 Sex-marking

English, like most—but not all—languages, requires a great deal of what Marilyn Frye calls ‘sex marking’ (Frye 1983). For example, one cannot use pronouns to refer to a particular individual without knowing their sex. (Frye, in common with most feminists of the early 1980s, does not consider trans issues. She also does not consider the possibility that pronouns like ‘he’ and ‘she’ might be a matter of gender, not sex.) Frye notes the absurdity of this.

If I am writing a book review, the use of personal pronouns to refer to the author creates the need to know whether that person’s reproductive cells are the sort which produce ova or the sort which produce sperm. (Frye 1983: 22)

Singular personal pronoun usage, Frye argues, is impossible without knowing the sex of the person one is discussing, and in many cases sex would otherwise be utterly irrelevant. Frye takes this to be an instance of a general tendency to make sex relevant where it need not be, which she takes to be a key feature of sexism. In addition, she suggests, the constant need to know and indicate sex helps to perpetuate the conviction that sex is a tremendously important matter in all areas. For Frye, this is a key factor in perpetuating male dominance: male dominance requires the belief that men and women are importantly different from each other, so anything that contributes to the impression that sex differences are important is therefore a contributor to male dominance. In more recent literature, the concerns stemming from this earlier work are taken up by the literature on gender marking, discussed in 2.1.

1.5 Maleness of Language

Some feminists (e.g., Penelope 1990; Spender 1985) argue that English is, in some quite general sense, male. (Corresponding arguments are also put forward about other languages. See, for example, Irigaray 1989/1978.) One thing that is meant by this is that English can be said to be male in a manner similar to that in which particular terms can be said to be male—by encoding a male worldview, by helping to subordinate women or to render them invisible, or by taking males as the norm. One sort of argument for this begins from the examination of large quantities of specific terms, and the identification of patterns of male bias, and proceeds from this to the conclusion that the male bias of English is so widespread that it is a mistake to locate the problem in a collection of words, rather than in the language as a whole. The first stage of this sort of argument is, obviously, a lengthy and complex one. The sorts of claims cited (in addition to those we have already seen) include (a) that there are more words for males than for females in English, and that more of these words are positive (Spender 1985: 15, citing Julia Stanley 1977); (b) that a “word for women assume[s] negative connotations even where it designated the same state or condition as it did for men” (Spender 1985: 17), as with ‘spinster’ and ‘bachelor’; (c) that words for women are far more frequently sexualized than words for men, and that this holds true even for neutral words, when they are applied to women. Dale Spender, citing Lakoff (1975), discusses the example of ‘professional’, comparing ‘he’s a professional’ and ‘she’s a professional’, and noting that the latter is far more likely than the former to be taken to mean that the person in question is a sex worker. The sexualisation of words for women is considered especially significant by the many feminists who take sexual objectification to be a crucial element, if not the root, of inequalities between women and men. (For more on such examples, see also Baker 1975.)

This widespread encoding of male bias in language is, according to theorists like Spender, just what we should expect. Males (though not, as she notes, all of them) have had far more power in society, and this, she claims has included the power to enforce their view of the world through language. Moreover, she argues, this has served to enhance their power.

There is sexism in language, it does enhance the position of males, and males have had control over the production of cultural forms. (Spender 1985: 144)

This, Spender claims, provides circumstantial evidence that “males have encoded sexism into language to consolidate their claims of male supremacy” (Spender 1985: 144). Spender takes the evidence for this claim to be far more than circumstantial, however, and to support it she discusses the efforts of prescriptive grammarians. These include, for example, the claim that males should be listed before females because “the male gender was the worthier gender” (Spender 1985: 147, emphasis hers), and the efforts (noted earlier) to establish ‘he’ as the gender-neutral third-person English pronoun.

According to theorists like Spender, men’s ability to control language gives them great power indeed. We have already seen ways in which what one might call the maleness of language contributes to the invisibility of women (with respect to words like ‘he’ and ‘man’). If one takes the maleness of language to go beyond a few specific terms, one will take language’s power to make women invisible to be even stronger. We have also seen ways that what might be called maleness can make it more difficult for women to express themselves. Where we lack words for important female experiences, like sexual harassment, women will find it more difficult to describe key elements of their existence. Similarly, where the words we have—like ‘foreplay’—systematically distort women’s experiences, women will have a difficult time accurately conveying the realities of their lives. If one takes such problems to go beyond selected particular terms, and to infect language as a whole, it is natural to suppose that women are to a large degree silenced—unable to accurately articulate key elements of their lives, and unable to communicate important aspects of their thoughts.Spender and others also suggest that the maleness of language constrains thought, imposing a male worldview on all of us, and making alternative visions of reality impossible, or at least very difficult to articulate. These arguments often draw upon the so-called Sapir-Whorf hypothesis (Sapir 1921; Whorf 1956). It is generally formulated very vaguely, but seems to amount to roughly the hypothesis that “our worldview is determined by the structures of the particular language that we happen to speak” (Cameron 1998b: 150). (There is substantial controversy about what this means, and about the accuracy of attributing it to either Sapir or Whorf, but this controversy is not very relevant to the present entry.)

Some suggest that male power over language allows men to shape not just thought, but also reality. For example, Spender claims that men “created language, thought, and reality” (1985: 143). This is a very strong version of what Haslanger has called discursive constructivism. For more on discursive constructivism, see also the section on Feminist Postmodernism in the entry on feminist epistemology and philosophy of science. She defines this view as follows:

Something is discursively constructed just in case it is the way it is, to some substantial extent, because of what is attributed (and/or self-attributed) to it. (Haslanger 1995: 99)

Feminists like Spender and Catherine MacKinnon (1989) argue that male power over language has allowed them to create reality. This is partly due to the fact that our categorizations of reality inevitably depend on our social perspective: “there is no ungendered reality or ungendered perspective” (MacKinnon 1989: 114). Haslanger (1995) discusses this argument in detail.

In general, the solution suggested is not to attempt to create a neutral language. Instead, we must aim to create a new reality more congenial to women. Some feminists have argued that the only way to achieve this is for women to create their own language, either by redefining terms already in use, or by inventing a new language, with new words and new rules. Only in this way, they suggest, will women be able to break free from the constraints of male language and male thought, to articulate a competing vision for the world, and to work toward it (Daly and Caputi 1987; Elgin 1985; MacKinnon 1989; Penelope 1990; Spender 1985). Lynne Tirrell (1993) offers an especially sophisticated and complex discussion of this idea. She does this by introducing a notion of ‘semantic authority’ and using it to argue for a kind of separatism that would allow women to recreate and redefine a world that had previously been defined for them by men. Tirrell argues that definition and redefinition, which are sources of semantic authority, happen in community: through the creation of community, community recognition of authority and value, and authorship of oneself as a member of a community that supports and recognizes that self-authorship (p.10). Separatist communities also provide frameworks that allow for self-articulation and uptake: they allow, for example, a “community-supported interpretation” of a woman’s articulation of her own marital rape, in contrast to a patriarchal legal and social system that denies this self-articulation by making marital rape “an oxymoron” (p.14). Separatist communities thus grant semantic authority and provide linguistic frameworks that allow women to self-articulate, and define and create themselves in a way that oppressive “phallocratic” communities do not allow for (p. 14).

The claims discussed above concerning the maleness of English, its causes, and its effects, are far from uncontentious. First, the extent of male bias in language is debatable. Although it is right that there is much to worry feminists about a wide variety of specific terms and usages, it is far from clear that it is appropriate to claim that English is male-biased in some sweeping sense. It is also unclear exactly what the claim being made is. If this claim is taken to be that every term is male-biased, then it is highly implausible: it is very unlikely that there is a male bias present in ‘piano’ or ‘isotope’. If the claim is simply that there is much for feminists to object to, then it is almost certainly right—but it is far from obvious that it is useful to focus on such a general claim rather than on specific problems, their complexities and their possible solutions (Cameron 1998b).

Next, the power that men have undeniably exercised in society (though, importantly, some groups of men have been vastly less powerful than others) by no means translates to a general power over language. Language is a difficult thing to control, as those who have attempted to create languages have learned. The main power men have had has concerned dictionaries, usage guides, and laws. While these are enormously important in shaping reality, and in shaping our thoughts, it is quite a leap to move from this power to the claim that men ‘created language, thought, and reality’.

