Feminist Perspectives on Sex Markets

First published Fri Jul 17, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Lori Watson replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Critiques of markets in sexually explicit materials (pornography) and sex (prostitution) have been a cornerstone of feminist activism and scholarship throughout the 20th and 21st century. During the 20th century, the mainstream feminist position held that both pornography and prostitution were sexually exploitative practices and feminist efforts ought to be directed at abolishing them. This view was especially prominent in the 1970s with the second wave of feminism emerging at that time. However, there have always been feminists who reject the claims that pornography and prostitution are sexually exploitative. While these voices were once a minority, during the latter part of the 20th century and into the 21st century, the view that pornography and prostitution (sex work) are potential sites of women’s agency and liberation has become a much more common view. Central to the debates among feminists are issues such as: whether pornography and prostitution are harmful (uniquely to women), and if so, in what ways? Whether pornography can be feminist, and if so, how? Whether markets are “morally neutral” or whether markets transform certain exchanges in pernicious ways? What role, in any, should the state have in regulating markets in sex or sexually explicit materials? And, finally, how are pornography, prostitution, and sex trafficking related?

1. Pornography

1.1 Feminist Definitions of Pornography

Traditionally and legally, pornography has been understood as potentially obscene material. Obscenity-based approaches to sexually explicit materials justify state regulation of “obscenity” on the grounds that such materials lack significant social value, harm community values (morality) and harm individuals either by offending them or by appealing to their “prurient interest” in sex (Miller v. California (1973) and West 2022). Feminist definitions of pornography break from obscenity-based approaches by emphasizing the gendered dimensions of sexually explicit materials (sexual objectification of women, specifically, for example). Thus, some feminists describe pornography as “sexist propaganda” or “anti-woman propaganda” (Morgan 1980, 139; Brownmiller 1980, 32). Yet other “sex-positive” feminists aim to redefine and change pornography so that women’s sexuality and pleasure are centered within it. Thus, one layer of the debate among feminists is precisely how to define pornography. Debates about definitions of pornography are broad and extend far beyond feminist engagement (see, Rea 2001, for example); this entry will hone in on the specific debates within feminist approaches.

Feminist anti-pornography positions can be distinguished with respect to whether they emphasize the “immorality” or the “political inequality of women” constitutive of pornography as the basis for problematizing certain sexually explicit materials. Helen Longino emphasizes the immorality of pornography while offering this definition: sexually explicit representations that “have as a distinguishing characteristic the degrading and demeaning portrayal of the role and status of the human female…as a mere sex object to be exploited and manipulated sexually” (Longino 1980, 42). She further clarifies: “What makes a work a work of pornography, then, is not simply its representation of degrading and abusive sexual encounters, but its implicit, if not explicit, approval or recommendation of sexual behavior that is immoral, i.e., physically or psychologically violates the personhood of one of the participants” (Longino 1980, 43). On this view, the endorsement of women’s degradation is central to what counts as pornography and the harms it is said to instantiate and bring about. Specific harms that Longino identifies are: pornography “is implicated” in violence against women, it is “defamatory and libelous,” spreading “a deep and vicious lie about women,” and it “reinforces the oppression and exploitation of women” by offering a “distorted view of women’s nature,” embodying sexist views of women (Longino 1980, 48).

Longino, like some other anti-pornography feminists (Gloria Steinem, for example), distinguishes “erotica” from pornography, where erotica is defined as sexually explicit material in which all participants treat one another with “mutual respect” or in an egalitarian way (Longino 1980; Steinem 1980, 30). Other feminists argue there can be no “equality in porn” (Brownmiller 1980, 32). Critics contend the distinction between pornography and erotica is ultimately groundless and reduces to individual preferences (Willis 1995, 124).

Challenges with Longino’s definition concern the fact that determining whether some sexually explicit material is pornography appears to be a matter of interpretation as to what constitutes “degrading” or “demeaning” material. Moreover, discerning whether a specific piece of pornography entails “approval” of the acts depicted can be a matter of subjective interpretation as well. Sex positive feminists—those who argue that, at least, some sexually explicit materials can be liberating and empowering for women—point to the vague and contestable nature of the terms deployed by Longino. For example, critics claim that when women consent to acts others deem “degrading,” such as sadomasochist sex acts, they are acting freely and thinking otherwise demeans their agency (Vance 1984).Unlike Longino’s morality-based definition, Andrea Dworkin and Catharine A. MacKinnon, separately and together, mobilized a critique of pornography as a political and “not a moral issue” (MacKinnon 1987, 146–162). On MacKinnon’s view, morality addresses questions of good or evil, whereas politics concerns questions of power and powerlessness (MacKinnon 1987, 164). She argues that what passes as “morality” as such, under conditions of sex inequality, reflects a male dominant point of view. MacKinnon describes her critique of male power as “about what is, the meaning of what is, and the way what is, is enforced,” while stating that her work is “not a moral tract. It is not about right and wrong or what I think is good and bad to think or do” (MacKinnon 1989, xii).

