Feminist Perspectives on Trans Issues

First published Sat Sep 26, 2009; substantive revision Fri Nov 21, 2025

The relationship between feminist and trans theory and politics is surprisingly fraught. The goal in this entry is to outline some of the key philosophical issues at the intersections, and this can be accomplished only by attending to the history thereof. This entry will therefore follow a roughly chronological order, although there will also be some deviations in the timeline to provide sustained philosophical engagements on specific points. While the early theorizing about trans issues did not occur in the discipline of philosophy, some of it has been included because of its philosophical character and pertinence to subsequent disciplinary discussions. Further, because much of the theory arose from on-the-ground political engagements, this entry will mention those engagements. And for additional coverage on the topic more broadly construed, see the general entry on trans philosophy.

Although there are many topics that might be covered, this entry will focus on some of the most general sets of questions. The first are prima facie metaphysical ones. They include the questions what women and men are – questions which might be understood as questions about concepts, meanings of terms, or kinds. They also include the question whether trans self-identifying claims are typically valid (e.g., whether a trans woman who says she is a woman, is a woman). Sometimes this last sort of question is framed as the question whether trans women are women and trans men are men. However, since some trans women and men self-identify as nonbinary, the initial formulation ought to be considered more precise.

The second set of questions are prima facie political ones. They include questions how the oppression of women and the oppression of trans people ought to be understood. To put it differently – if both women and trans people can be oppressed through gender then it would appear that multiple forms of gender oppression are possible. If so, how ought this be theorized? Are feminist politics and trans politics necessarily at odds with each other? Is it possible for trans forms of oppression and sexist forms of oppression to intermesh with each other? What might an intersectional trans feminist look like?

A note on terminology. “Trans terminology” has continued to change over time and at any given time has been subject to political and semantic contestation. For example, while “transsexual” continues to be a term of self-identification for some, for others the term is outdated and offensive. One consequence of this is that any straightforward definition of an expression risks eliding these changes and taking sides on these contestations. For the reason, the terms will often be discussed throughout the entry by placing them within their historical and political location and then using them as appropriate to that time and place. When more general terms are required, the contemporary expressions ‘trans,’ ‘trans woman,’ ‘trans man’, and ‘nonbinary’ will be used, recognizing that this deployment risks anachronism. The expression ‘nontrans’ will be used in place of the expression ‘cis.’

1. The Wrong Body Account

The Wrong Body Account consists of two main claims. First, that trans gender dysphoria is to be accounted for as an incongruence between gender identity and body. Second, that gender identity is either innate or immutable from an early age. There is also a third claim that may or may not be endorsed – namely, that the innateness (or immutability) of this gender identity validates trans claims to belong to this or that gender. This last claim has tended to be voiced by some of those trans folk who have endorsed this account (Hausman 1995, 141–174, Prosser 1998, 99–134). The voicing of it by medical practitioners, by contrast, has been more mixed (contrast Benjamin 1953, 13 and Hamburger et al 1953, 392). The general idea, at any rate, is that, prior to transition, a trans woman is a woman “trapped inside” the body of man and a trans man is a man “trapped inside” the body of a woman. The solution to this medical condition consists in the various technologies of transition including access to surgical and hormonal interventions.

Two intertwined intellectual developments served as preconditions for the view – namely, the field of sexology – the “scientific” study of human sexuality – and the development of hormonal and surgical procedures for changing sex characteristics. Some of the most notable thinkers in sexology include Karl Heinrich Ulrichs (1864 [1994]), Richard von Krafft-Ebing (1886 [1965]), Havelock Ellis (1905 [1942]), and Magnus Hirschfeld (1910 [1991]). The idea of being trapped in the wrong body can be traced to Ulrichs, although it is deployed in a less contemporary way as what we now call gender identity and sexual orientation are not distinguished. Meanwhile, as early as the 1910s Eugen Steinach was experimenting with “transplantation” on animals and by the 1920s and 1930s, hormonal and surgical treatments were being made available to humans, largely through Magnus Hirschfeld’s Institute for Sexual Science (Meyerowitz 2002, 16–21).

In the United States, however, there was a reluctance to provide such treatments owing to concerns about violations of ‘mayhem’ laws. This was ungirded by the view that trans phenomena were purely psychological in character and ought to be treated psychotherapeutically to “cure the mental illness.” By contrast, in Europe, the prevailing view was a “bisexuality theory” which maintained that there was a physical blend of male and female in all human beings and that special cases yielded a “mixed-sex” condition which in some cases justified surgical intervention (Meyerowitz 2002, 98–129).

This began to change in the early 1950s with Christine Jorgensen’s well-publicized transition and U.S. celebrity. In 1953, two articles were published, one by her endocrinologist in the U.S., Harry Benjamin, another by her Danish endocrinologist, Christian Hamburger, psychiatrist, Georg K. Stürup, and lead surgeon, E. Dahl-Iverson. Both articles argued that the desire for medical transformation in “transsexualism,” as Benjamin called it, and “genuine transvestism” (“psychic hermaphroditism,” “eonism” (as Hamburger et al called it), could not be altered through psychiatric treatment and likely had a somatic basis. Benjamin spoke of a “female psyche in a male body” (1953, 12), and Hamburger et al. characterized “eonists” as having a “fundamental feeling of being victims of a cruel mistake – a consequence of the female personality in a male body” (1953, 391). In addition to arguing against the application of ‘mayhem’ laws to prevent access to medical procedures, they also argued against laws prohibiting public cross dressing and in favor of legal recognition consistent with “psyche.”

In 1966, Benjamin published the landmark The Transsexual Phenomenon. Meanwhile, that same year saw the opening of the Johns Hopkins University program for sex- reassignment surgery, with John Money as the lead, ushering in a period of large university-based gender-identity clinics which lasted until the end of the seventies. By the time the Johns Hopkins program closed in 1979, the Harry Benjamin International Gender Dysphoria Association (since renamed The World Health Professional Association for Transgender Health or WPATH) had been formed and had approved standardized criteria for the treatment of transsexuals. A year later, transsexualism was added to the DSM, the same year that homosexuality was removed from it. (In 2000, transsexualism was replaced by gender identity disorder in the DSM-IV and in 2013, this was replaced with gender dysphoria in the DSM-V).

Work by John Money, Joan Hampson, and John Hampson (1955) on intersexuality, the state of having both female and male biological characteristics, converged with the emerging view about “transsexualism”. Their work purported to evade the debate between psychology and biology, arguing that while the capacity to learn a “gender role” (like a language) was biologically grounded, the specific native role learned (like language) was contingent upon social environment which became “locked down” at a very early age (1957). Subsequently, the expression gender identity was coined by Robert Stoller and Ralph Greenson in 1964, which helped terminologically separate the notion of social role from psychological sense-of-self. Stoller defined the latter as “the sense of knowing to which sex one belongs” (1964, 220). It was ultimately taken up by the likes of Money and Harry Benjamin (Meyerowitz 2002, 117–9), and while debate over etiology continued, views allowing for both biology and social environment in determining gender identity gained somewhat greater prominence (Meyerowitz 2002, 119).

Meanwhile, feminist sociologist Ann Oakley, drawing on Stoller’s work, contrasted ‘sex’ as a biological term and ‘gender’ as “a psychological and cultural one” (2015 [1972], 115) in what was one of the earliest feminist deployments of the term ‘gender’ to characterize the sex/gender distinction. Prior to this, expressions such as ‘sex role’ and ‘sex role stereotype’ tended to be used by feminists and many continued to use those terms long after. Indeed, as discussed below, some feminists will come to be critical of the very notion of gender. The issues, far from terminological, concern the question whether the cultural phenomena designated by expressions like ‘sex role’ and ‘gender’ are exhausted by their function in subordinating women or whether they also operate in other forms of subordination and can be repurposed in acts of resistance.