The claimed effects of the maleness of language are also problematic. We have already seen problems for the idea that men control language. The idea that men also control or create thought and reality faces further problems. The ability of feminists to successfully point out ways in which elements of language have obscured women’s experiences counts strongly against the claim that men control thought (Cameron 1998b); and, as Haslanger (1995) has argued in detail, discursive constructivism about reality is unsustainable. Nonetheless, it does seem right to notice that problems with specific terms can render it more difficult for women to communicate about important elements of their lives, and probably also more difficult to reflect upon these elements (Hornsby 1995). These difficulties could perhaps be described as partial silencing, partial constraint of thought, or hermeneutical injustice (Fricker 2007). (We discuss silencing and hermeneutical injustice in more detail in Section 2.)

If the criticisms above are right, then women certainly do not need to create their own language. Many welcome this conclusion, worried that a women’s language would doom women’s thoughts to marginality and impede feminist progress. Moreover, the idea that women could craft a common language that allowed the articulation of all their experiences seems to ignore the fact that women differ enormously from one another (Crenshaw 1991; Lugones and Spelman 1983; Spelman 1988; see the section on feminism and the diversity of women in the entry on feminist philosophy). If women cannot use the same language as men, why should we suppose that women can successfully share a language?

The idea that some terms encode a male worldview, however, has considerably more appeal than the idea that language as a whole is male. One thing that is meant by it is, roughly, that the meanings of certain terms seem to divide the world up in a way that is more natural for men than for women. Good examples of this come from the terms ‘foreplay’ and ‘sex’. ‘Sex’ is generally taken to refer to an act that is defined in terms of male orgasm, while the sexual activities during which many women have their orgasms are relegated to secondary status, referred to by terms like ‘foreplay’. These terms, then, can be seen as based in a male perspective on sex. (It is worth noting that the ‘male perspective’ claim need not rest on the (implausible) idea that this perspective is shared by all men. Rather, it can rest on claims about what is typical for men, or on the claim that the only perspective from which certain understandings make sense is a male one.) As a result, these terms may serve as a barrier to accurate communication or even thought about women’s experiences of sex (Cameron 1985; Moulton 1981b; Spender 1980 [1985]). Catharine MacKinnon and Sally Haslanger also discuss legal definitions of ‘rape’ as (among other things) involving more than ‘the normal level of force’, an understanding that seems committed to the idea that some level of force is acceptable in sexual relations (Haslanger 1995: 109; MacKinnon 1989: 173).

Languages may also lack words for things that matter a great deal to women. This sort of gap is another way that a language can be seen as encoding a male worldview. The term ‘sexual harassment’, for example, is a recent feminist innovation. Women’s discussion of their experiences led them to see a certain common element to many of their problems, and as a result they invented the term ‘sexual harassment’. Once the problem was named, it became much easier to fight sexual harassment, both legally and by educating people about it (Farley 1978; Spender 1985).

Miranda Fricker (2007) calls gaps such as that before the invention of the term ‘sexual harassment’ a form of hermeneutical injustice. Roughly speaking, this is what occurs when “some significant area of one’s social experience [is] obscured from collective understanding owing to” (2007: 155) a gap in communal linguistic/conceptual resources that is more damaging to those from a socially disadvantaged group (to which one belongs). In her Epistemic Injustice, Fricker connects this up with issues in both ethics and epistemology, especially epistemology of testimony. We discuss this more fully in 2.5, below.

1.6 Metaphor

Feminists have also devoted attention to another aspect of language—the use of metaphor (see the section Feminist Critiques and Conceptions of Objectivity in the entry on feminist epistemology and philosophy of science; and the entry on feminist approaches to the intersection of pragmatism and continental philosophy). In particular, feminists have discussed the use of gendered metaphors in philosophy and in science. Emily Martin (1991 [1996]) offers particularly vivid examples in her discussion of the use of gendered metaphors in discussions of human reproduction.

At its extreme, the age-old relationship of the egg and the sperm takes on a royal or religious patina. The egg coat, its protective barrier, is sometimes called its ‘vestments’, a term usually reserved for sacred, religious dress. The egg is said to have a ‘corona’, a crown, and to be accompanied by ‘attendant cells’. It is holy, set apart and above, the queen to the sperm’s king. The egg is also passive, which means it must depend on the sperm for rescue. Gerald Schatten and Helen Schatten liken the egg’s role to that of Sleeping Beauty: ‘a dormant bride awaiting her mate’s magic kiss, which instills the spirit that brings her to life’. Sperm, by contrast, have a ‘mission’ which is to ‘move through the female genital tract in quest of the ovum’. One popular account has it that the sperm carry out a ‘perilous journey’ into the ‘warm darkness’, where some fall away ‘exhausted’. ‘Survivors’ ‘assault’ the egg, the successful candidates ‘surrounding the prize’… (Martin 1996: 106)

The vision of reproduction suggested above is an inaccurate one. The sperm fails to behave in the single-minded manner suggested. Instead, the

sideways motion of the sperm’s tail makes the head move sideways with a force that is ten times stronger than its forward movement…in fact, its strongest tendency, by tenfold, is to escape by attempting to pry itself off the egg. (Martin 1996: 108)

Nor is the egg passive: adhesive molecules on its surface play a crucial role in overcoming the sperm’s tendency to pry itself away (Martin 1996: 108). Martin argues that scientists have been slow to discover these facts, partly due to the metaphors they employed; and that even as they have learned these facts they have been slow to update their metaphors. Gendered stereotypes, Martin suggests, can impair our understanding of reproduction—by leading scientists to employ misleading metaphors that conceal the truth. The use of gendered stereotypes in scientific imagery can also help to perpetuate damaging stereotypes, for example by reinforcing the tendency to see females as passive. Martin’s account has, however, been challenged by Paul Gross (1998), who argues that scientists were not nearly so slow to these discoveries as Martin claimed. If Gross is right, then the problematic metaphors did not affect scientists’ work in the ways suggested by Martin (though they do seem to have affected popular writing on the subject.)

Gendered metaphors have been used at many levels of discussion, including the most general. An important topic of feminist concern has been the historical tendency to conceive of the scientific endeavour in gendered ways. A particularly clear example comes from Francis Bacon, discussed by both Evelyn Fox Keller and Genevieve Lloyd:

For Bacon, the promise of science is expressed as ‘leading you to Nature with all her children to bind her to your service and make her your slave’. (Keller 1996: 36.)

The tendency to describe nature in feminine terms is a long-standing and widespread one, well-documented in Lloyd (1984). Lloyd links this to a tendency to describe reason and the mind as male, and to contrast these with supposedly feminine emotions and bodies. She argues that these metaphors play a powerful role in the history of philosophy, shaping and often distorting our views both of reason, mind, emotion, and body and of men and women. Other important discussions of gendered metaphors in philosophy include Irigaray (1974 [1985a], 1977 [1985b]), Le Dœuff (1980 [1990]), and Nye (1990, 1992).

1.7 Philosophy of Language

In the early days of feminist philosophy of language, much attention was devoted to ways that philosophy of language was problematic from a feminist point of view. One sort of criticism was that philosophy of language, like English, displays a male bias. Another was simply that philosophy of language is ill-equipped to further feminist aims. Those making these criticisms did not suggest that philosophy of language be abandoned, but rather that it should be reformed—purged of male bias and turned into a discipline that can help in the attainment of feminist ends.

What reasons were given for supposing that philosophy of language is ill suited to achieving feminist ends? There were a variety of reasons (Hintikka and Hintikka 1983; Hornsby 2000; Nye 1996, 1998), but one common thread involves the idea that philosophy of language is excessively individualistic. Criticism of individualism in philosophy is widespread in many areas of feminism. Exactly what ‘individualism’ comes to varies depending upon the area of philosophy under discussion, and depending also on the concerns of the particular critic. (For more on what feminists mean by ‘individualism’, see Antony 1995.) Because of this, we will not attempt a general definition of ‘individualism’, as used by those raising these concerns. However, we will sketch what seems to be at issue in concerns over philosophy of language. Some claim that philosophy of language focuses excessively on the states of mind of individual speakers—in particular on their intentions (Hornsby 2000). Jennifer Hornsby’s central example of this tendency is the work of H. P. Grice, which does indeed analyse speaker meaning in terms of speaker intentions. (Although it is worth noting that Grice’s analysis of sentence meaning incorporates social elements, and that both speaker and audience are essential to his notion of conversational implicature. For more on this, see Saul 2002.) Others suggest that semantics assigns too important a role to the notion of reference to discrete individuals (Hintikka and Hintikka 1983). Their focus is on Alfred Tarski’s truth definitions (Tarski 1956; see also entry on Tarski’s truth definitions) and Richard Montague’s work (Thomason 1974).