Dworkin’s book Pornography: Men Possessing Women (1979) develops a line of feminist thought initiated by Kate Millet in Sexual Politics (1969): sexuality itself is socially constructed, by men, as an expression and practice of power over women. The emphasis on politics (power structured relationships) brings to light that the sex/gender distinction is a status distinction, not primarily biological, and that sexuality is ground-zero for analyzing women’s inferior social status and position.

Catharine A. MacKinnon further develops the claim that sex and sexuality are political relations in her early work, giving it full expression in Toward a Feminist Theory of the State (1989). MacKinnon argues that eroticizing inequality is constitutive of social masculinity; being sexualized as an inferior is definitive of social femininity. “Dominance eroticized defines the imperatives of its [sexuality’s] masculinity, submission eroticized defines its femininity” (MacKinnon 1989, 130). Human sexual practices, heterosexuality in particular, embody these meanings of masculinity and femininity, and, at the same time, reproduce them. While MacKinnon unearths the social and contingent nature of sexuality, dominant perspectives reduce them to natural imperatives. Thus, while women’s social inferiority is created by male power (force) is it made to appear natural and inevitable. Pornography is one social practice of male domination and female subordination insofar as it serves to further solidify the social meaning of femininity as inferiority and causes men to act in sexually violent ways towards women (MacKinnon 1989, 195–214).

In this frame, the question of pornography’s harms are not questions of good or bad, morally speaking, but whether pornography creates and maintains sex/gender-based power relations. MacKinnon and Dworkin argue that it does insofar as pornography constitutes and contributes to the social construction of sexuality where women are made subordinate to men. Insofar as pornography embodies and perpetuates dominant meanings of (hetero)sexuality, it is a primary means through which women’s unequal status (subordination to men) is enforced and maintained. Distinguishing this political critique from a “moral” one enables MacKinnon and Dworkin to argue that what constitutes subordination as such is not a matter of interpretation or point of view but rather is a question of how power functions and is distributed unequally, which can, in part, be assessed empirically (for example, by measuring gender inequality and sexual violence).

In light of their shared analysis of male domination as manifest through (hetero)sexuality and its concomitant sex/gender distinction, Dworkin and MacKinnon worked together to draft a civil rights ordinance, at the request of the City of Minneapolis (1983), while they were co-teaching a course on pornography at the University of Minnesota Law School. Unlike traditional obscenity-based criminal statutes, the ordinance was a civil rights law. This feature of the law was intended to remove state censorship of sexually explicit materials while empowering women, specifically, to have avenues of legal redress for the harms of pornography. (Though, importantly, the ordinance includes children, men, and “transsexuals” “when they are used in the place of women” (Dworkin and MacKinnon 1993, 429).) The ordinance was aimed at two categories of harms: production harms (i.e., harms experienced through the making of pornography) and consumption harms (harms inflicted upon women by men due to pornography’s causal influence upon them).

Paradigmatic of production harms is coercion into pornography. Linda Marchiano (a.k.a. Linda Lovelace) retained MacKinnon as her lawyer aiming to sue the various producers of “Deep Throat,” a popular pornographic film she claimed to be coerced into making by her abusive husband. Marchiano also wanted an injunction against any further distribution of the film, as she testified that anytime someone watches the film they are watching her be raped (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 60–66). At the time of the drafting of the ordinance, and as presented in the public hearings on it, a substantial amount of empirical research was being conducted to determine the causal relationship between pornography consumption and violence against women. Such studies claimed to establish the following kinds of consumption harms:

  1. Trivialization of rape: “…after six weeks of exposure, male subjects are less likely to convict for a rape, less likely to give a harsh sentence to a rapist if in fact convicted” (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 53).
  2. Likelihood of committing rape: “You are asking a normal, healthy male, ‘would you commit a rape after exposure to this type of material?’ And on a five-point scale, you find that after exposure to sexually violent images, particularly when those sexual violent images depict women enjoying rape, up to 57 percent of those males indicate some likelihood they would commit a rape if not caught” (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 49).
  3. Sexual arousal at depictions of rape (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 49).
  4. Beliefs that women enjoy rape (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 51–53).
  5. Acceptance of rape myths (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 50–51).
  6. Sexual arousal at depictions of violence (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 50–51).
  7. Perceiving violent sexual images as just sexual (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 51).