2. The Lesbian Separatist Perspective

Lesbian Separatism is a species of radical feminism where radical feminism itself understands women’s oppression as arising due to patriarchal arrangements, regards sexist domination as the fundamental form of oppression, and which advocates a remaking of society. It is worth noting that several radical feminist thinkers have explicitly endorsed trans affirming feminist views, including Andrea Dworkin (1974) and Catharine A. MacKinnon (2023). Further, Loren Cannon (2016) argues that Shulamith Firestone’s (1970) radical feminist vision of the future – one in which reproduction is facilitated by technological advancement – has begun to be actualized in trans affirming communities and greater recognition of trans lives will yield greater strides towards the revolution Firestone envisioned.

Moreover, prior to the rise of separatism, lesbian perspectives on trans issues were mixed. One of the earliest controversies occurred in the San Francisco chapter of the Daughters of Bilitis in 1972 over the participation of Beth Elliott (a transsexual woman who was serving as vice-president) (Bettcher and Stryker 2016, 276). The side that favored inclusion appealed to the Wrong Body Account above to argue that transsexual women were women, while the side that supported expulsion did not endorse a feminist perspective, such as lesbian separatism (Córdova 1972). Meanwhile, the Lesbian Tide Collective in Los Angeles, led by Jeanne Córdova, articulated a third position that argued common cause in the fight against mandated “sex roles” and in favor of self-definition (Tide Collective, 1972) – a view that anticipated the transgender paradigm of the nineteen-nineties (see below).

These perspectives were overshadowed, however, when controversy ensued at the 1973 West Coast Lesbian Conference in Los Angeles. As Beth Elliott took the stage as a performer, the Gutter Dykes, a group from San Francisco protested the presence of a “man” on lesbian separatist grounds (Stryker 2017, 129–131). While the participants ultimately voted that Elliott could continue performing, Elliott did not stay for the remainder of the conference. The keynote, Robin Morgan, charged Elliott, “as an opportunist, an infiltrator, and a destroyer – with the mentality of a rapist” (Morgan 1977, 181).

Lesbian separatism itself arose in response to mainstream feminist lesbophobia. In 1969–70, Betty Freidan, President of the National Organization for Women (NOW) purged lesbian feminists from leadership positions, concerned about “lesbian baiting.” This, in turn, led to a “zap” at the Second Congress to Unite Women in 1970 (Stryker 2017, 125). Led by Rita Mae Brown, the “lavender menace” seized the stage while distributing the pamphlet “The Woman-Identified Woman” (Radicalesbians 1970 [1988]). Against the view that concerns about prejudice against lesbianism distracted from the mission of feminism, this document argued that such prejudice was integral to sexism, and hence central to feminism. The essence of sexist oppression, in this view, is the mandated heterosexual relation with men through which women are subordinated. The second main idea is that women are conditioned to form self-identities that involve identification with their oppressors and that, consequently, it is critical for women to develop new self-identities by learning to love women and by becoming woman-identified, breaking away from relationships with men.

The lesbian separatist position (as well as any radical feminist position recommending the undoing of socialization under patriarchy) prima facie conflicts with the Wrong Body Account discussed above at least insofar as the latter regards gender identity as fixed from an early age, the former endorses the project of changing one’s identity from man- to woman-identified later in life, suggesting the mutability of gender identity. In other words, the latter treats as fixed certain identities that can be rightfully critiqued from a feminist perspective. However, one might argue, as did Beth Elliott, that there is a distinction between gender identity as the sense of knowing to which sex one belongs (as per Stoller and Greenson), and the internalization of sex stereotypes. It is the latter, she says, not the former that is required to be mutable (Elliott 1973).

Janice Raymond’s The Transsexual Empire (1979) is the most systematic development of the lesbian separatist perspective on transsexuality. She regards medicalization of gender variance and the gender identity clinics as nothing but vehicles to further secure sexist sex roles. Thus, for her, a sexist society is “the first cause” of transsexuality (1979, 16). The role of the medical treatment of transsexuality is to turn men into “women” and women into “men” when they cannot be normed into their natally assigned sex roles. Raymond’s solution to “the problem” of transsexuality which she sees as promoting the surgical violation of bodily integrity, is to “morally mandate it out of existence” (178) by working against sex role oppression through education and consciousness raising (178–185).

For Raymond, the phrase transsexual empire applies to the patriarchal medical establishment which perpetuates sex-role oppression through surgical intervention. (She uses the word empire to refer to “a political unit having a territory of great extent, or a number of territories under a single sovereign authority” (xv). She sees the medical “empire” as including numerous specialties such as urology, gynecology, endocrinology, and so forth. She also sees the collaboration of psychology and psychiatry in hiding what she calls the sovereignty of the medical “empire” by making it appear that there is some need for transsexual medical intervention, as well as the involvement of lawyers and legislators. However, it is the medical establishment, for Raymond, which possesses this sovereignty. So, it is the medical establishment which is the unifying authority of the “transsexual empire” (ibid.)).

Raymond rejects trans self-identifying claims by asserting that membership in the category woman is determined by (1) chromosomes and (2) the individual’s history of experience being assigned to a sex role (1979, 4, 18, 114). In light of this, Raymond maintains that transsexual women are men and transsexual men are women. One worry with her view is that the two criteria can come apart. For instance, individuals born with Complete Androgen Insensitivity Syndrome have XY chromosomes yet will typically experience female socialization because their external morphology is female. A possible solution, endorsed by Germaine Greer, is that such individuals is to commit to the first criterion alone (1999, 74–79). However, such a position runs against the actual experiences of the individuals involved – living as women – as well as the spirit of lesbian separatism itself. In the first edition of Empire, Raymond, by contrast, admits that somebody without XX chromosomes yet with the history of being raised as a woman would be “practically a woman” (1979, 115), although she later reframes this history in terms of bodily events likely to occur to somebody with XX chromosomes (e.g., menstruation, childbirth) (Raymond 1994, xx).

The argument behind the second criterion centers on the idea that ‘woman’ (or ‘womon’) is a term being reclaiming in the face of sexist oppression. For somebody who has not experienced that oppression to self-identify with the term would be both appropriative and semantically empty, analogous to a white person claiming to be black (Raymond 1979, 116). While this argument has force, there are two possible responses. First, many trans women certainly do experience sexist oppression after they transition and not a few trans women transition fairly young. At some point, a reclamation of the term would seem viable (Bettcher 2017a, 402). Second, the term ‘woman’ can be used in multiply oppressive ways. For instance, it can be used as an instrument of racism by centralizing white norms of femininity (e.g., fragility), or as an instrument of homophobia by centralizing heterosexist norms of femininity. This suggests that the term can be reclaimed along multiple vectors of oppression and to the extent that there exists a distinct form of trans oppression – Bettcher suggests “reality enforcement” and the centralization of genitalia –the term could be reclaimed on that basis alone (Bettcher 2017a, 402, see below for further discussion of “reality enforcement”).

Crucial to Raymond’s position, however, is the view that any sort of oppression that trans people face is the side effect of sexist oppression – that is, is a form of collateral damage. This view leads Raymond to ignore trans-specific forms of oppression and resistance. The actual struggle of some scientists and surgeons to make surgeries available to transsexuals, for instance, is ignored in Raymond’s account (Riddell 2006). Such advocates for transsexual surgery were in the minority (certainly in the U.S) and themselves experienced hostility and marginalization. This means that what Raymond calls the transsexual empire was not monolithic. And given the marginalization of these advocates for transsexual surgery, it seems that the medical establishment was not especially friendly to transsexuality (Riddell 2006). Generally, transsexuality was and remains largely unaccepted in society. Contrary to Raymond’s view, it is largely not endorsed by “the patriarchy.”

Meanwhile, Raymond herself engages in oppressive behavior towards trans people by constructing monolithic, stereotypical representations of trans individuals in ways that foreclose the possibility of registering the actual variable experiences of trans people (on this point see Riddell 2006, 152–3, Stone 1991, 298, Heyes 2003, 1095). Most egregiously, she writes, “All transsexuals rape women’s bodies by reducing the real female form to an artifact, appropriating this body for themselves. However, the transsexually constructed lesbian-feminist violates women’s sexuality and spirit, as well. Rape, although it is usually done by force, can also be accomplished by deception” (104).