Individualism of this sort was said to be problematic for several reasons. One common claim was that this sort of individualism is characteristic of male thinking. Men tend, according to this line of thought, to be interested in separate, discrete individuals; while women are interested in connections and relationships. Thus, it is suggested, an individualistic philosophy of language is one that represents a male way of thinking about the world. For philosophy of language to be true to the experiences and language use of both men and women, then, the individualistic philosophy of language which is characteristic of male thinking will need to be supplemented or replaced by a version more suited to female thinking (Hintikka and Hintikka 1983; Hornsby 2000). As Haslanger (2000a) and others have noted, however, the claims regarding male and female thinking on which this line of thought depends are not well supported. Moreover, differences among women give us reason to doubt the prospects for any supportable generalizations about ‘women’s’ thinking (Ang 1995, Lorde 1983, Lugones and Spelman 1983; Moody-Adams 1991).

Other objections to individualism do not depend upon contentious psychological claims about differences between women and men. Instead, they suggest that the real problem with individualism is its failure to appreciate the importance of the social. The social world is, naturally, an important area of concern when discussing politics and power relations. Understanding how people come to dominate one another, and exactly how this domination functions, are important projects for feminists. Language is an important part of the social world, and understanding the roles that language plays in communicating, manipulating, and controlling (to cite just a few examples) is surely vital to understanding the workings of power (see, for example, MacKinnon’s views on speech in MacKinnon 1993). So, many feminists suggest, a philosophy of language that is appropriate to understanding communicative interactions in the social world could be a valuable tool for feminists. However, they insist that the individualism of philosophy of language (as it is now) prevents it from serving this function (Hornsby 2000).

The general charge that philosophy of language pays little attention to the social world is not one that all feminists would agree with. Indeed, it is a difficult one to sustain in light of the prominence of—to give a few examples—Saul Kripke’s causal theory of reference (1972; see also Section 2 of the entry on reference), Hilary Putnam’s arguments for a social element (the division of linguistic labor) in the working of kind terms (1975; see also Section 3 of the entry on reference), H.P. Grice’s theory of conversation (1975 [1989]), David Lewis’s work on convention (1969), and J.L. Austin’s speech act theory (1962 [1975]). Nonetheless, one might well suggest that philosophers of language have generally attended only to aspects of the social world that are not of particular interest to feminists. While causal theories of reference undeniably involve social elements, these social elements don’t seem to be of the sort that concern feminists; while Putnam’s division of linguistic labour arguably involves some power relations (experts have a special sort of linguistic power that non-experts lack), the political aspects of these power relations have until very recently been ignored. (The rise of social and political philosophy of language represents an important departure from more traditional work.) Andrea Nye criticized mainstream philosophy of language on roughly these grounds, arguing that work on radical translation had not been sufficiently sensitive to political concerns (for the notion of radical translation, see the section on Meaning and Truth in the entry on Donald Davidson).

…a highly technical and professionalized English-speaking philosophy of language was addressing problems of the possibility of ‘radical’ translation from one language community to another, of alternate and incommensurable conceptual schemes, of the difficulty of establishing singular reference across ‘different worlds’, but with virtually no reference to actual failures of communication or problems of gender. (Nye 1998: 266)

In response, Louise Antony has argued that it is a mistake to suppose that there is any particular approach to philosophy of language that is distinctly feminist or anti-feminist, taking as her particular target Hornsby’s work—but her arguments apply more broadly. She argues that such strategies are “disrespectful to and exclusionary of feminists who support alternative views” (2012: 277).

2. More Recent Work

Things have changed a great deal in recent years, and it is now widely accepted that philosophy of language has something to offer feminists, and even (though less widely) that feminists have something to offer philosophy of language. Feminist philosophy of language is now becoming a well-established area of the larger field, with several substantial positive research programmes. The first of these, the reformation of language with feminist goals in mind, began in the early days of the field. But we include it here because it is very much a live programme today.

2.1 Reform Efforts: Successes and Limitations

The “maleness of language” issues discussed in Part 1 gave rise to a wide variety of reform proposals (see, for example, Miller and Swift 1976, 1980, and the papers in part two of Cameron 1998a).

One especially successful reform effort has been the increasingly accepted singular use of the third-person gender-neutral pronoun ‘they’ (in place of ‘he’) as in the sentence below:

Somebody left their hat behind.

A key reason for the success of this reform is perhaps the history of the singular ‘they’. As Ann Bodine has noted (1975 [1998]), the singular use of ‘they’ has a long history. It did not begin to be criticized until the 19^th century, and despite all the efforts of prescriptive grammarians it has remained very popular in speech. (See also Srinivasan 2020.) Due to feminist work on the effects of “gender-neutral” use of ‘he’, even prescriptive grammarians are now becoming more accepting of ‘they’.

It is also becoming increasingly widespread to use ‘they’ as one’s chosen personal pronoun, or, less frequently, to use another gender-neutral option such as ‘ze’ (Bennett 2016; Dembroff and Wodak 2017). This means it is now also increasingly common to see sentences like the following, with a specific antecedent for the third person singular pronoun.

Matt left their hat behind.

Arguments for adopting widespread gender-neutral pronouns came from trans activists like Leslie Feinberg (1996), who offers “s/he,” “sie,” and “ze” as gender-neutral pronoun options, and ultimately advocating for “ze” over “s/he,” explaining: “I asked Beacon Press to use s/he in the author description of me on the cover of Transgender Warriors. That pronoun is a contribution from the women’s liberation movement. Prior to that struggle, the pronoun ”he“ was almost universally used to describe humankind – ”mankind“ So s/he opened up the pronoun to include ”womankind.“ I used s/he on my book jacket because it is recognizable as a gender-neutral pronoun to people. But I personally prefer the pronoun ze because for me, it melds mankind and womankind into humankind” (1994, p. 71).

Dembroff and Wodak (2017, 2021) provide further arguments for the widespread use of gender-neutral ‘they,’ including arguments for trans-inclusivity as well as arguments pointing out the arbitrariness of linguistic identity markers. Indeed, they argue that it would be best to adopt these for everyone (with very few exceptions), not just for people who prefer to be referred to this way. Kukla and Lance (2023) argue that gender ascriptions (including but not limited to gendered pronouns) function as exercitives that “institute social norms for how people should be treated” (p. 1131). Hernandez & Crowley (2024) argue against Dembroff & Wodak’s prescription against gendered pronouns, arguing that gendered pronouns and gendered language more broadly can be a way of “transing language” (p.298). They offer three kinds of language use—recognition, playful, and joyous—that are gender affirming through the use of gendered language. Following Hernandez (2021), they argue that removing gender from language is not the only way to combat gender essentialism. González Vázquez, Klieber, and Rosola (2024) look beyond English and investigate how both gender visibility and gender neutrality are expressed in Spanish, Italian, and German. They conclude that there is no fixed answer to how to represent genderqueer individuals in language, but highlight the diversity between different approaches in grammar and morphology: splitting, article splitting, gendering, slash, and generic feminism.

Other reform efforts have met with greater difficulties. Even ones that have caught sometimes backfire. Susan Erlich and Ruth King (1992 [1998]), for example, discuss the case of ‘chairperson’, intended to serve as a gender-neutral replacement for ‘chairman’. Instead, they found that in many places it was often used to indicate women who fill the post of chair, while men are referred to as ‘chairman’. They take this to show that reforms cannot succeed unless attitudes change as well. Since the time of their writing, the word ‘chair’ does seem to have taken off as a truly neutral replacement for ‘chairman.’

Moreover, feminist work on language has also indicated that there may be problems which are simply not amenable to piecemeal linguistic reforms. Some difficulties that have been raised go well beyond a handful of problematic terms or gaps. Deborah Cameron offers striking examples of writing that take males as the norm without using any particular terms to which one might object, such as the following, from The Sunday Times:

The lack of vitality is aggravated by the fact that there are so few able-bodied young adults about. They have all gone off to work or look for work, leaving behind the old, the disabled, the women and the children. (Cameron 1985: 85)

Clearly, in the above example, ‘able-bodied young adult’ is being used in such a way as to exclude women. Moreover, examples like this (and others Cameron provides) pass unnoticed by newspaper editors and many readers. There is clearly a problem, but it is not a problem that can be pinpointed by picking out some particular term as objectionable and in need of reform. Eliminating language use that takes males as the norm, then, must involve more than changing a few terms or usage rules.

2.2 Feminism and Speech Act Theory

A very important analytic research programme in feminist philosophy of language began with Rae Langton’s and Hornsby’s use of speech act theory to make sense of Catharine MacKinnon’s suggestion that pornography silences and subordinates women. It has now, however, evolved well beyond those beginnings. To give some flavour of this initial work, we briefly summarise Langton’s discussion of silencing.