Under the law, those harmed by pornography, whether in its making or use, according to the ordinance’s enumeration of specific harms would be empowered to file suit against those who harmed them, whether producers, distributors, or users of pornography. Private consumption or possession was not regulated under the law.

The ordinance rests on the claim that pornography is a “form of sex discrimination” (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 444). The specific definition is: “Pornography shall mean the graphic sexually explicit subordination of women, whether in pictures or words, that also includes one or more of the following…” The enumerated list specifies, in part, the meaning of subordination, for example, where “women are presented as sexual objects who enjoy pain or humiliation;” or where “women are presented as sexual objects who experience pleasure in being raped” (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 444).

Additionally, the ordinance defines specific causes of action (bases for legal claims) where individuals (including women, men, children, or trans persons) could make a claim for sex discrimination when pornography is forced upon them, or where they can prove an assault was the direct result of pornography, or where they claim to have been coerced into a pornographic performance, or where materials that are proven to subordinate women, as a class, are trafficked (produced, sold, exhibited, or distributed) (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1993, 442). The trafficking provision has received the most legal and philosophical attention and bears directly on the legal regulation of markets in pornography as defined by the ordinance (this will be discussed further below).

The ordinance was expressly drafted as a civil rights law; thus, unlike obscenity laws it does not criminalize pornography. Its primary claim is that pornography is a social practice whereby women are made unequal. MacKinnon and Dworkin define subordination as an active practice whereby persons, as members of groups, are rendered socially unequal: “It includes the practices that enforce second-class status. Subordination includes objectification, hierarchy, forced submission, and violence” (Dworkin and MacKinnon 1988, 39). The women used to make pornography are the first group of women subordinated, if they were made to do any of the acts defined in clauses of the definition of pornography in its making (such as being penetrated by inanimate objects or animals). Women who have pornography forced upon them or are attacked and a specific piece of pornography can be causally linked to the attack are subordinated as well. And, finally, women as a class are subordinated by pornography—per the definition—insofar as it both designates them as inferiors and causes them to be treated as inferiors.

An important part of the analysis includes the way other social forms of inequality become eroticized in pornography as well. So, for example, pornography sexualizes race inequality, ethnic inequality, age-based inequalities, disabilities, and so on, turning social hierarchies into eroticized inequalities. Alice Walker and Patricia Hill Collins argue the treatment of black women within slavery is a model upon which contemporary pornography is based. In the preface to “Coming Apart,” Walker emphasizes “the obvious connections between the lynching of black men and women…and the pornographic abuse of white women” (Walker 1981, 41–42). Even further, she suggests “that the more ancient roots of modern pornography are to be found in the almost always pornographic treatment of black women, who, from the moment they entered slavery, even in their own homelands, were subjected to rape as the ‘logical’ convergence of sex and violence” (Walker 1981, 42).

Patricia Hill Collins takes Walker’s suggestion further. She notes the parallel between slavery and pornography in the use of women’s bodies “for pleasure and profit.” Additionally, Hill Collins points to the fact that enslaved women were treated as sex objects, raped, and rendered socially powerless by the oppressive structures within which they lived. “The treatment of Black women’s bodies in nineteenth-century Europe and the United States may be the foundation upon which contemporary pornography as the representation of women’s objectification, domination and control is based” (Hill Collins 1993, 98). (For an alternative analysis of Black women’s relation to pornography, emphasizing pleasure and agency, see: Nash (2014) and Miller-Young (2014)).

Not all feminists, then or now, accept the claim that pornography is subordinating to women. Prior to the ordinance, and in the wake of anti-pornography feminist organizing, some feminists organized a counter-response. Notably, a conference was held at Barnard College in 1982 with the organizing theme “Towards a Politics of Sexuality.” “The conference attempted to explore the ambiguous and complex relationship between sexual pleasure and danger in women’s lives and feminist theory” (Vance 1984, 3). Several of the conference papers became foundational in what is now known as “sex-positivism feminism.” Carol Vance introduces the volume of published papers from the conference aiming to problematize the juxtaposition of “pleasure and danger” in women’s erotic lives. She argues that anti-pornography feminists offer an overly simplistic picture of women’s sexuality, failing to explore the ways in which women themselves derive pleasure in sexuality (Vance 1984, 3). Vance interprets anti-pornography feminism to reflect the same kind of moralistic thinking present in 19th century feminism, where male “lust” and aggression were perpetual threats to women and from which they must be kept safe. Further, she argues that the root of the anti-pornography feminist movement is shame-based attitudes toward sex, denying women’s power and agency over sexuality and their experience of it (Vance 1984, 6).