She points to ways in which (some) transsexual women take up traditional sex roles (and are thereby complicit) on the one hand (77–79), and yet goes on to criticize lesbian-separatist identified transsexual women who have eschewed such roles as oppressively masculine (102–6). In this way, she traps transsexual women with a double-bind: Either they take up traditional sex roles and are thereby sexist or else they eschew these traditional sex roles and are thereby sexist (See Califia 1997, 102, 104–5; Serano 2007, 49). Such a theory isn’t equipped to accommodate the actual variable experiences of transsexual women trying to negotiate gender in a sexist and transphobic world. In this way, Raymond’s theory erases the actual experiences of transsexual women through monolithic, ideologically-driven representations of them. Moreover, because Raymond sees transsexuality as essentially a “male” phenomenon, her discussion of transsexual men is minimal. She argues that transsexual men are mere tokens who are used to prop up claims that transsexuality is a universal phenomenon and thereby hide its true patriarchal character. In this way, their transsexuality is largely dropped out of the picture (xxiii, 27–28, 140; for further critique see Califia 1997, 100–1, Serano 2007, 48). This allows her to avoid discussing transsexual men in any depth at all. And this means that the complex, variable, everyday experiences of transsexual men do not get represented in the first place.

3. The Beyond the Binary Account

In the late 1980’s and early 1990’s, a new framework for understanding trans experience emerged in reaction to the Wrong Body Account and, in particular, to the pathologization of transsexuality, and to anti-trans feminist perspectives such as lesbian separatism – namely, the beyond the binary account. It consisted of the following three claims: First, there exists a form of gender-based oppression, usually targeting trans people, intersex people, and other gender variant people that is distinct from sexist oppression. Second, trans people, intersex people, and gender variant people are problematically situated with respect to the gender binary. (The binary applies to the man/woman, male/female, masculine/feminine, and the alignment of the preceding). Third, those who are so oppressed ought to become visible to contest the presumption of gender binarism. In this view, it is not the body that is wrong, but, rather, the oppressive culture.

This moment witnessed the popularization of the word “transgender” as a broad umbrella term – bringing together different “gender variant” people (including transsexuals, cross-dressers, drag queens and kings, some butches, and others). Originally, the term “transgenderist” had been used by Virginia Prince to refer to somebody who “lived full time” in their preferred gender without availing themselves of any medical interventions (Stryker 2017, 154). But this expansion of the term aimed for unity in the face of hostility toward those who were gender “non-normative”, those who transgress the binary.

The account itself encompasses many variations since the notion of a strict binary may be contested in several respects including its insistence on exclusiveness, exhaustiveness, invariance, and the alignment of male/man/masculine and female/woman/feminine. Further, the very categories themselves or any categories whatever may be contested as politically controlling. For instance, while Leslie Feinberg (1992, 1993, 1996, 1998) emphasizes the historical persistence of transgender people as a distinct kind of people or oppressed group, Kate Bornstein (1994) emphasizes the constructed (and oppressive) nature of gender categories as a whole, the desirability of viewing gender as fashion, and the importance of moving toward a more consensual gender system.

Two major theoretical views form the basis of this paradigm, each having had a profound impact on gender scholarship. First, Sandy Stone’s “The Empire Strikes Back: A Posttransexual Manifesto” launched the inter- and multi-disciplinary field of trans studies. Second, Judith Butler’s Gender Trouble: Feminism and the Subversion of Identity (1990) trailblazed early queer theory. These are discussed below.

3.1 The Empire Strikes Back

In 1977 a controversy erupted in lesbian-separatist circles, led by Raymond, over Sandy Stone, an openly transsexual woman and an engineer who had been working at Olivia Records (an all-woman recording company). Both she and Olivia were then explicitly targeted by Raymond in The Transsexual Empire. After leaving Olivia, Stone earned her doctorate under Donna Haraway at Santa Cruz, and in 1991 published a reply to Raymond and what would become the founding essay in transgender studies, “The Empire Strikes Back: A (post)transsexual manifesto” (Stryker 2017, 115).

Stone takes up a third position in opposition to both the medicalized view of transsexuality characterized by Benjamin’s The Transsexual Phenomenon and the feminist critique offered in Raymond’s The Transsexual Empire. The fundamental move of the essay is to see transsexuals as a kind of “oppressed minority.” While Stone does not position transsexuals as a third gender, she does propose that transsexuals “currently occupy a position which is nowhere, which is outside the binary oppositions of gendered discourse” (1991, 295). Because Stone wishes to avoid appeal to a pre-existing class of individuals who are then oppressed, she represents transsexuality as a genre of discourse. The idea is that traditional medical discourse about transsexuality constitutes a distinctive, regulated way of talking and theorizing which Stone calls a genre. (Contrast, for example, traditional medical discourse on transsexuality with Raymond’s feminist discourse on transsexuality). Stone is suspicious of appealing to a group of individuals prior to the workings of a particular discourse (that is, one which is conceived of as independent of a particular discourse) since, goes the postmodern worry, such an appeal to this group of individuals would nonetheless be at the same time providing an account of them within a discourse – a discourse which could be shaped by ideological commitments. Instead of trying to make such a move, then, Stone identifies a group of individuals as represented through traditional medical discourse about transsexuality.

Drawing on the autobiographies of some transsexual women, Stone finds herself in agreement with Raymond in worrying about what she sees as the uptake of sexist stereotypes by (some) transsexual women (1991, 289). However, she also notes (some) transsexual women’s insistence upon a male/female binary and the absence of any middle or more complex gender ground (286). Beyond this, she criticizes the subjectivity-erasing, blanket claims in Raymond’s work along with the implicit denial of transsexual subjectivity discussed above (298). What is lacking, according to Stone, is space for the discourse of transsexuals as transsexuals. She points to ways in which the medicalization of transsexuality has required both the uptake of sexist behavior as well as the acquiescence to a strict gender binary. In this way, she argues, transsexuals have been complicit in telling a story within a genre that does not necessarily reflect their own subjective experiences (1991, 295). At the same time, argues Stone, transsexuals have also developed their own subcultures as well as distinctive practices within those subcultures that entirely run against the official account of transsexuality (such as helping each other know what to say and how to act in order to get medically designated as a transsexual) (291–2). The solution, Stone argues, is for transsexuals to begin telling their own stories (295). This requires minimally, that post-operative transsexuals come out as transsexual and forego passing as (non-transsexual) men and women (298–9). The traditional medical requirement that one construct a plausible non-trans history to hide one’s past, for Stone, undermines the possibility of authentic relationships. Because the injunction to forego passing as the (non-transsexual) sex one has transitioned into runs entirely against the prevalent discourse of transsexuality as such, Stone represents the political move as post-transsexual (299). She sees that while many transsexuals are complicit in this discourse, they nonetheless go beyond it by attempting, for example, to assist each other in “working” the medical regulations (as explained above). Thus their experiences and actions outstrip the “official” medical accounts of transsexuality. Yet this “outstripping” is rendered invisible in any complicit attempt to fit into a medical account which requires that one’s status as transsexual be ultimately denied in everyday life (through this construction of a false history). For Stone, eschewing this discourse is important because it hides the complex, variable experiences of different trans people who are often positioned in contestatory ways vis a vis this discourse. The move is not designed to find some one authentic and uniform account of transsexuals beyond the medical discourse. It is, rather, to clear the way for discourses from which it is at least possible to speak and to speak politically as a transsexual.

One crucial difference between Raymond’s and Stone’s views about gender (or sex roles) turns on the former’s contrast between integration and integrity. Integration, for Raymond, involves putting together parts to form a complex whole (1979, 163). She sees androgyny as a kind of blend between masculine and feminine and she argues that transsexual surgery also brings about such blends (constructing the individual into a kind of hermaphroditic being) (1979, 165). By contrast, integrity involves a prior wholeness from which no part can be taken away (193). For Raymond, true liberation cannot be secured by any mere blending of sex roles. Rather, it must be secured through a transcendence of sex role altogether (164). Stone, however, doubts the promise of purity and instead celebrates gender mixture, drawing on Donna Haraway’s “A Cyborg Manifesto” (1983, 1991) and Gloria Anzaldúa’s theory of the mestiza (1987).