According to Langton (1993), pornography helps to bring about rape by perlocutionarily and illocutionarily silencing women. Following Austin, Langton distinguishes between locutionary, illocutionary, and perlocutionary acts. A locutionary act is, roughly, the act of uttering words that have particular meanings; a perlocutionary act is, roughly, the act of uttering words that have a particular effect; and an illocutionary act is the act done in uttering the words. Consider, for example, Jenny’s utterance one day of the sentence ‘I pledge my allegiance to Her Majesty the Queen and all her heirs’. The locutionary act she performed was simply the utterance of a sentence with a particular meaning. This act had many perlocutionary effects: it made it possible for her to get a British passport, it made her feel slightly disturbed at having expressed such monarchist sentiments, and it made her wonder whether a republic, should it succeed the Queen, would count as an heir. The illocutionary act she performed was that of becoming a British citizen.

Langton proposes that there are forms of silencing corresponding to each of these sorts of speech act. A person is locutionarily silenced if she is prevented from speaking, or intimidated into not speaking. A person is illocutionarily silenced if she is unable to carry out the acts that she intends to carry out in speaking. A person is perlocutionarily silenced when her speech cannot have its intended effects. Langton is particularly concerned with the role that perlocutionary and illocutionary silencing may play in rape. A woman’s refusal to have sex is perlocutionarily silenced if—even though she is recognized as refusing—she is forced to have sex. Her (attempted) refusal to have sex is illocutionarily silenced if it is not even recognized as a refusal. (For an exploration of the role of conventions in this illocutionary silencing, see Wyatt 2009.) In such a case, according to Langton, it isn’t a refusal. She suggests that pornography plays a key role in making men less able to recognise women’s refusals as refusals and more willing to rape women even when they recognise women’s refusals. This means, she argues, that pornography illocutionarily and perlocutionarily silences women. And this silencing is an important one, as it results in rape.

This example can also help us to see that some elements of individualism may be indispensable to feminism (for more arguments to this effect, see Antony 1995). Assuming that Langton’s arguments are sound, we can see an important role for individualistic philosophy of language in feminism. Although it is right that focusing exclusively on individual speakers’ intentions would prevent us from seeing some important facts (as Hornsby 2000 argues), it also vital to recognise the importance of paying some attention to an individual speaker’s intentions. In order to understand what has gone wrong in the illocutionary silencing described above, one needs to understand that the woman intended to be refusing sex. In order to understand what has gone wrong in the perlocutionary silencing example, one needs to understand that the woman intended her refusal to bring it about that she did not have sex. More generally, not being understood properly is an important element of life in a subordinate position, as many feminists have noted. In order to make sense of not being understood properly, one needs to attend to what the speaker intended and how the audience understood the speaker, and how these things differ. To do this, one needs to look at individual states of mind.

These discussions have inspired a now substantial literature. Further reading can be found in the section on pornography, hate speech, and silencing in the entry on hate speech. Below, we give some very non-comprehensive pointers to this literature.

Some critics (e.g., Dworkin 1991, 1993; Jacobson 1995) have argued that any silencing which may result from pornography is not of the sort that free speech law should attempt to protect. (Responses to these criticisms can be found in Hornsby and Langton 1998; Langton 2009a; and West 2003.)
Others, such as Leslie Green (1998), have argued that pornography does not have the sort of authority needed to carry out acts of subordination and silencing. Langton (2009b) has responded to this criticism; and Mary Kate McGowan (2003) has argued that the sort of authority needed for the acts in question is really quite a modest and ordinary sort of conversational authority. Nellie Wieland (2007), like McGowan, thinks that there is no need for the sort of authority that worries Green. However, she argues that Langton’s account runs the risk of absolving rapists from culpability for their crimes. (Jacobson 1995 also raises this culpability worry.) McGowan and Maitra (2010) have responded to this, as do McGowan, Adelman, Helmers, and Stolzenberg (2010). On the topic of authority more broadly, see Tirrell (2018) for a discussion of the role of gender in authoritative speech.
Jennifer Saul (2006a) worries about Langton’s claim that pornography itself is a speech act, arguing that only utterances in contexts can be speech acts. Moreover, she suggests that if Langton’s claim is revised to be one about acts of viewing or showing pornography it loses its plausibility. Claudia Bianchi (2008) criticizes this, and Mari Mikkola (2008) responds.
A further concern about context comes from Tirrell (1999). Tirrell argues that MacKinnon assigns pornography an authority so strong that women would be unable to successfully articulate their own experiences. She suggests that MacKinnon’s picture needs revising to make room for the successful communication that takes place between feminists.
Alexander Bird (2002), Daniel Jacobson (1995) and Ishani Maitra (2009) all raise worries about the Austinian distinction between illocution and perlocution and its role in the silencing argument (in particular, about the requirement that illocutions must be understood to be successful). For Bird and Jacobson this leads to a rejection of the silencing argument, but Maitra instead re-frames it in Gricean terms. Angela Grünberg (2014) argues that the silencing argument should be reconceived to focus not on illocutionary silencing, but on locutionary or rhetic silencing. She suggests that this allows a satisfying response to criticisms like those from Bird and Jacobson. Mikkola (2011a) also defends Langton-Hornsby against Bird and Jacobson.
Judith Butler (1997) objects to the silencing argument on several grounds, chief among them (a) that it assumes an implausible picture of language use; and (b) that silencing does not matter in the way that Langton and Hornsby think that it does. Langton (2009c) has responded to this worry.
Alex Davies (2016) argues that pornography may not just alter the illocutionary force of women’s utterances, but also block her from making utterances with the content that she desires. Davies’s central example is the way that rape myths, perpetuated by pornography, may make it impossible for women in courtroom cross examinations to express the truth about their experiences.
Clausen (2020) evaluates the speech act of refusal in general contexts: comparing sexual refusal to general refusal and arguing they should be treated with the same significance. Mason (2023) evaluates cases where refusal fails and argues that they do so due to a lack of speaker authority. Caponetto (2023) gives a taxonomy of refusals in what she calls a “refusal family”—speech acts that include rejecting, declining, and other verbs that describe the general act of ‘saying no.’ Caponetto identifies proper refusals as those that respond negatively to requests for permissions, and, disagreeing with Mason, argues that only proper refusals require speaker authority, and a refusal can succeed as an illocutionary act even if it is ignored. One upshot of Caponetto’s argument is that ‘consent’ and ‘refusal’ may not be the right categories when it comes to talking about sex (see section 2.7).
In recent years, many philosophers have connected silencing to other philosophical phenomena in feminist epistemology, philosophy of race, philosophy of gender, trans philosophy, and political philosophy. Davis 2018 identifies credibility excess as a kind of testimonial injustice that involves self-silencing (following Dotson 2011’s work of naming testimonial smothering as a kind of self-silencing). Toole (2021) argues that white supremacy is an epistemological system that works in part through silencing. Klieber (2023, 2024) identifies the harmful phenomenon of silencing silences: defined as what happens when individuals—often women—are prevented from communicating things via their silence (see also Swanson 2017 on omissive implicature). Fricker & Jenkins (2017) apply testimonial smothering to the trans experience, arguing that many trans people experience pre-emptive testimonial injustice. Medina (2023, 2024) connects silencing with the act of protest. Medina (2024) identifies a kind of preemptive silencing that occurs before a (speech) act of protest even occurs, of which one kind is pre-locutionary silencing: silencing that prevents a speech act from occurring in the first place. Kukla, Herbert, Watson (forthcoming) describe how confidentiality agreements silence victims of sexual violations as a way of protecting institutions. McDonald (2020, 2022) expands the silencing argument to cat-calls, coercion and compliments that silence. Stoljar (2022) connects silencing to communication failure and autonomy. Tanesini (2016) gives an account of intellectual arrogance as a phenomenon that involves silencing other speakers and hearers. Nowak (2020) identifies language loss (understood as the disappearing of a currently existent spoken language) as a kind of illocutionary silencing.
For recently published overviews on the variety of silencing, see: Caponetto (2021) on kinds of silencing, Bianchi (2023) on varieties of uptake, Harrison & Tanter (2025) on further kinds of uptake and their ethical implications, Schiller (2021) on varieties of illocutionary harm, Ayala & Vasilyeva (2016) on responsibility for silence, and Dowell (2021) on kinds of silencing and assertion.

This use of speech act theory was one of the first developments of feminist philosophy of language to gain mainstream currency, and it has become widely taught and studied. Recently, however, sharply critical feminist voices have started to emerge. Separately, and for different reasons, Nancy Bauer (2015) and Lorna Finlayson (2014), have both argued that the feminist literature on speech acts and pornography is deeply misguided. Bauer objects on several grounds. She thinks it is misguided to treat pornography as speech, and she (like other critics noted above) argues that pornography should not be seen as authoritative. Her more fundamental critique, though, is that this literature fails to take seriously the realities of both pornography and women’s subordination—by not engaging sufficiently with the phenomenology of pornography use; by not attending to all the ways that the broader culture is involved in subordinating women; and by focusing on just women’s verbal acts of refusal, thereby failing to appreciate the fuller dehumanization involved in sexual assault. This is part of a broader critique, for Bauer, of both analytic philosophy in general, and widespread understandings of Austin. Finlayson goes even further, arguing not that Austin’s work was misused by feminists but that it never should have been used at all. She suggests that the feminist foray into speech act theory was entirely unnecessary, and also that the focus on pornography was misguided.