In the same volume, Gail Rubin takes aim at anti-pornography feminism as stigmatizing sexual minorities, scapegoating persons with “deviant” sexual preferences and identities, and relying on overgeneralizations and scare tactics to support their regressive, “anti-sex” values (Rubin 1984, 301). Feminism, argues Rubin, needs a pluralistic sexual ethics that eschews sexual hierarchies and embraces the sexual variation among humans without stigma or shame. Her defense of sexual minorities (people with “kinks” in today’s lingo) and of sadomasochism, in particular, made her work foundational for subsequent and emerging sex-positivism feminisms.

The ordinance, itself, was subject to immediate criticism, from feminists and non-feminists (largely liberals) alike. The Feminist Anti-Censorship Task Force (F.A.C.T.) filed an amicus curiae brief in American Booksellers v. Hudnut (1985) —the case resulting from the passage of the Indianapolis Ordinance. They argued, inter alia, that the civil rights ordinance was functionally equivalent to censorship; that the Dworkin/MacKinnon analysis rests on a repressive view of sexuality; and, that the constituent terms in the law (subordination, sex object, and so on) were irretrievably vague (Duggan, Hunter, & Vance 1985 [1993: 135]).

Among the claims advanced in the F.A.C.T. brief that have received attention from philosophers is the claim that the ordinance implies a negative, or repressive, view of sexuality. “At its heart, this analysis implies that heterosexual sex itself is sexist, and that women do not engage in it of their own volition, and that behavior pleasurable to men is intrinsically repugnant to women” (Duggan, Hunter, & Vance 1985 [1993: 147]). Amy Allen shares this conclusion with the authors of the F.A.C.T. brief and argues that the fundamental problem with the feminist anti-pornography position is that it rests on an impoverished conception of power. Allen interprets Dworkin and MacKinnon as implicitly relying on a concept of power where “power is about having power over others”—understood as domination (Allen 2001, 513). She argues further that such a conception is a.) reductive (treats all power as domination and defines domination/subordination relations as dyadic, master-servant like relations) b.) implies all women are powerless while all men are powerful and c.) provides no grounds for conceiving of women’s empowerment, an important feminist aim (Allen 2001, 515). Allen argues that Dworkin and MacKinnon’s concept of power, as she interprets it, misses the ways in which social power is more diffuse than a master-servant relation. Additionally, some women (white women, for example) may well have more power than some men (e.g., men of color in a racist society). Finally, she argues MacKinnon and Dworkin have no “theoretical resources” for envisioning women’s empowerment, instead they simply adopt a view of women as lacking agency, submissive, and hence powerless (Allen 2001, 516). (While not aimed at addressing Allen’s critique specifically, Lori Watson (2024) offers a different interpretation of MacKinnon’s concept of power that distinguishes it from a conception of domination as mere “power over” and emphasizes the constructive nature of social power.)

Among those who identify as sex-positive feminists, some have sought to create and define “feminist pornography,” as distinct from misogynist pornography and as an avenue for women’s sexual freedom. One such definition, offered by Penley, Shimizu, Miller-Young, and Taormino, states:

[F]eminist porn uses sexually explicit imagery to contest and complicate dominant representations of gender, sexuality, race, ethnicity, class, ability, age, body type, and other identity markers. It explores concepts of desire, agency, power, beauty, and pleasure at their most confounding and difficult, including pleasure within and across inequality, in the face of injustice, and against the limits of gender hierarchy and both heteronormativity and homonormativity. It seeks to unsettle conventional definitions of sex, and expand the language of sex as an erotic activity, an expression of identity, a power exchange, and cultural commodity, and even a new politics (Taormino, et al. 2013, 9–10).

Additionally, those who make feminist pornography express a commitment to fair labor practices that emphasize consent and the health and safety of the performers (Taormino et al. 2013, 10). Those who make and defend feminist porn share many of the critiques of the anti-pornography movement elaborated above. Most importantly, they argue that the anti-pornography movement rests on a conservative and repressive view of sexuality that actually contributes to women’s oppression by denying their agency and sexual freedoms. Feminist porn producers claim to make pornography that women want to see and, in so doing, expand women’s sexual horizons beyond patriarchal and misogynist mainstream pornography.

In an effort to balance sex positive feminist aims and a critique of mainstream pornography, Anne Eaton argues in favor of a shift in the definition of problematic pornography away from MacKinnon’s and Dworkin’s technical definition and toward a more general conception of “inegalitarian pornography” (Eaton 2017, 244). Inegalitarian pornography is defined as sexual imagery that eroticizes gender inequality (Eaton 2017, 251). Eaton explores the possibilities of “egalitarian pornography,” or feminist pornography, and proposes the following criteria: First, there are negative conditions, representations that should be absent from anything properly called “feminist pornography.” They include: the “absence of representations of nonconsensual violence, expressions of contempt for women, and sexist stereotypes, and scenes of men ejaculating on women’s faces are typically absent” (Eaton 2017, 253–254). The positive conditions she enumerates include women in active roles, the centering of women’s desire and pleasure, men as sex objects, women as powerful and strong, and diversity of realistic body types (Eaton 2017, 254). Eaton is optimistic that such feminist pornography could have the effect of reshaping individuals’ erotic landscapes away from misogynist, inegalitarian desires and toward more egalitarian ones.