Haraway’s postmodern image of the cyborg is intended to raise worries, derived largely from writings of women of color, about single, monolithic (identity-based) accounts of oppression/liberation. According to Haraway, the difficulty with such theories is that they are partial in their account of the world (while assuming universality) and so end up ignoring (and even promoting) certain forms of oppression (1991 [1983], 156). The cyborg, then, is a collection of disparate, incongruent parts: Each individual contains multiple elements of oppressor and oppressed. As a metaphor, it is intended to refuse postulations of original innocence and utopian future (1991 [1983], 151). Instead, resistance for Haraway is possible due only to the possibility of the cyborg’s turning against the intentions of its maker in a dystopian environment (151).

This notion of mixture is also central in the work of Anzaldúa, who speaks against an emphasis on purity and in favor of the notion of mixed race (una raza mestiza) (1987, 99). She recognizes herself as a border dweller, torn between the demands of conflicting cultures (for example, anglo and Mexican) (1987, 100). The experience of being caught in the confluence of multiple cultures leads to a kind of multiplicity or fragmentation of self. For example, one might be represented in a racist manner in dominant white forms of feminism and in a sexist manner in dominant forms of racial resistance. This tension between conflicting cultural perspectives yields the possibility of “double” or “Mestiza” consciousness which involves the capacity to see oneself in accordance with the dominant ways in which one is oppressively represented and constrained in different, and often conflicting ways (101–2). It is precisely the capacity to be conscious of this plurality of the self, in Anzaldúa’s view, that allows for resistance, since there is an awareness which outstrips the multiple forms of oppression by viewing them together, as well as in conflict (1987, 102). Such a consciousness also allows for the possibility of “linguistic terrorism” – the creative blending of disparate languages and cultures in ways that work against the monolithic character of each (1987, 75–86).

3.2 Gender Trouble

The political landscape began to change during the late nineteen eighties and early nineteen nineties as the HIV/AIDS pandemic was devasting gay male communities in the U.S. and the horrors of homophobia were on vivid display. Many lesbians began to work closely with gay men and the new issue-driven activism of ACT-UP overshadowed earlier identity-based politics. Judith Butler’s seminal work emerged out of this context.

Aside from arguing against the identity-based politics on the grounds that identity categories were inherently normative and exclusionary, Butler aimed to answer concerns that queer enactments of gender (as in a butch-femme relationship or in gay male drag) merely replicate traditional patriarchal norms. Certainly, lesbian separatist views such as Raymond’s had led to the purging of butch and femme forms of gender presentation in feminist communities.

For Butler, such a view presupposes a heterosexual bias obscuring the way in which gender is re-worked in queer contexts. What they have in mind is that in queer subculture gender practices do not always have the same meaning that they do in mainstream cultural contexts. For example, feminine presentation in some queer contexts may involve a degree of irony not found in mainstream instances of that feminine presentation. To treat queer gender practices as simply repeating or miming non-queer practices without any significant change in meaning is to understand all gender practices in a way that assigns dominant heterosexual meanings to it.

Queer gender performance, far from replicating patriarchal norms, can subvert such norms by exposing their non-natural, imitative character (1990, 174–80). Sometimes queer gender performance can involve irony and/or parody through exaggeration. (Good examples of this can be found in early films by John Waters, such as Female Trouble). Queer gender can make fun of heterosexual gender practices by exaggerating them and parodying them in such ways that make them seem theatrical and contrived. And gay male drag, for Butler, can show that feminine presentation is not the sole property of female individuals. Once it is recognized that such behavior is only contingently assigned to groups of individuals, the very idea that gay drag merely involves imitation of heterosexual women as the original assigns a priority to the latter over the former. This prioritization, for Butler, reflects a heterosexual bias. And, so for Butler, feminist identification of all gendered behavior as inherently sexist (as, for example, found in Raymond’s work) is nothing short of a heterosexist tendency to attach a primacy to heterosexual gender performance.

Butler’s account of gender aims to call into question the pre-existence of a group of individuals (i.e., women, females) prior to the enforcement of gender role. Instead, in Butler’s view, biological sex is culturally instituted and in this sense “gender all along.” Prima facie this view seems counter-intuitive. However, in Butler’s view, whenever we discuss the body, we are also always representing it in culturally specific and normative ways. To speak of the biologically sexed body as somehow prior to particular discourses about it is to, in so doing, nonetheless ironically speak about it within some particular discourse and hence to represent in some way. According to Butler, sex is culturally instituted by representing the body as the natural container of some inner, gendered self. Sex is understood as the bodily indication that concealed within it is the essence of either a woman or a man. For Butler, this view is false. To the extent that this view is pervasive and regulative of human conduct, one can – in this sense – say that sex is socially constructed.

For Butler, behavioral manifestations of gender are often taken to express a prior gender identity that is contained within a naturally sexed body. Thus, feminine behavior is seen as expressive of an inner feminine core (contained within the body sexed female). On the contrary, in their view, such performances simply serve to generate the fiction of a pre-existing gender identity as well as the fiction of the sexed body qua natural container of this identity (1990, 178–9). This is to say: Behavioral manifestations are prior to gender identity and sexed body (rather than the other way around). The illusion of a stably sexed body, core gender identity, and (hetero) sexual orientation is perpetuated through repeated, stylized bodily performances that are performative in the sense that they are productive of the fiction of a stable identity, orientation, and sexed body as prior to the gendered behavior (173).

This allows Butler to answer the charge that queer gender performances merely replicate sexist gender role behavior. In their view, all gender behavior is imitative in character. Heterosexual gender identity involves an instability that it attempts to cover over: While it purports to be grounded in a naturally gendered core, it amounts to nothing more than repeated attempts to imitate past instances of gendered behavior (1990, 185). Thus, there is also a subversive potential of queer drag and camp gender performance, in her view, insofar as it can parody and thereby expose this concealed imitative quality (1990, 174–6). As a consequence, Butler welcomes the proliferation of queer gender behaviors that re-signify, parody, and expose the mechanisms by which the fiction of normative heterosexist gender is created (1990, 184–190).

3.3 Beyond the Binary 2.0

Despite the ascendance of the Beyond the Binary Model, there were trans scholars, such as Viviane Namaste (2000, 2005, 2009), Jay Prosser (1998), and Henry Rubin (1998a, 2003), who worried that the paradigm didn’t accurately capture the realities of transsexual people and, in particular, didn’t leave much space for trans people who didn’t self-identity as “beyond the binary” at all (Namaste 2005, 7). These critiques were connected to several other concerns – both theoretical and political. The work of Jay Prosser (1998, 69) attempted to rehabilitate the Wrong Body Account in a way that could enter into a dialogue with Butler’s views (1990, 1993). Politically, there was concern with a transgender politics of visibility and, moreover it’s affiliation with a queer politic (Rubin 1998a, 276).

The backlash did not merely occur in the theory books. For example, in the United States, various forms of transsexual separatism, were voiced mostly on online social networking sites and blogs. In this type of political view, transsexuals particularly those who have undergone genital reconstruction and who choose not to disclose their trans history, see themselves as non-consensually subsumed under the ‘transgender umbrella’ and wrongly associated with gender non-normative people (such as cross-dressers) (Cooke 2007). While the transgender umbrella was supposed to include transsexuals, there were those transsexuals who had nothing but distain for the term which they saw as coopting them into a political vision that was not their own. In disavowing the term, they were disavowing a politics.