But there have also been very substantial developments broadening and building upon the feminist use of speech theory—extending it to issues like racist speech, and hate speech more generally. McGowan (2009a) argues for the existence of a different sort of silencing due to pornography; and in her 2009b she argues that speech may be counted not just as silencing or subordinating, but also as oppressing. Moreover, she suggests that oppressive speech is likely to be a very widespread phenomenon. These ideas are developed further in McGowan (2012), which takes as its focus racist speech, and in Simpson (2013). Maitra (2012) also applies ideas from feminist work on subordinating speech to racist speech. Langton also turns her attention to hate speech more broadly, including in her 2012. This paper is also notable for its focus on the role of pragmatics in shaping attitudes other than belief. Rachel McKinney (2016), “Extracted Speech”, builds on this literature by exploring the ways that speech may be unjustly extracted rather than silenced (as in, for example, the paradigm case of the Central Park Five’s false confessions). Quill Kukla, writing as Rebecca Kukla, introduces the notion of discursive injustice, in order to discuss a broader range of ways that “members of a disadvantaged group face a systematic inability to produce a specific kind of speech act they are entitled to perform” (2014: 440), which often takes the form of performing a different speech act from the one that they intend. Although they draw on Langton and Hornsby, they abandon Langton and Hornsby’s focus on illocution and perlocution, focussing instead simply on performative force. Johnson 2020 argues for the existence of illocutionary pluralism about speech acts: an utterance of ‘no’ in a sexual context “could be a refusal and a coy consenting” (p.9). Johnson applies this notion of illocutionary pluralism to mansplaining: giving an account that explains mansplaining as a mismatch between participants’ understanding of the illocutionary act associated with an utterance: mansplainers react to women’s assertions as though they are requests or questions. Johnson agrees with Kukla that the audience member or hearer who treats an assertion as a request has wronged the speaker, but argues that this is a moral and epistemic wrong, rather than a wrong in language. Johnson’s view differs from Kukla’s insofar as Johnson holds that there is no factual mistake on the part of the hearer who understands the illocutionary act differently than the speaker does.

Also considering the role of pragmatics in politics (though developed independently from Langton and Hornsby), Marina Sbisà (1999) explores the role of presuppositions in political persuasion. Finally, Jason Stanley (2015) draws heavily on Langton and Hornsby’s work in developing his account of propaganda (focused, but not exclusively, on racist propaganda).

2.3 On the Meaning of Gender Terms and Concepts

In her ground-breaking paper “Gender and Race: (What) Are They? (What) Do We Want Them To Be?” (2000b), Haslanger aims to provide an account of the nature of gender, as well as an account of the meaning of the concept woman. She assumes the classical distinction between sex and gender, where sex is supposed to refer to biological or anatomical properties distinguishing males from females (although as she argues, this distinction is flexible and permeated by social and political factors too), and gender is supposed to refer to social or cultural factors distinguishing men from women (see the entry on feminist perspectives on sex and gender). One of the main virtues of Haslanger’s article is that she makes explicit the methodological approach that she endorses, to wit: she famously distinguishes between a descriptive project, which aims to reveal the concept that we actually use or the property that we actually track with our usage of the term, and an analytical project (or an ameliorative project, as she calls it in Haslanger 2006), which aims to reveal the concept that we should use or the meaning that we should associate to the corresponding term, given our purposes and aims in that inquiry. As she makes clear, she is following the analytical or ameliorative approach, with the explicit aim of providing an account of the meaning of gender and woman that could be a useful tool in order to fight sexism and help to achieve social justice. With this purpose in mind, she comes up with the following definition of the concept woman, as one particular type of gender:

S is a woman iff_def S is systematically subordinated along some dimension (economic, political, legal, social, etc.) and S is “marked” as a target for this treatment by observed or imagined bodily features presumed to be evidence of a female’s biological role in reproduction. (2000b: 39)

As we can see, the main idea of Haslanger’s account is that gender is a hierarchical social structure, where some members are situated in a position of privilege and some other members are situated in a position of subordination along social, economic, political, legal, or cultural dimensions, in virtue of their real or imagined biological role in reproduction. And more particularly, being a woman corresponds to occupying a specific position of subordination with respect to this social structure, due to one’s perceived or imagined biologically female bodily features.

Haslanger’s proposal gave rise to a rich debate about the virtues of an ameliorative approach, and the advantages and problems of this particular account. Although Haslanger’s discussion focuses mostly on the concept woman, many theorists also extend the ameliorative approach to discussions about what the term ‘woman’ should mean. For instance, Saul (2006b) argued that this proposed usage of the term ‘woman’ could have some problematic consequences, such as feminists having to advocate for the eradication of women, since feminists advocate for the eradication of the subordination of people in terms of their biological role in reproduction. For this reason, Saul argued, this might not be the most advantageous way of using the term ‘woman’. In addition, Saul argued that the folk or ordinary concept woman does not really distinguish between sex as a biological feature and gender as a social or cultural feature. Following up on this, Mikkola (2011b) argued that it might be very costly to revise the ordinary meaning of ‘woman’ in the considerable ways that Haslanger suggests, since this might jeopardize communication, in addition to the fact that gender identity and the label ‘woman’ might be a source of identity and pride for many women. Therefore, to characterize being a woman in terms of being subordinated, as Haslanger does, might not be politically useful for the aims of feminism. Mikkola (2011b) put forward an alternative account of ‘woman’ that does not endorse the sex/gender distinction: rather, she proposed a trait/norm covariance model, according to which there are different traits that are assigned to men or women (or males or females) at a certain context, and that are expected to be followed and instantiated. However, the different traits that are assigned to men or to women are heavily context-dependent and flexible, and it is possible to revise both the assignment of traits and the norms and expectations involving them, in virtue of many kinds of factors, including moral and political considerations.

More recently, several feminists have argued that an account of woman along the lines of Haslanger’s proposal might fail to do justice to the aims of trans women, which should be central for the purposes of feminism. For example, Saul (2012) argues that neither standard sex-based accounts nor standard gender-based accounts are automatically going to be inclusive of trans women, since (at least some) trans women could arguably turn out to be excluded from the extension of the term ‘woman’ when defined in terms of biological features, or in terms of certain social and cultural factors that are usually attributed to biologically female individuals. Saul put forward a possible alternative view, namely, a contextualist view of the meaning of ‘woman’, as follows:

X is a woman is true in a context C iff X is human and relevantly similar (according to the standards at work in C) to most of those possessing all of the biological markers of female sex. (2012: 201)

According to this account, an individual will fall under the extension of ‘woman’ in a certain context when she is sufficiently similar to those who are biologically female, given the standards of similarity that are relevant in such context, where these standards can vary from context to context. Saul argues that at first sight, this view seems to give the right results, since it would classify trans women as women in most contexts where, say, self-identifying as a woman is what is deemed relevant, but on further reflection, she argues, the view can give unwanted results. For example, in a conservative community where most speakers take for granted that trans women should not be allowed to use women’s toilets, their usage of ‘woman’ would be such that trans women would not fall under the term, since the relevant criterion of similarity in that context that those conservative speakers have in mind seems to be something like having certain chromosomes or certain anatomical features, which some trans women lack. In response to this worry, E. Diaz-Leon (2016) has argued that we can understand the contextualist view in a way that avoids this objection. In particular, she argues, we can understand the relevant standards of similarity at work in each context as those criteria that are the most politically useful, given the aims and purposes that are morally salient in that context. For example, in the context of a conservative community where trans women are not allowed to use women’s toilets, there are moral reasons for focusing on criteria such as self-identifying as a woman, rather than having certain biological features, and this is what makes this criterion the relevant one in that context, and hence what fixes the extension of ‘woman’ in that context, as required. (See also Bettcher 2017, Laskowski 2020, Zeman 2020a,b, Chen 2020, 2021, Ichikawa 2020, and Cosker-Rowland 2024, for further discussion and criticism of contextualist views about the meaning of gender terms, and discussions of alternative semantic proposals such as polysemic views (ones on which a term has multiple related meanings) and relativist views about the meaning of ‘woman’. Díaz-León 2022 responds to some of the objections to contextualism. See also Knoll 2022, 2024 and Kukla & Lance 2023 for alternative accounts that explain gender ascriptions in pragmatic terms.)