One common theme among all the definitions surveyed thus far is the emphasis on women. In this way, they are narrower than many other definitions of pornography, which typically focus on sexually explicit material more broadly. Some find the emphasis on women grounds for critique of feminist engagement with pornography. Petra Van Brabant argues that such definitions rest on a heteronormative framework (Van Brabant 2017, 227). Incorporating a heteronormative view of sexuality into definitions of pornography “affirms the norm of heterosexual power dynamics. It implies that in patriarchal societies nonheterosexual sexual subordination is nothing but a misplaced identification with the heterosexual male perpetrator, a role-play defined by the heterosexual paradigm” (Van Brabant 2017, 228). Queer pornography, argues Van Brabant, challenges the heterosexual paradigm of sexuality, and in so doing has emancipatory and liberating potential that is ignored by many feminists (Van Brabant 2017, 228).

Feminist debates over pornography, its social meaning and potential for harm, were so divided and fierce that they have been dubbed “the sex wars” or “the porn wars.” In this context, many philosophers entered the fray to either further defend Dworkin and MacKinnon’s view or to criticize the fundamental claims therein. Three claims that have received the most philosophical attention are: 1. That pornography subordinates and silences women. 2. That pornography constructs women’s “nature” as sexual servants for male use. And, 3. That pornography sexually objectifies women. Additionally, the empirical evidence has been widely criticized, even as some scholars continue to provide evidence of the connection between pornography and sexual violence against women (Oddone-Paolucci et. al. 2000). Although evaluating the empirical literature is beyond the scope of this entry, for an overview of the empirical literature that claims to show there is a connection between pornography and sexual violence targeting women, see Max Waltman (2021). For a summary of the various kinds of criticisms of the empirical evidence, see Andrew Altman (2019).

1.2 Exploring pornography’s harms—Subordination and silencing, constructing women’s natures, and sexual objectification

1.2.1 Subordination and silencing

Among the claims advanced by Dworkin and MacKinnon in their analysis of pornography and its harms are that pornography (per their definition) constitutes and causes the subordination of women and that pornography silences women as a class. The judge in American Booksellers v. Hudnut, Judge Easterbrook, conceded that pornography does subordinate women: “There is much to this perspective. […] Therefore we accept the premises of this legislation. Depictions of subordination tend to perpetuate subordination. The subordinate status of women in turn leads to affront and lower pay at work, insult and injury at home, battery and rape on the streets. […] Yet this simply demonstrates the power of pornography as speech” (American Booksellers v. Hudnut 1985). Of note is the fact that Easterbrook emphasizes “depictions of subordination.” As such, his concession here captures the claim that pornography causes subordination, but he does not address the constitutive claim.

Recognizing the importance of the distinction, Melina Vadas thought the constitutive claim was philosophically “peculiar” and in need of analytic defense. Vadas’s defense turns on unpacking the significance of the full claim in the ordinance: pornography is a practice of sex discrimination (subordination of women). Practices carry with them an internal logic, sets of rules, in light of which “practice constituents” (objects, events, acts) gain “their identity” (Vadas 1987, 493). For example, in the practice of baseball, a third swing and a miss has the meaning of striking out. There is no independent meaning of the act absent the organizing context of the practice of baseball. Moreover, such meanings are “non-subjective and determinate” (Vadas 1987, 495). Vadas further argues that some predicates transfer directly from a practice constituent (object, event, act) to depictions of that object, event, or act. This is especially true, she argues, of value predicates. The property of being a beautiful rose transfers to the photograph of the same rose. The property of “being subordinated” Vadas identifies as a value predicate that transfers from the practice event of making pornography to the representations (images) of the original act. Thus, if a woman is made to appear to enjoy rape in order for a video to be made of her appearing to enjoy rape, and the original meaning of the act is subordinating (enjoying rape), then that property can also be predicated of the video. “Thus, pornographic depictions could subordinate women, if the predicate ‘subordinates’ transfers without change of meaning from constituent to depiction and if the predicate applies to the depiction because it applies to the practice constituent” (Vadas 1987, 508). In other words, if the acts done to make a particular piece of pornography subordinate, then on Vadas analysis, so does the subsequent image of the original acts. Thus, she argues that the identity claim (pornography is the subordination of women) can be vindicated.