By 2011, at least, some had started to discuss the “death” of the “transgender umbrella” due, in part, to these tensions and due also to the emergence of many youth who were self-identifying as ‘nonbinary,’ ‘genderqueer,’ ‘agender,’ and so forth (Allen 2011). The ideas that circulated in the nineties had now become lived possibilities for young people who were increasingly attracted to identities that opposed the traditional ones. Around this time, a new umbrella term – ‘trans*’ – emerged, motivated by the erasure of nonbinary people from transgender politics (Bussell 2012). While “transgender” had been deployed as an umbrella term for those “beyond the binary,” the dominance of self-identified transgender men and women who do political work under the category “transgender” had seemed to require a new iteration of the beyond the binary vision (although, this time, rather than drag queens and kings, cross dressers, and butches, it was nonbinary-, agender-, gender fluid-, and genderqueer-identified individuals who contested the binary).

Julia Serano’s ground-breaking 2007 book, Whipping Girl, played an important role in this changing landscape by mitigating the tensions (above) by attempting to bring the Wrong Body Account and the Beyond the Binary Account into harmony. By appealing to the notion of an innate subconscious sex, Serano helps move past the requirement that one “always knew” one’s internal sex or gender (78–82). And by recognizing wide variations in nature, she helps obviate concerns about the pathologizing nature of the Wrong Body Account. By postulating innate inclinations to express one’s gender in a wide variety of ways, Serano can say that the insistence on male/masculine and female/feminine binaries was too sharp while also claiming that masculinity may naturally clump towards male, femininity towards female.

Under Serano’s influence, a queer “smash the binary” politic is replaced by one centered on privilege – the privilege of non-trans, or, as they were now named “cis” people. Serano deploys the term cissexualism to indicate the advantaging of those for whom biological sex and subconscious sex are in alignment. The term cisgenderism, by contrast, indicates the assumption that males ought to be masculine and females ought to be feminine (where masculinity and femininity are constituted by the set of attributes typically associated with males and females respectively) (90).

Serano proposes “oppositional sexism” as a vector distinct from what she calls “traditional sexism.” She defines the latter as the belief that males and masculinity are superior to females and femininity and the former as the belief that male and female, along with masculinity and femininity, constitute exclusive categories) (2007, 12–3) and she coins the expression trans-misogyny to capture forms of discrimination which pertain specifically to trans women which principally target their perceived femininity who effectively lie at the intersections of these vectors (13).

One concern with this model, however, is that traditional sexism already seems to involve not only the devaluation of femininity, but also its enforcement as exemplified by the numerous double-binds to which women are subjected (Frye 1983). That is, Serano’s distinction of the two vectors yields an account of “traditional sexism” that is too meagre (Bettcher 2021). Another concern is that, for Serano, while some forms of femininity may be socially instituted, many feminine attributes may also be biologically grounded (2007, 339). In Serano’s view, many (nontrans) feminists have engaged in negative assessments of femininity (viewing it as strictly an imposed artifice) and thereby implicated themselves in a form of sexism. Indeed, Serano claims that any feminist critique of trans femininity is inherently anti-feminist (2007, 360). The worry is that Serano under-estimates the degree and depth of female subordination. While she may be right to raise worries about the ways in which the behavior of trans women has been unfairly judged, a position which allows for no analysis of politically problematic gender behavior at all seems to seriously impair feminism’s critical force.

3.4 Transfeminism

The Combahee River Collective’s Black Feminist Statement (1977 [1981]) constitutes one of the earliest rejections of lesbian separatism. Arguing for the unacceptability of abandoning their black men in the struggle against racism, the collective articulates the basic idea of what Kimberlé Crenshaw will later call ‘intersectionality’ (1989). In additional to being oppressed due to racism and sexism, argues the collective, black women experience forms of intermeshed forms of oppression that cannot be separated into discrete vectors. For instance, they write of “racial-sexual oppression, which is neither solely racial nor solely sexual, e.g., the history of rape of Black women by white men as a weapon of political repression.” Further, black women experience forms marginalization when feminist movements are controlled by white women and black liberation movements are controlled by black men. Instead, the collective insists upon an integrated analysis of racism, sexism, classism, and heterosexism.

Drawing on this idea, Emi Koyama regards characterizes trans feminism as “primarily a movement by and for trans women who view their liberation to be intrinsically linked to the liberation of all women and beyond” (2003, 244). In this view, trans oppression intersects with sexism oppression and other forms of oppression such as racist and classist forms of oppression. Through this intersectional transfeminist lens, Koyama discusses the controversy concerning the Michigan Womyn’s Music Festival and the ‘womyn-born womyn’ policy which excluded trans women. (In 1991, the same year Stone published her manifesto, Nancy Jean Burkholder was denied entrance to the Land at Michigan Womyn’s Music Festival, leading to protests the following year and the formation of Camp Trans in 1994.)

Specifically, Koyama criticizes the efforts of some post-operative trans women to accept a “compromise” policy which would have admitted only post-operative trans women. Such a policy, argues Koyama, would unfairly advantage those trans women with greater economic resources, and is consequently both classist and racist (2006, 700). Koyama also argues that even if it is true that non-trans women require their own space, this does not preclude the admission of trans women into the festival, since while women of color have special exclusionary space on the land, this does not require that white women cannot enter the festival at all (701). Moreover, Koyama points out, such special space for women of color does not exclude those women of color who can pass as white (and thereby receive certain privileges) (701). Indeed, Koyama argues, the exclusion of trans women is inherently racist insofar as it is uses differences in experience to rule out trans women, a policy which can only make sense if it is presupposed that feminist solidarity requires a monolithically shared experience (704).

Cameron Awkward-Rich (2017, 836–7), however, points to the way the experiences of trans men and trans masculine people more generally challenge the notion that the purview of feminism is determined by the category woman. Trans men and trans masculine people can be subject to sexist oppression and attempts at socialization as girl as children and, further, can be subject to sexist violence even after transition. Since they can be subject to sexism, they ought to be subjects of feminist concern, despite the fact that they are not women. Observing that while both Stone’s and Koyama’s manifesto promise a sequel centralizing trans men, none have ever been forthcoming, Awkward-Rich suggests that Koyama’s model merely replicates traditional intersectional forms of feminism while obscuring the deeper challenges posed by trans men and masculine individuals to traditional conceptions of feminism. (For related discussion see Hale 1998b, Rubin 1998b, Salamon 2010.)

4. Early Disciplinary Perspectives

C. Jacob Hale’s work in the late nineteen-nineties is among the earliest instances of disciplinary trans philosophy and, reflective of the time, articulates a largely beyond-the-binary conception of trans experience. Hale defends the view that the category woman is what Wittgenstein called a family-resemblance concept. This position enables Hale to then argue, pace Monique Wittig’s contentious claim that lesbians are not women (1992), that some lesbians are women, others are not, and for some there is no fact of the matter (1996, 115). Similarly, Hale argues, there is no single feature which can distinguish between butch and ftm individuals and that both categories are family-resemblance concepts (1998a, 323). If so, claims Hale, it would be better to speak of a border zone where the categories partially overlap with each other than to search for a firm boundary between the two (323).

Drawing on María Lugones’s notion of ‘world’-travelling (Lugones 1987), Hale speaks of “border zone dwellers” – individuals who live at the edges of multiple, overlapping identity categories. For Hale, border zone dwellers, those who occupy ‘dislocated locations,’ may fit within different categories (‘man’, ‘ftm’, ‘butch’, ‘genderqueer’ etc.) that attach to different cultural ‘worlds’ (1998b, 116–7). However, since these border zone dwellers are marginal with respect to the categories, their fit in all cases will be only limited and tenuous. (Hale thereby modifies Lugones’ conception of ‘world’-travel, which does not postulate such a tenuous fit into categories, instead, emphasizing the multiplicity of languages and systems of meaning (117)).