Talia Bettcher (2013) has also argued that ameliorative accounts of the meaning of ‘woman’ should take into account the aims of trans women. She argues that “single-meaning” views, according to which ‘woman’ has a unique meaning that is shared by all speakers, cannot do justice to those aims. Instead, she puts forward a “multiple-meaning” account, according to which there are several co-existing meanings of the term ‘woman’ in our society, but where some of those meanings embed world-views that are not only morally and politically problematic, but also factually misguided, such as using ‘woman’ in a trans-exclusionary way. Because of this, we have good reasons for using the term ‘woman’ in our speech with the trans-inclusive meaning that trans-friendly communities already associate with the term. She also argues that although it is methodologically useful to rely on intuitions, “it is inappropriate to dismiss alternative ways in which those terms are actually used in trans subcultures; such usage needs to be taken into consideration as part of the analysis” (2013: 235). Pluralist accounts are also developed by Briggs & George (2023), Jenkins (2023), Cull (2024) and Díaz-León (2024).

Katharine Jenkins (2016) argued that Haslanger’s original proposal excluded trans women from the extension of the concept woman, which is morally and politically problematic. As Jenkins argues, trans women who do not pass as cis women (that is, those women who were assigned female at birth) do not occupy a position of subordination in virtue of their perceived or imagined bodily features presumed to be evidence of a female biological role in reproduction, since they are not presumed to have a female biological role in reproduction (given that they do not pass as cis women). For this reason, Haslanger’s account cannot capture the self-identity of those trans women as women, and the ways in which they are subordinated in virtue of their gender identity. In order to solve this problem, Jenkins proposes an ingenious account of gender in terms of two elements, namely, gender as a social class, and gender as social identity, where the former is similar to Haslanger’s notion of gender as social structures, and the latter has to do with our own perceptions of our own positioning within those social structures. Following Haslanger’s (2005) account of racial identity, Jenkins suggests an account of gender identity in terms of mental maps that serve to guide our own behavior, norms and expectations within the social niches that we live in. (For criticism of Jenkins’ account as insufficiently inclusive of trans women, see Andler 2017.) Cosker-Rowland (2023) provides a useful survey of ameliorative analyses of gender concepts in terms of gender identity.

Haslanger (2020) provides a useful clarification of the aims of her original ameliorative analysis of gender concepts, partly in response to the rich discussion that followed the publication of her (2000b) piece. As Haslanger (2020) reminds us, one of her original aims was to respond to critiques of realist conceptions of gender that were common in the last decades of the 20^th century (e.g. Spelman 1988). In response to anti-realist concerns that contended that there is no common trait that all women had in common, Haslanger (2000b) aimed to offer an ameliorative analysis of gender that emphasizes the process of social formation that underlies gender. As Haslanger (2020) explains, she was more interested in the process of social formation rather than social identities, and she saw social identities as a causal result of that process. Moreover, Haslanger (2000b) already remarked that appropriating current gender terminologies to refer to new categories must be done with caution, and that what can be useful in some contexts and for some purposes might not be so in other contexts and for some other purposes. However, as she acknowledges in (2020), the appropriation of gender terms such as ‘man’ and ‘woman’ to express her ameliorative hierarchical conceptions of gender was more problematic than she anticipated in her (2000b) piece, since these analyses exclude people who should not be excluded, as Bettcher (2013), Jenkins (2016), Kapusta (2016), Kirkland (2018) and others have shown. At the same time, the aim of Haslanger’s ameliorative analyses of gender concepts was to emphasize and make salient the processes of social formation of gender categories that are unjust and exclusionary.

In this section so far we have focused on semantic accounts of the meaning of ‘woman’ and the concept woman, although recently there has also been an explosion of work about the issue of the connection between the semantics of gender terms and the metaphysics of gender as a social class, and also about the notion of biological sex as a contested category. Some of these discussions have implications for the meanings of the corresponding terms ‘woman’ and ‘female’. For example, Saray Ayala and Nadya Vasilyeva (2015) provide an account of biological sex in terms of extended, flexible biological features, where which features count for being male or female can change from context to context, depending on our aims and purposes, and where those extended biological features can be taken to incorporate features of the environment, artificial bodily features, and so on. On the other hand, Helen Daly (2015) has argued that we should favour semantic accounts of ‘female’ and ‘woman’ that do not assume a sharp cut-off point between those who fall under the term and those who do not, since this is morally and politically problematic. In addition, Jennifer McKitrick (2015) has argued that an account of gender in terms of dispositions to behave in certain ways can be politically useful, and can capture the aims of trans women. Moreover, Haslanger (2016) has defended a context-sensitive account of ‘sex’, where the term can have different meanings, depending on the aims and purposes of the inquiry in that context. Furthermore, recently there has been a lot of interest in discussions about the alleged connection between the meaning of gender terms (or the content of gender concepts), and the metaphysics of gender categories: see, for instance, Barnes (2019), Dembroff (2018) and Díaz-León (2024). Finally, recently there have been some philosophers defending the view that gender terms such as ‘man’ and ‘woman’ do or should pick out the property of being biologically male and being biologically female, respectively, instead of picking out gender kinds, as is customary in feminist theory (e.g. Bogardus 2020a,b and 2022, and Byrne 2020). See Bettcher (2025), Dembroff (2020), Arvan (2023) and Mason (2024) for compelling responses.

2.4 Ameliorative Projects and Conceptual Engineering

As we saw in the previous section, Haslanger (2000b) brought attention to the need for revisionary or ameliorative approaches in feminist philosophy, as opposed to purely conceptual or descriptive approaches, which focus on the concept we have or the objective type that we actually track. The idea of a revisionary or ameliorative approach to the analysis of our concepts has been a very influential one in philosophy, but Haslanger’s work has served as a kind of reminder of the significance of aiming for the concepts that would best serve our purposes and aims, rather than merely revealing the ordinary concepts that we happen to have, which is the task that many projects in recent mainstream analytic philosophy seem to have paid attention to. Haslanger’s work has inspired a lot of interesting ameliorative projects in philosophy of gender and race and social philosophy more in general (see for instance Glasgow 2006, 2009 and Mallon 2006 on ‘race’, Barnes 2016 on ‘disability’, Dembroff 2016 on ‘sexual orientation’, as well as many of the papers on ‘woman’, ‘sex’ and ‘gender’ cited in the previous section). As suggested above, the notion of an ameliorative project in philosophy is not new, but in our view the impetus that this methodological approach in philosophy has experienced recently owes much to the centrality that this notion has played in recent developments in philosophy of gender and race over the last two decades.

As ameliorative projects are becoming more common in mainstream analytic philosophy, they have given rise to a careful examination of the methodological foundations and the metaphysical, semantic and epistemic aspects of the ameliorative approach, as well as its moral and political implications. Alexis Burgess and David Plunkett (2013a,b) have usefully surveyed these and related issues pertaining to ameliorative projects in philosophy, and have coined a new label: conceptual ethics. They intend this new term to refer to the philosophical reflection about the terms and concepts that we ought to use in different areas, given our best normative reasoning, as well as the methodological and philosophical issues to which these projects give rise. Examples include the nature of the values and normative considerations that should guide our choice of terms and concepts, as well as semantic questions about the nature and possibility of conceptual change and conceptual revision, among many others. One of the advantages of having this new label is that discussions on these normative issues about our talk and thought that were formerly scattered can now be more unified and more systematic.

Another term that is becoming prominent in this area is that of conceptual engineering, which is supposed to refer to ameliorative projects that aim to revise our current concepts and engineer new concepts that can better serve our main purposes. This term originates from discussions about Carnap’s methodological insights (see for instance French 2015 for a useful overview), but is now being used in a more general, encompassing sense. See Cull (2021) for an argument tracing the idea of conceptual engineering to black feminist philosophers. Several philosophers have recently argued that we could understand many traditional debates in philosophy as debates in conceptual ethics or conceptual engineering (see for instance Floridi 2011 and Plunkett 2015). Moreover, Cappelen (2018) wrote a monograph about foundational issues in conceptual engineering, drawing on Haslanger’s work and other feminist and anti-racist philosophers. Cappelen’s discussions of foundational issues such as what we revise when we revise the meaning of a term, whether revising a term’s meaning is within our control, and when revisions of a term’s meaning go too far so as to change the topic, have given rise to an explosion of interesting work on foundational issues about conceptual ethics or conceptual engineering. Such work includes assessments of the prospects, the scope and the significance of ameliorative projects in philosophy (see e.g. the articles included in Burgess, Cappelen & Plunkett (2020) and Isaac, Scharp and Koch (forthcoming)). This growing literature can be seen as an example of debates in feminist philosophy of language having a significant impact in mainstream philosophy of language.