William Parent critiques Vadas’s account on grounds that she makes a category mistake and that the crucial claim (that subordinates is a transferable predicate) lacks an argument (Parent 1990, 208). He argues that “we have yet to be given any reason for supposing that pornography in fact does contribute to the creation of women as a subordinated people. Consequently, we have as yet no reason to accept the Dworkin/MacKinnon account of the wrongness of producing pornography…” (Parent 1990, 208). Parent argues that there is a much more straightforward argument for condemning pornography: “The application of ‘moral evil’ to pornography is clear enough. Materials that depict in a favorable light the arbitrary debasement of women are intrinsically contemptuous of women and as such are morally evil. Likewise, the pleasure a person takes in reading or watching pornography is evil” (Parent 1990, 211). Whatever one thinks of Parent’s claims about moral evil, this argument is of a kind with obscenity-based, moralized objections to pornography and, thus, abandons the equality-based analysis that MacKinnon, Dworkin, and others have tried to develop as a uniquely feminist position.

Rae Langton has contributed much to reviving and defending a MacKinnon-Dworkin style approach to pornography. She draws on J.L. Austin’s speech act theory to explain how pictures and words, in themselves, can subordinate. Following Austin, Langton distinguishes three features of speech acts (performatives): locution (the content of an utterance), illocution (“the action constituted by the utterance itself”), perlocution (the effect of the utterance) (Langton 2009, 27). According to Langton, pornography itself can subordinate women if it is understood as the illocutionary act of determining “women’s inferior social status” (Langton 2009, 29). In order to be understood as such, certain felicity conditions must hold. As, for example, uttering the words “I do” in front of a duly recognized magistrate or minster constitute the act of getting married, pornography can constitute the act of subordinating women where the relevant speakers (pornographers) are recognized as authoritative speakers about sex and women. In this way, pornographers’ speech acts count as exercitives and verdictives. Exercitives and verdictives are two kinds of authoritative speech acts, as such they entail the power to make things be so. For example, a jury’s issuing a verdict of “guilty” make the legal fact of a defendant’s guilt true. In so far as pornography functions as an authority “in the game of sex,” it has the power to rank women as inferior, legitimate discrimination against them, and deprive them of power and rights—that is, the power to subordinate (Langton 2009, 40).

Langton and Jennifer Hornsby also rely on speech act theory to give an account of how pornography silences women, in particular (Langton 2009; Hornsby 1995). They are interested in a specific kind of silencing, what Langton calls “illocutionary disablement.” Illocutionary disablement occurs when one speaks but “fails to perform the very action she intends” (Langton 2009, 49). Such disablement occurs, for example, when a speaker lacks the relevant authority to perform the speech act in question. So, for example, in the master/slave relation, slaves simply cannot give masters orders—“such acts are unspeakable for the slave” (Langton 2009, 49). Under such conditions, a slave’s words lack “illocutionary force” (Langton 2009, 48). Hornsby relies on a failure of reciprocity between speaker and hearer to generate a similar analysis.

Langton further illuminates how some speech (say the speech of the powerful) can disable certain speech-acts (say of the less powerful). As some speech-acts set the felicity conditions for other acts to count as speech acts, the speech acts creating the relevant felicity conditions can make other acts “unspeakable.” For example, laws (understood as speech-acts) set the felicity conditions for various acts, including marriage. Someone uttering the words “I do” only counts as marrying if the relevant felicity conditions are in place (in front of a duly recognized official, at or above the age of maturity, and so on.) Prior to federal recognition of same-sex marriages in the United States, various state laws made the act of saying “I do” – as constituting the act of marriage—unspeakable for same-sex partners. If pornography sets the felicity conditions for women’s speech to constitute certain speech-acts, then pornography can silence women (make it so that some of their speech-acts are unsayable). In the context of a sexual assault, a woman’s uttering “No!”, sometimes, does not count as an act of refusal (Langton 2009, 54; Hornsby 1995, 226). The relevant cases are not ones in which a perpetrator hears the woman and ignores her, rather they are ones in which he fails to even recognize her speech as communicating a refusal. He gives her no uptake. This failure of recognition of her intention to refuse entails she cannot do with her words what she intends (Hornsby 1995, 226). Such silencing occurs when uptake failures, as in the example, are systematic rather than episodic (Hornsby 1995, 227). The silencing argument, like the subordinating argument, rests on the claim that pornographer’s have the relevant authority to set the felicity conditions for women’s speech acts. Langton argues that the speech-acts of pornographers, in fact, set such felicity conditions. And, insofar as pornography legitimates rape and sexual violence, and delimits no space for women’s refusals, then it “engender[s] the silence of illocutionary disablement” (Langton 2009, 60).