In one of the earliest pro-trans feminist discussions, Naomi Scheman (1997) proceeds with the assumption that marginal lives “are lived, and hence livable” (132). She considers the unintelligibility of her own secular Judaism under Christianormativity insofar as a Jewish people conceptually required by Christianormativity, and yet rendered unintelligible by its representation of all religions as entirely conversion-based (1997, 128). By contrast, she argues, heteronormativity requires a “natural” binary of women and men, transsexuals are paradoxically defined by an insistence of having always been the other sex all along and thereby required to deny their own histories (138–9). Just as individuals may convert to Judaism, Scheman suggests, transsexual women may be understood to “convert” to womanhood. In both cases, such individuals are no less real than those who have been assigned the categories at birth (144). (While she recognizes that transsexuals do not choose their gender, as one might choose to convert to a religion, she also suggests that by viewing sex/gender as more analogous to Jewishness in this respect, some of its oppressiveness might be undermined (145)). Such converts, Scheman explains, count every bit as much as women as those who have been “perinatally pinked” – that is those who have experienced oppression as female from birth (141–2).

Cressida Heyes continues this project of finding grounds for solidarity. Heyes argues that both Raymond (and Bernice Hausman, not discussed in this entry) are caught in the grip of a picture which precludes any examination of their own gender privilege while foreclosing the possibility of perceiving trans resistance (2003, 1095). This foreclosure is accomplished through assimilating all transsexual subjectivity into to a hetero-patriarchal medical discourse about transsexuality (2003, 1095). Using Feinberg’s book Trans Liberation as an example, Heyes also raises worries about a transgender politics which says that individual gender expression ought not be subject to criticism, restriction, or oppression. She observes that gender is not merely an aesthetic style or expression of an isolated self. It is relational and often embedded in problematic systems of oppression. What is missing from accounts which merely tout gender freedom of expression, Heyes argues, is a rich “ethics of transformation” which distinguishes between progressive transformations from those who are oppressed and marginalized and hegemonic (i.e., dominant; oppressive) forms of gender that only further oppression and marginalization (2003, 1111–3). In this way, she seeks to find some middle, common ground.

5. The Feminist Philosophical Purview

The late 1990’sand early 2000’s saw several feminist philosophers responding to the challenges of Butlerian queer theory and the upshots of intersectionality – both of which appear to undermine the view that the purview of feminism can be set by the concept of woman. The former regards the concept as serving a regular function that performs various exclusions. The latter (“the problem of difference”) suggests that there is no unifying category at all. On the supposition that ‘woman’ does not mean ‘adult, female human’ but rather something social, (since this that would appear to go against the feminist insight that womanhood is not a fact of biology, but, rather, a fact of culture), there do not appear to be any features all women have in common. This is because all social features such as status, role, and so forth, are inflected by racial privilege and oppression (as has already been exemplified by the failures of lesbian separatism to address racial oppression). Initial responses did not centralize or, in some cases, even include the question of trans inclusion. This changed in the two thousand teens.

5.1 Initial Responses

In Nathalie Stoljar’s view (1995) the problem of difference can be solved by endorsing a family-resemblance analysis concept of woman. She also endorses resemblance nominalism – the view that tokens constitute a type by participating in a resemblance structure, and she says that the concept woman applies to that type. Stoljar says that the type is constituted through several exemplars and that an individual’s membership in the type is determined by sufficiently resembling some exemplar. Notably, Stoljar suggests that at least some trans women might count as exemplary, while also suggesting that others will be “hard cases.” (While she does not state this, this also means that some trans men will be “hard cases”). In this way, her account might be described as partially trans-exclusionary.

Sally Haslanger (2000 [2012]), by contrast, proposes an ameliorative account. Rather than providing a description or analysis of the existing concept of woman, she asks what concept feminists ought to use in light of their goals of ending sexist oppression. In doing so, she advocates a revisionary way of using ‘woman,’ for feminist philosophers, that ostensibly departs from the ordinary way of speaking. In Haslanger’s view, woman ought to be defined in terms of subordination. Specifically, she proposes that one functions as a woman in some context just in case one is subordinated on the basis of presumed female sex (i.e. female biological role in reproduction) in that context (235). And she says that one is a woman just in case one typically (“regularly, and for the most part”) functions as woman (234). Notably, this leads to the exclusion of trans women who are presumed biologically male and the inclusion of trans men who are presumed biologically female. (Haslanger’s view would prove to be tremendously generative, particularly in teens and twenties).

For Linda Alcoff (2006), the biological division of reproductive roles in humans serves as the basis for a distinction in objective type (174). In her view, women are characterized by a “relationship of possibility to biological reproduction, with biological reproduction referring to conceiving, giving birth, and breast-feeding, involving one’s own body” (172). This relationship of possibility is partly hermeneutical, by which Alcoff means that reproductive possibilities shape a life, shape the horizon of possibilities, by which an embodied individual experiences themself in relation to their future (175). This account seems to suggest that no trans women would count as women, since no trans women would have the right hermeneutical relationship to biological reproduction (while all trans men would).

Finally, Mari Mikkola (2009, 2016) argues that no answer to the question “What is a woman?” is required to determine the feminist purview. Rather, feminists need only rely on the intuitions of ordinary language speakers to determine the concept’s extension. With regard to trans people, however, Mikkola admits that intuitions may fail us. However, she later goes on to propose that the trans inclusion question is ultimately going to be settled by nontrans feminists in negotiation with trans people and is hence political, not semantic. For example, it may be determined for the purposes of improving treatments of ovarian cancer, trans women do not count as women, while trans men would. One worry with this proposal is the asymmetry in supposing that whether or not trans women are included within the feminist purview is an open question, while this is not the case for nontrans women. Another is the oddity in supposing that the inclusion of trans women is to be determined, in part, by nontrans feminists when the reverse is not true.

5.2 The Feminist Purview 2.0

Stephanie Kapusta (2016) argues from a decidedly trans perspective that misgendering inflicts moral, psychological, and political harms on trans people. More pointedly, she argues that any philosophical analysis of the concepts woman and man, including feminist ones, that would lead to the misgendering of some group of trans people, if such an analysis were broadly implemented in society, is unacceptable from a trans political perspective. It is notable, then, that attempts at analysis in the twenty-teens were far more attentive to trans identities.

Partially in response to Haslanger’s ameliorationist account, Jennifer Saul provides a more descriptivist semantic contextualist analysis of the term ‘woman’ that centralizes trans and intersex people (2012). Saul’s aim is to make a case about methodology – namely, to show how political considerations, such as doing justice to trans women’s claims to be women have a bearing on how one does philosophy of language. While she proposes that the referent of ‘woman’ as ordinarily used is determined by context in a rule-governing way such that in many contexts trans women count as women, it is also not an account she finally endorses precisely because she does not think it does justice to the claims of trans women in a non-trivializing way. Specifically, she notes that while it will be true that trans women are women in some contexts, it will not be true in others and that, moreover, in contexts involving restrooms that matter will have to be settled by extra-semantic moral and political considerations.

However, Esa Díaz-León (2016) attempts to address Saul’s reservations (mentioned above) by adopting a semantic contextualism that is not dependent upon the particular beliefs of the attributor about the relevant standards at play to make determinations about, say, restroom use, but, rather, the objective features of the context itself where the relevant standards are those that are relevant for practical purposes. Thus, argues Díaz-León, the considerations Saul takes to be extra-semantic are semantic after all. One worry is that regardless of the success of Díaz-León’s account, there will still be contexts in which trans women do not count as women and that therefore trans women will still be marginalized roughly in the way that they are marginalized in the family-resemblance account (Bettcher 2017b).

Meanwhile, Katharine Jenkins (2016), criticizing the trans exclusionary upshot of Haslanger’s account, attempts a reformulation of it. The problem, according to Jenkins, concerns Haslanger’s “focal analysis” (i.e., its centralizing of gender-as-hierarchy). While Haslanger recognizes multiple senses of ‘woman’ (e.g. gender identity), anything other than gender-as-class would be merely secondary. Jenkins, by contrast, defends an account with branching target concepts, gender-as-class and gender-as-identity. She argues that both are equally important in providing a feminist account of oppression. While the former is intended to capture external forms of oppression, the latter is intended to accommodate the possibilities of internalized oppression (and resistance).