2.5 Hermeneutical Injustice

As we saw in section 1.5, Fricker (2007) argues that there is a distinctive kind of injustice that has to do with the inability to properly understand and communicate important aspects of one’s social experience: she calls this hermeneutical injustice. According to Fricker, people in a position of marginalization are prevented from creating concepts, terms and other representational resources that could be used in order to conceptualize and understand their own experiences, especially those having to do with being in that position of marginalization. People in a position of power will tend to create concepts and linguistic representations that help to conceptualize the experiences and phenomena that matter to them, rather than the experiences and phenomena that matter the most to people in a position of marginalization. Because of this, members of marginalized groups might suffer from a lacuna in the representational resources that are available to them, and in particular might lack the concepts and terms that would allow them to understand and communicate their experiences. In order to illustrate this phenomenon, Fricker (2007) focuses on several examples, such as the articulation of the term ‘sexual harassment’: before the term was coined, victims of sexual harassment lacked the language to explain their experiences of receiving unwanted sexual advances at work in a way that would make clear why those interactions wronged them. But through meeting together and discussing common experiences they developed a new concept, sexual harassment. And eventually this concept was taken up more broadly.

There is by now a large and flourishing literature on hermeneutical injustice, developing the notion in many directions. One line of inquiry has focused on the significance and existence of hermeneutical gaps. Laura Beeby (2011) has emphasised the epistemic symmetry of the gaps between the marginalised and the more powerful (for example the harasser and the harassee). Several authors have disputed the idea that the marginalized generally lack the ability to conceptualize and communicate their own experiences (Rebecca Mason 2011, Kristie Dotson 2012, Gaile Pohlhaus 2012 and José Medina 2013), and called into question the idea of a single shared hermeneutical resource. This work has important precursors in the work of Patricia Hill Collins’s (1990/2022) discussion of black women developing new concepts together in order to articulate their experiences, concepts that were unavailable in the dominant conceptual resources. For example, Mason (2011) and Medina (2013) have both argued that although Fricker is right that people in a situation of marginalization might not have access to publicly shared terms in order to communicate their experiences to those in a position of power, they might nonetheless be able to make sense of their own experiences in a useful way, even before those public concepts are introduced in the dominant language. Mason (2011) argues that what they often actually lack is the power to introduce these meanings into the collective understanding, which is unjust, and which results in the fact that dominant groups have a distorted understanding of the social experiences of non-dominant groups. Pohlhaus (2012) has argued that marginalized subjects are in a better position to notice gaps in our collective epistemic resources in order to properly describe and conceptualize the experiences of those who are socially oppressed, and to work collectively to develop new conceptual resources. Indeed, according to Medina (2013), this is necessary for the introduction of better conceptual resources in our shared language. But Pohlhaus (2012) argues that wilful hermeneutical ignorance often keeps the more powerful from using the resources that the marginalised develop. This can connect with what Derek Anderson (2017) has called conceptual competence injustice, in which marginalised subjects are wrongly taken to be incompetent users of concepts. Relatedly, Dotson (2012) introduces the concept of contributory injustice. This kind of epistemic injustice has to do not only with the phenomenon of willfully ignoring the epistemic resources developed by the marginalized, but also with the continuous use of distorted epistemic resources developed by those in a position of power, without paying attention to the experiences of the marginalized. This use of faulty conceptual resources acts to block the uptake of the new conceptual resources developed by the marginalized, which leads to further misunderstandings. Han Edgoose (2024) has introduced the idea of hermeneutical sabotage for the practice of dominant knowers actively worsening shared hermeneutical resources by distorting the resistant resources that have been developed. A related notion is that of hermeneutical backlash (George and Goguen 2021), a targeting by dominant forces of hermeneutical liberation. This takes the form of undermining hermeneutical liberation by casting doubt on its key features—for example by seeing growing adoption of a liberatory concept as “social contagion”. Luvell Anderson has introduced the idea of a hermeneutical impasse, which occurs when “agents engaged in communicative exchange are unable to achieve understanding due to a gap in shared hermeneutical resources” (2017: 3). He uses this to explain the impasse between those who endorse “Black Lives Matter” and those who endorse “All Lives Matter”. (For other takes on “All Lives Matter” see Atkins 2018, Keiser 2021, Clapp 2022.) Goetze (2018) offers a useful taxonomy of the ways in which groups’ and individuals’ relationships to each other’s hermeneutical resources can give rise to different sorts of hermeneutical injustices.

How to respond to hermeneutical injustice is a further issue. Fricker (2007) focuses on developing the virtue of hermeneutical justice. Elizabeth Anderson (2012) argues that there should be more attention paid to the epistemic justice of social institutions. George Hull (2017) argues that consciousness-raising is very important, not only as a means to overcoming hermeneutical injustice, but it “can itself constitute the overcoming of hermeneutical injustice” (2017: 585). Charlie Crerar (2016) suggests that we need not just the right concepts but also “access to an expressively free environment in which to put these concepts to work: an open and receptive social context in which a particular experience that individuals or groups have a significant interest in coming to understand can be discussed in hermeneutically conducive ways” (2016: 205). Medina (2013) argues that members of dominant groups should be more sensitive to inchoate attempts at communication by people in a position of subordination, even before they have access to shared concepts to properly conceptualize those aspects of our social interactions. Romdenh-Romluc (2016) poses an important challenge by considering the importance of deciding which non-dominant resources should be adopted more widely. A key example for her is the anti-Muslim conceptual resources of the marginalised members of the English Defence League. She argues that these should not be adopted more widely, but that it is difficult to formulate criteria to rule this out. Goetze and Crerar (2022) argue that we can achieve hermeneutical justice with respect to extremists by carefully distinguishing between understanding and accepting a world view.

The concept of hermeneutical injustice has been widely taken up across a wide range of issues including domestic abuse (Jenkins 2017); child abuse (Lo 2023); sexual violence (Haenel 2020, Jackson 2019, Jenkins 2017); gendered language (Rosola 2024); trans issues (Fricker and Jenkins 2017, George and Goguen 2021); LGBTQ asylum seekers (Boncompagni 2021); and health/illness (Kidd and Carel 2014 and 2018, Ritunanno 2022, Chen et. al. 2021).

2.6 Generics

Generic statements are ones such as “cats are furry”, or “a cat has fur”, which are neither universal generalizations (there are furless cats) nor existential generalization (the claim being made is clearly stronger). They give rise to many puzzles, which have for some time interested both linguists and philosophers. For a fuller discussion, see the entry on generics. Our focus here is the social and political import that has recently been suggested for generic statements about social groups, on which there is a growing literature. This literature takes as its starting point Sarah-Jane Leslie’s work (Leslie 2015; Wodak, Leslie, and Rhodes 2015). Of key interest here are examples such as “boys don’t cry” or “women place their families before their careers”. These sentences can be used to express merely descriptive claims—describing, for example, crying as something not that many boys do. But they can also be used to make normative claims about what boys or women should do. Wodak, Leslie, and Rhodes (2015) suggest that “we can understand the difference between normative and descriptive generics in terms of the different concepts picked out by the noun phrase in the generics themselves” (Wodak et. al. 2015: 629). ‘Woman’ may pick out a normative concept—an ideal, which might include such things as a focus on family over career; or, alternatively, it may pick out a descriptive concept, and refer to women regardless of whether they focus on family over career. Leslie uses this as a foundation for explaining utterances like “Hillary Clinton is the only man in the Obama White House”, suggesting that ‘man’ here is a dual character concept, and refers in the sentence above to the ideal of manliness. According to Leslie, normative generics operate using this kind of polysemy. It is also a part of a more general project of arguing that generic utterances have harmful effects on social cognition. See Hesni 2021 and Lemeire 2023 for arguments against a polysemous dual character concept view of normative generics, and Del Pinal and Reuter 2016 for empirical considerations that amend Leslie’s view of normative generics. Leslie (2017) also discusses what she calls “striking property generics”, statements that attribute dangerous properties to groups generically specified—like “Scots are violent drunkards” or “Muslims are terrorists”. She argues that striking property generic claims may not require many instances to be accepted as true (assuming some other conditions are also met) allowing them to serve as a key mechanism in perpetuating and exacerbating prejudice. (For some criticisms of Leslie on striking property generics, see Saul 2023 and Sterken 2015a,b.)