Mary Kate McGowan challenges Langton’s specific analysis of the claim pornography subordinates by relying on Austin’s account of exercitive speech acts. She details a number of limitations of such an analysis, including, most importantly, that pornography doesn’t work on us at a conscious level; as MacKinnon argues pornography works at the subconscious-level, conditioning our responses. Langton’s analysis requires the speech acts in question to “function at the conscious level of communicated intentions” (McGowan 2003, 169). However, McGowan thinks that the claims that pornography subordinates and silences women can be defended through “a previously overlooked sort of speech act, the conversational exercitive” (McGowan 2003, 169).

Drawing on David Lewis’s “Scorekeeping in a Language Game,” McGowan points out that conversations, like various games, are governed by rules, the permissibility of certain acts in context “depends on the rules and what has already happened in the game or conversation,” and both conversations and certain games “can be understood as having a score” (McGowan 2003, 170). The “conversational score” updates when new utterances are introduced that contain presuppositions, or correct misunderstandings, or shift topics, and so on. Lewis identifies the rules that govern conversations as “rules of accommodation.” “Rules of accommodation make the score automatically adjust (within certain limits of course) so that what actually transpires counts as fair play” (McGowan 2003, 171). McGowan argues that contributions to a conversation that invoke a rule of accommodation are exercitive speech acts “in virtue of changing what is permissible in the conversation” (McGowan 2003, 172). Her contribution aims to show that “pornography functions like a conversational exercitive” and, as such, we can understand the claims that pornography subordinates and silences. “Suppose that pornography, via the rules of accommodation operative in the sociosexual arena, renders certain speech acts unspeakable for women. If these speech acts are ones that women ought to be able to perform, the pornography silences women” (McGowan 2003, 182). “Suppose that pornographic speech enacts, via the rules of accommodation, permissibility facts such that it is permissible to force a woman to have sex under certain circumstances. […] By rendering rape permissible, pornography would thereby subordinate women” (McGowan 2003, 182).

McGowan expands the notion of silencing beyond uptake failures, identifying four additional forms of silencing. Importantly, McGowan’s account is different than Hornsby’s and Langton’s in that she does not draw on the concept of illocutionary disablement, but rather, describes the phenomenon as a communicative failure (McGowan 2017, 48). In addition to the failure of an addressee to recognize a speaker’s intention to refuse, McGowan identifies types of silencing flowing from the failure to recognize the speaker’s authority, failure to recognize the speaker is sincere, and failure to recognize the speaker’s true feelings (McGowan 2017, 47–49). She argues that pornography can both cause these types of silencing and, in some cases, constitute such silencing (McGowan 2017, 50). One way of filling out the causal explanation turns on pornography causing “beliefs that would cause that kind of silencing” (McGowan 2017, 50). As to constituting silencing, McGowan emphasizes “that constituting the harm of silencing is really just as specific way of causing it; it would involve causing silencing by enacting a norm where the silencing results from adhering to (i.e., following) that norm” (McGowan 2017, 52). As with Langton’s analysis, McGowan notes that pornography can constitute the harm of silencing when it enacts norms as an authority. However, McGowan argues this is not the only way pornography can enact norms. Drawing on her earlier work on conversational exercitives, she argues that insofar as some pornography is a move “in the norm-governed activity of social interaction, the norm-governed activity of gender relations, and even the norm-governed activity of sexism,” then some pornography can “enact specific highly localized norms that silence…” (McGowan 2017, 54). If pornography enacts norms such as women only say “no” to sexually excite men, or women do not have the authority to refuse men’s sexual advances, or “no” actually means “yes,” or women enjoy being raped, then pornography constitutes the silencing of women (McGowan 2017, 56).