She changes Haslanger’s analysis of functioning as a woman in some context to an analysis of being classed as a woman in some context and then she provides a “norm-relevancy” account of gender identity according to which female gender identity is “an internal ‘map’ that is formed to guide someone” classed as a woman through the social and/or material realities that are, in that context characteristic of women as a class (Jenkins 2016, 410). In this view, somebody with a female gender identity will experience feminine norms as relevant to herself – that is, as something that can be complied with or resisted. One worry about Jenkins’s account of identity, is that some trans women may not have such a gender identity defined in this way prior to any experience in the world as women (since they haven’t been socialized as women) and that, therefore, they won’t count as women in this account after all (Bettcher 2017a, see also Adler 2017, Barnes 2022 for criticism).

6. Evil Deceivers and Make-Believers

In work largely orthogonal to the preceding, from the mid two-thousands onwards, Talia Mae Bettcher develops a trans feminist account of trans oppression that, she claims, does not reduce to the beyond the binary account (discussed above). She begins with the deceiver/pretender representation of trans people (the view that trans people are either trying trick people into believing they are something they are not or that they are openly pretending to be something they are not). She argues that this representation constitutes a double-bind – either come out as a pretender or refuse and be exposed as a deceiver (2007). This bind, Bettcher argues, is grounded in what she calls the appearance-reality contrast (“appearing to be a man, is really a woman”) and she dubs this phenomenon by which trans identities are invalidated “reality enforcement.”

The appearance-reality contrast arises, argues Bettcher, due to a representational relation between public gender presentation and private genital status. That is, public gender presentation invasively communicates genital status (2007). Crucially, for Bettcher, “genital status” is not a biological feature, but, rather a moral one insofar as genitals and information about them are subject to socially determined boundaries on privacy and decency (2012b). It is for this reason that “reality enforcement” is an abusive phenomenon that cannot be reduced to the verification of some biological truth.

Bettcher argues that reality enforcement cannot be accommodated in the Beyond the Binary Account and that the Wrong Body Account, while flawed for naturalizing social phenomena and distorting trans experience, can be understood as a resistant gesture in response to reality enforcement when deployed by trans people and therefore not as reactive as hitherto supposed (2014). She also argues that the communicative function of gender presentation is grounded in (hetero) sexist and racist sexual violence and sexual manipulation, thereby providing an account of trans oppression that she feels accommodates an intersectional analysis in a way that the Beyond the Binary Account cannot (2007, 2016). This analysis is expanded by Francisco Galarte (2021) in a Chicano context and Andrea Pitts (2022) in an indigenous context.

Drawing on María Lugones’s (1987) notion of ontological pluralism, Bettcher argues that alternative practices exist in trans subcultures (“worlds”) that do not replicate the abusive structure in the dominant “world” and that stand in contestation to it (2014). These extra discursive practices underwrite and are interwoven with the discursive practices of gender attribution. In trans “worlds”, Bettcher argues, claims like “x is a woman” function like “x is sad” rather than “x is tall” (2009). The former, unlike the latter, involves privileging first-person, present tense avowals with first-person authority (FPA). This authority, rather than epistemic, argues Bettcher, is grounded in an ethical demand for “taking responsibility” of one’s attitudes by “publicly certifying” them and gender avowals specifically are instances of taking responsibility for one’s existential self-identity (2009). Preceding the so-called transgender tipping point of 2014, Bettcher’s work sets the stage for explosion in trans philosophy that would follow it.

7. Gender-Critical Feminism and Philosophy

While there had been earlier efforts to promote philosophy written by trans philosophers, critical mass was not achieved until after the so-called ‘transgender tipping point’ of 2014. (The expression was originally intended to refer to the increased positive cultural visibility trans people, as exemplified by the appearance of Laverne Cox on the cover of Time magazine in May 2014. Given the political backlash against trans people since then, the qualification “so-called” appears warranted). The expression ‘trans philosophy’ began to circulate around the time of the Trans Experience in Philosophy Conference in Eugene, Oregon in 2016, as trans and nonbinary graduate students and junior professors began to produce work in the nascent field (Zurn 2016).

It was also around this time that controversy surrounding trans people in the profession seemed to explode. Most notable was a controversy in 2017 that rocked the journal Hypatia when it published an article by a white nontrans woman who argued that the legitimacy of transgender entailed the legitimacy of “transracialism” (Tuvel 2017). The publication of the article sparked a backlash – a public letter demanding its retraction due to its lack of grounding in the relevant literature by trans philosophers and philosophers of color, and then a backlash against the backlash decrying attacks on academic freedom (Kapusta 2018, Dembroff 2020). Other moments included a heated engagement between gender-critical feminist Kathleen Stock and trans feminist philosopher, Talia Mae Bettcher, as gender-critical feminism was beginning to make its presence known in the profession of philosophy. (See Dembroff 2020 for further discussion of these issues).

Gender-critical feminism expresses concern over the focus on the concept of gender which it takes to obscure sex-based oppression. In this view, any other form of gender-based oppression is merely a collateral effect of the oppression of women. Although details vary, it is typified by its rejection of trans self-identifying claims and right to access segregated spaces that align with their identities. Gender critical feminism can be regarded as continuous with trans-exclusionary forms of radical feminism, although it need not be…. It needn’t, for instance, regard sexism as the preeminent form of oppression, nor need it advocate a total reformation of society.

This form of feminism appears to have arisen around the time the public statement “Forbidden Discourse: The Silencing of Feminist Criticism of Gender” (2013) was circulated, signed by prominent radical feminists (Stryker 2017, 226). While ostensibly a protest of unfair suppression of any radical feminist critique of trans gender politics, this radical feminist critique was notably conflated with feminism per se and touted the importance of excluding trans women from feminist space. This statement was followed by Sheila Jeffreys’s Gender Hurts (2014), which while largely rehearsing the arguments of Janice Raymond, also provides a more in-depth discussion of transgender men – effectively arguing transition is motivated by a response to patriarchal domination and abuse.

Gender-critical feminists played a crucial role in the defeat of a proposed reform to the UK’s Gender Recognition Act (2004) which would have shifted the criteria for a Gender Recognition Certificate from a medical diagnosis of gender dysphoria to that of self-identification. The Government Consultation of 2018 led to considerably controversy, with gender-critical feminists providing the most prominent voice in opposition to the reform. In the wake of the defeat of the reform, anti-trans sentiment and legislation has been on the rise in the UK. Two of the most prominent gender-critical feminist philosophers are discussed below.

According to Kathleen Stock, the term ‘woman,’ in its ordinary use, means ‘adult, female human.’ While she simply asserts this claim, Alex Byrne (2020) has defended the closely related thesis that the biconditional ‘S is a woman iff S is an adult human female’ is true in all possible worlds. His thesis has subsequently been disputed on several grounds. One general concern is Byrne’s undefended assumption that terms such as ‘woman’ have one “standard” meaning, rather than possessing meanings that are contextual determined or that are polysemous (Dembroff 2021). Other grounds involve the ‘adult, female human’ formulation itself and its application to trans women. Heartsilver (2021) argues that even if Byrne’s analysis is correct, trans women who engage in certain gender affirming technologies may still count as women. Arvan (2023), by contrast, engages in traditional conceptual analysis to argue that ‘female’ and ‘adult’ are ambiguous between social and biological senses, that ‘woman’ is only interchangeable with ‘adult female’ in the gendered (social) sense, and that trans women therefore count as women. (See also Dembroff 2021 for discussion of the social sense of adult and Bettcher 2025 for a position related to Arvan’s). Adopting an anti-ameliorationist position, at any rate, Stock argues that feminists ought not permit any revision in the meaning of the term, since sex is real (i.e., not merely socially constructed) and since sex differences matter.