Haslanger (2011) has built on Leslie’s work, arguing that generic claims often carry conversational implicatures about natures, and that these help them to serve as a key mechanism for perpetuating the ideologies that hold unjust social structures in place. She suggests that—whatever their truth conditions (one understanding of Leslie’s view would make striking property generic claims very easily true)—one should deny them via the mechanism of meta-linguistic negation (Horn 1985) which allows the denial of a claim because it carries a false implicature. By this method, we can start to disrupt the ideologies that have us in their grip. (For criticism of this, see Saul 2023). For criticisms of the view that generics are particularly suited to make harmful essentializing claims, see Ritchie (2019), Hoicka et al. (2021), and Reuter, Neufeld, and del Pinal (2023).

2.7 New Directions

In this section we point very briefly to some of the newly emerging literatures in feminist philosophy of language.

2.7.1 Sexual Communication

Sexual communication has always been an important issue for feminists. As we have seen, it is an important part of the literature on silencing—in particular the inability of women to succeed in refusing sex. There has also, of course, been substantial discussion of consent and refusal in the literature on rape more generally. There have been feminist criticisms of conceptualizing sex in terms of consent and refusal, but until recently these have not come from feminist philosophy of language. In recent years, feminist philosophers of language have begun to argue against an excessive focus on just the presence or absence of consent and refusal in discussions of sex. Emily Tilton and Jonathan Ichikawa (2021) are primarily focused on sexual deception, but crucially they also argue for discussing not just the question of whether consent is present, but also the linguistic question of what was consented to. Madeleine Kenyon (forthcoming) has argued that careful consideration of the indispensable role of demonstratives in sexual consent poses problems for the idea of fully explicit consent. Ichikawa (2020) suggests that the language of consent carries the presupposition that sex must always be “at someone else’s behest”—and that this idea is tied to problematic gender norms. Finally Laura Caponetto (2023) has recently argued that sexual requests have been wrongly understood as permission requests, and this has led to a distorted understanding of sexual refusals. Quill Kukla (2018) suggests a much greater broadening of feminist discussions of sex. By urging a shift to considering negotiation, Kukla discusses topics such as the speech acts involved in initiating sex (as invitation or gift, to take two of their examples), the use of non-literal language, safe words, and consensual nonconsent. Building on this broader idea of sexual communication, Lucy MacDonald (2022) has offered an analysis of flirting.

2.7.2 Manipulative Communication

In recent years, philosophers of language have become increasingly interested in manipulative speech, and feminist philosophers of language are no exception. This is a relatively new literature, but intriguing directions are being mapped out.

Sara Bernstein (2024) has argued for the importance of what she calls ‘biased evaluative descriptions’, apparently positive descriptions, whose use displays a pattern influenced by biases. An example is the use of ‘calm and professional’ to praise a Black woman: the description is positive, but it would be unlikely to be used to describe a White man.

Jennifer Saul has discussed the use of figleaves—additional communicative items that provide just a little bit of cover for what would otherwise be recognized as clearly norm-violating. She explores sexist figleaves in her 2021 chapter on racist and sexist figleaves. Madeleine Kenyon (2024) builds on this to discuss the ways that figleaves are used to evade accusations of sexual violence.

2.7.3 Misgendering and Deadnaming

Recent work has begun to develop detailed analyses of harmful phenomena previously understudied by philosophers of language, misgendering and deadnaming. Stephanie Kapusta’s (2016) provides a careful analysis of the nature of misgendering and the harms that it causes. Dembroff and Wodak (2018, 2021) build on this work, but also argue for a more restricted understanding of misgendering, one which allows them to argue for a (defeasible) moral obligation to use gender-neutral pronouns for everyone. Deadnaming occurs when a trans person is called by a name that they no longer use. Klieber and Bolton (forthcoming) argue that this is importantly distinct from misgendering, and offer an analysis of its harms. Koles (2024) explores the semantics of deadnaming.

2.7.4 Social Scripts

Philosophers write about social scripts as, variously, psychological, linguistic, or social entities that encode expectations about norms, language, and behavior: they indicate how to act and what to say in certain situations and are often internalized. A classic example is the English greeting script: “Hi, how are you?”“Fine, and you?” Although much of the work that brings social scripts to bear on feminist issues treats scripts as cognitive (Valian 2005, Bicchieri 2005, Spaulding 2018, Eickers 2024, Plakias 2024) or social (Butler 1988, Appiah 2001, Oshana 2005, Bettcher 2014, Stoljar 2014, Haslanger 2015, Dembroff 2018), a growing number of researchers have been combining philosophy of language with social scripts, with emphases on scripts and gender (Berio & Musholt 2022, Hesni 2024, 2025, Emerick, Stockdale, and Yap 2023). However, to the extent that scripts involve narratives (Appiah 2001 Bettcher 2014, Dembroff 2018), and narratives are related to language, all of these thinkers have insights to offer feminist philosophy of language. Stoljar (2014), drawing on the insights of Marina Oshana and Diana Tietjens Meyers, talks about how certain scripts (like motherhood, compulsory heterosexuality (see Dembroff 2014 and Scheman 2011)), are autonomy constraining. Kwame Anthony Appiah argues that life scripts around being gay or being African-American can be constraining to individuals’ autonomy, and Marina Oshana responds with respect to scripts about being an African American woman in particular, arguing that by exercising autonomy over which features are central to one’s identity, one can overcome or resist some agency-constraining features of scripts. Bettcher (2014) argues that sexuality is scripted, in a way analogous to how Butler (1988) tells us that gender itself is scripted, and Dembroff 2014 (drawing on Scheman 2011), points to the existence of heteronormativity scripts and narratives to highlight the injustice of exclusion of non-binary identities in dominant contexts. Eickers (2024) also argues that social scripts reinforce the binary gender system. Hesni (2024) argues that many social scripts place us in double-binds, with an emphasis on sexist and transphobic harassment scripts. Berio & Musholt (2022) connect social scripts to stereotypes, arguing that social scripts play a role in stereotype formation by way of contributing to generics, in contrast with Valian (2005) who argues that scripts are stereotypes, and Hesni (forthcoming) who argues that stereotypes both give rise to social scripts and are informed by social scripts. Spaulding (2018) argues that stereotypes and stereotype-derived inferences makes certain scripts more readily available. Emerick, Stockdale, and Yap (2023) show how gendered scripts around forgiveness place harmful burdens and expectations on women to forgive wrongdoings when it is not in their best interest to do so.

New work in feminist philosophy of language continues to expand.

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Acknowledgments

We are very grateful to David Braun, Eric Devall, Ray Drainville, Sally Haslanger, Chris Hookway, Jules Holroyd, and Nancy Tuana for their invaluable help with this entry. We would also like to thank Kathrin Gluer-Pagin for spotting some misidentified sentences in an earlier version of this entry, and Erik Tellgren for alerting us to Paul Gross’s response to Emily Martin. Special thanks are due to Mary Kate McGowan for her extremely helpful advice on the 2010 update to this entry, and to Ann Garry and Heidi Grasswick for their very useful comments on the 2017 update.

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Feminist Philosophy of Language

1. Early work on language and philosophy of language

1.1 False gender-neutrality

1.2 Invisibility of women

1.3 Maleness as norm

1.4 Sex-marking

1.5 Maleness of Language

1.6 Metaphor

1.7 Philosophy of Language

2. More Recent Work

2.1 Reform Efforts: Successes and Limitations

2.2 Feminism and Speech Act Theory

2.3 On the Meaning of Gender Terms and Concepts

2.4 Ameliorative Projects and Conceptual Engineering

2.5 Hermeneutical Injustice

2.6 Generics

2.7 New Directions

2.7.1 Sexual Communication

2.7.2 Manipulative Communication

2.7.3 Misgendering and Deadnaming

2.7.4 Social Scripts

Bibliography

Academic Tools

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

Browse

About

Support SEP

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	How to cite this entry.
	Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
	Look up topics and thinkers related to this entry at the Internet Philosophy Ontology Project (InPhO).
	Enhanced bibliography for this entry at PhilPapers, with links to its database.

Feminist Philosophy of Language

1. Early work on language and philosophy of language

1.1 False gender-neutrality

1.2 Invisibility of women

1.3 Maleness as norm

1.4 Sex-marking

1.5 Maleness of Language

1.6 Metaphor

1.7 Philosophy of Language

2. More Recent Work

2.1 Reform Efforts: Successes and Limitations

2.2 Feminism and Speech Act Theory

2.3 On the Meaning of Gender Terms and Concepts

2.4 Ameliorative Projects and Conceptual Engineering

2.5 Hermeneutical Injustice

2.6 Generics

2.7 New Directions

2.7.1 Sexual Communication

2.7.2 Manipulative Communication

2.7.3 Misgendering and Deadnaming

2.7.4 Social Scripts

Bibliography

Academic Tools

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

Acknowledgments

Browse

About

Support SEP

Mirror Sites