Some of the reasons Stock (2021) cites for the importance of tracking sexual differences between male and female humans include the relevance of biological differences to medical treatment as well as to social barriers conditioned by those differences (e.g., pregnancy). By refusing to use sex terms to name biological categories, and by revising terms like ‘woman’ away from their alleged original meaning, Stock claims, valuable information would be lost. Notably, however, she does not consider the possibility of using the distinction between ‘cis’ (or ‘nontrans’) and ‘trans’ to help track such information – a distinction which would prima facie seem to secure more information, rather than less.

Stock (2021) also argues that public restrooms, changing rooms, and the like ought to be segregated on the basis of “biological sex.” She argues that the reason for such segregation is the overall greater physical size and strength of males relative to females and the tendency of sexual aggression of the former towards the latter. In light of this, because trans women are biological males, Stock claims, they ought not be permitted into spaces designated for females. Finlayson, Jenkins, and Worsdale (2018 – see Other Internet Resources) argue, however, that it is far from clear that biological factors alone contribute to male violence against females and that socialization would also appear relevant. Given that trans women have different gender identities, their experience of socialization is going to be different, and because of this the inference from male violence to the potential violence of trans women is questionable. Notably, Stock (2021, 2022) does not address this argument, nor does she take into account the evidence that policies allowing trans women access to women’s facilities does not lead to any increase in risk to nontrans women (Hasenbush et al 2019).

Holly Lawford-Smith defends a gender-critical feminism which she regards as a continuation of, yet distinct from, and a revival of radical feminism (2022). She represents this radical feminism as entirely trans-exclusive, thereby ignoring the inclusive positions of some radical feminists. Notably, Lawford-Smith expressly rejects intersectional feminism on the grounds that it generates too many issues for feminism to accommodate (2022). Instead, she argues, that issues caused by intermeshed oppressions ought to be divvied up among different identity-based groups or referred to a single group devoted to intersectional matters. While lesbian separatism did not, of course, use the term ‘intersectionality,’ Lawford-Smith’s position would require its rejection since it regards women’s oppression as secured through compulsory heterosexuality.

Lawford-Smith (2022) regards women as a sex caste. In this view, biological sex is not socially constructed, and gender consists in norms that are assigned to the sexes to subjugate females. (Contrast this with Butler’s counter-proposal that these norms are those that secure heterosexuality while abjecting queerness). In her view, then, while the oppression of trans men is due to their being women and thereby part of the oppressed caste, any oppression trans women is a collateral effect. Specifically, trans women who pass as (nontrans) women, will be subject to oppression intended for females, while trans women who do not pass will be punished for failing to abide by norms of masculinity – norms which help secure the subordination of women. One concern is that Lawford-Smith does not recognize distinctive forms of trans oppression that do not conform to this dichotomy (Killmister forthcoming). Another is that she does not even recognize that trans women who do not pass or who are out as trans are subject to various forms of sexism and sexist violence (Killmister forthcoming). For a thorough critique of Lawford-Smith’s metaphysics, see Killmister forthcoming.

Like Stock, Lawford-Smith argues for sex-segregation on the basis of “biological sex.” However, unlike Stock, Lawford-Smith addresses the argument (above) from Finlayson, Jenkins, and Worsdale (2018 – see OIR). Lawford-Smith’s strategy (2022) is to dismiss the notion of gender identity as merely philosophical, disregarding its deep roots in sexology and psychology, and instead embracing the controversial theories of Ray Blanchard who distinguished trans women into those with “autogynephilia” and those who were homosexual (see Serano 2020 for a summary of the views as well as the concerns). Like Stock, Lawford-Smith does not take into account the evidence indicating that trans-inclusive policies leads to no increase in risk of violence against (nontrans) women (Hasenbush et al. 2019).

8. Decolonial Feminism/Decolonizing Trans

While the concept of intersectionality recognizes the intermeshing of vectors of oppression such as racism and sexism, decolonial feminism situates these intersections historically in the emergence of settler-colonialism and slavery. The most influential theorist in this tradition has been María Lugones (2007, 2010, 2020). Drawing on Aníbal Quijano’s work, Lugones recognizes “the coloniality of power” and “the coloniality of modernity.” The former involves the worldwide imposition of racial categories and thereby the racialization of the social areas of labor, collective authority, sex, and subjectivity/intersubjectivity. The latter involves the naturalization of European ways of knowing and with that the representation of Europeans as “culturally advanced” and non-Europeans as “primitive.”

Lugones (2007) breaks from Quijano by bringing out his assumptions that the social area of sex involves male heterosexual access to females. Specifically, he presumes the inferiority of females, sexual dimorphism, and heterosexualism. According to Lugones (2007), however, these are not natural facts but features of the Eurocentric-system. Lugones (2007) then posits what she calls the colonial/modern gender system in which there is both a light and dark side of the gender that is of a piece with the imposition of race. While the light side involves the presumptions of female inferiority, sexual dimorphism, and heterosexualism, the dark side involves deviancy and deficiency with regard to the light. In other words, while the gender system was imposed on those who were colonized and enslaved, they were not situated on the light side. This, in turn, raises concerns about any politics which focuses on the light side of gender exclusively.

In subsequent work, Lugones (2010) develops this view in two important ways. First, using ‘gender’ in the sense of the cultural correlate of sex, she argues that those on the dark side were not taken to have gender. Instead, “sex was made to stand alone.” Because of this, maintains Lugones, anatomical females on the dark side were not constituted as women, anatomical males were not constituted as men, and through these respective failures neither were constituted as human. Second, using ‘gender’ to name the system of power in which gender (above) and sex were co-constituted racially, Lugones rejects the presumption of gender universality – namely that all cultures have “gender relations.” In light of the latter, Lugones is suspicious of the possibility of resistance through the gender system and, more specifically, any resistant reclamations of womanhood since such resistance would obscure the way in which gender was imposed on cultures without any such correlate. Consequently, Lugones (2020) is specifically critical of queer and trans theory for presuming gender universality and for promoting the proliferation of genders as a mode of resistance (see Butler).

Brooklyn Leo (2020), however, raises worries about Lugones own presumption of “cisness” and her erasure of both the oppression and resistance of Two-Spirit peoples under colonialism through her own account which, as discussed above, merely distinguishes between anatomical males and females and cannot therefore register violence specific Two-Spirit people. Moreover, Leo contests Lugones’s claim that resistance is not possible through the colonial/modern gender system, pointing, for instance, to the work of C. Riley Snorton (2017) . Snorton argues that the racist treatment of black people as fungible and ungendered was utilized for purposes of escaping slavery through cross-dressing and passing. Indeed, argues Snorton, the development of these practices paved the way for what is now called “transgender” so that trans and blackness are inextricably bound together.

Meanwhile, Bettcher (2025), developing her own account more deeply, attempts to answer Lugones’s challenge to trans theory by situating “reality enforcement” within the colonial/modern gender system. Specifically, Bettcher argues for the constructedness of nakedness, recasting the contrast between public gender presentation and genital status as a contrast between proper (clothed) and intimate (unclothed) appearance which together constitute what she calls “the physical person.” Bettcher introduces the notion of interpersonal spatiality – the thought that all sensory and discursive encounters between us admit of closeness and distance as determined by boundaries – and argues that physical personhood is a function of an abusive system of interpersonal spatiality (“the folk system”) which admits of a distinction in types of boundary structures (morally male and morally female) which she calls “moral sex”. Bettcher argues that this system was a feature of the colonial/modern gender system where those on the dark side were dehumanized through associations between nakedness and “primitivity” and denials of modesty. Further, Bettcher proposes that while gender may not be universal, interpersonal spatiality likely is and that this opens the door to resistant possibilities of refiguring elements of the colonial/modern system by redeploying them in resistant forms of interpersonal spatiality.

9. Conclusion

While early (nontrans) feminist perspectives on trans issues were marked by hostility, trans studies and politics have emerged in complex reaction and interaction with feminist and queer theory and politics as something to be recognized. As time has passed, it seems the possibility of productive interplay between feminist and trans theory and politics as well as solidarity between trans and nontrans feminist is being realized. However, as trans people have become increasingly visible a resurgence in anti-trans sentiment has made these developments more challenging.

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