Louise Antony, Cynthia Stark, and Nancy Bauer each argue that the most the Dworkin/MacKinnon analysis, and likewise Langton’s, Hornsby’s, and McGowan’s defense of it, can establish is that pornography has perlocutionary effects (causally harms women) and that the claim pornography itself is the subordination of women cannot survive philosophical scrutiny (Anthony 2017; Bauer 2015; Stark 1997). Additionally, Anthony and Bauer each contest the claim that pornography (as an industry) possesses the relevant kind of Austinian authority (Antony 2017; Bauer 2015). Stark reads MacKinnon as arguing that pornography “works by portraying, sexually explicit and in an endorsing context, women being harmed, or women whose agency has been erased or reduced to slavish desire to please men sexually” (Stark 1997, 294). Further, as these materials are used for masturbation, they condition men to find the subordination of women sexually arousing. Subsequently, men’s behavior is conditioned to act in ways that harm women or dismiss the harms women experience as “just sex.” Stark argues this view, as presented, does not establish the core claim that MacKinnon advances—namely, that pornography itself is an action (Stark 1997, 294). “Rather, it describes a complex causal process tracing the various links between sexually explicit, misogynistic images on the one hand to social practices and institutions on the other” (Stark 1997, 294). Thus, Stark concludes the argument that “pornography constitutes the subordination of women” fails. Further, she argues that Langton’s defense, while successful, cannot support the claim that pornography is “beyond the reach of the First Amendment” (Stark 1997, 295). Bauer doesn’t find the claim that pornography is speech plausible or persuasive, First Amendment arguments notwithstanding (Bauer 2015, 63–64). She argues more generally that the use of Austin to vindicate the MacKinnon and Dworkin approach to pornography is misguided. Antony argues that Langton’s claim that pornography as the requisite Austian authority rests on the mistaken conflation of authority and power (Antony 2017, 61).

Lori Watson undertakes a defense of the Dworkin/MacKinnon approach to pornography in her contribution to Debating Pornography. Beyond a broad defense of a civil rights based approach to pornography, she takes up the questions raised by various scholars, supporters and critics alike, as to what the meaning of “subordination” is in the context of the ordinance. In so doing, Watson aims to reply to critics like Stark and Bauer who argue that pornography cannot constitute the act of subordination but can only produce causal effects and that the effects of pornography cannot be distinguished from other forms of misogynist materials. Watson argues the distinction between illocutionary acts and perlocutionary acts is overdrawn by those relying on Austin to vindicate MacKinnon. “Asking for a sharp divide between the two overlooks how effects are relied upon in determining meaning” (Altman and Watson 2019, 198). The use of words often determines their meaning. The function of pornography “(the eroticization of inequality) determines its meaning. The fact it produces sexual arousal is both a cause and a consequence of existing within a rape culture in which the subordination of women to men is sexualized. The eroticization of inequality is at once a constitutive act and an effect; they are not separable” (Altman and Watson 2019, 198). As to the question of pornography’s authority to define sex, Watson argues part of this authority derives from the fact that, legally, pornography is treated as speech. As such, the pornography market is enormous and unfettered and legitimated; thus, pornography gains its social power to “define and determine dominant meanings of sex.” (Altman and Watson 2019, 199). Women are subordinated when this view of sex is forced upon them, whether as individuals or as a class.

In the mid-2000s, Anne Eaton aimed to revive interest in anti-pornography feminism by developing what she calls “a sensible anti-pornography feminism” (ASF) (Eaton 2007). Such a view abandons the claim that pornography is constitutively harmful (subordinating) and rests on a definition much like Longino’s. Eaton suggest an ASF should restrict itself to inegalitarian pornography—sexually explicit representations that as a whole eroticize relations of gender inequity (Eaton 2007, 676). Her arguments aim to vindicate the “harm hypothesis”—namely, “that pornography shapes the attitudes and conduct of its audience in ways that are injurious to women” (Eaton 2007, 677). Thus, she refines the definition, along the lines of Longino, by emphasizing that the pornography she is problematizing is material that endorses or approves of the subordination of women (Eaton 2007, 677). Eaton advances a probabilistic model of causation for conducting empirical research on pornography’s post-production harms (primarily harms to the class of women as a whole). Within such a model, the claim that pornography harms women (for example, by increasing the risk of sexual violence or fomenting misogynists attitudes) should be explored according to the following conception of causation: “x is a cause of y if and only if (i) x occurs earlier than y and (ii) the probability of the occurrence of y is greater, given the occurrence of x, than the probability of the occurrence of y given not-x.” (Eaton 2007, 696). This is the model of causation adopted by epidemiologists, for example, when they explore health effects of certain behaviors, like smoking.

It’s worth noting that Eaton’s suggestion stands in contrast to the causal model adopted in much of the earlier research showing pornography’s harms. For example, in his testimony during the Minneapolis hearings, Edward Donnerstein emphasized that the connection between pornography consumption and negative attitudes towards women (acceptance of rape myths, for example) was causal and not correlational. In describing the relationship between sexual arousal to violent images and subsequent aggressive behavior, Donnerstein says: “We are not talking about correlations where we get into chicken/egg problems of which came first. We are talking about causality. The ability, at least [in] this research, to take certain types of images, expose people to those images and make a prediction independent of their background, independent of their past viewing habits, independent of their initial hostility and make quite accurate predictions of potential aggressive behavior. […] I think it suggests quite strongly there is a strong relationship between the material and subsequent aggression” (MacKinnon and Dworkin 1997, 52).

1.2.2 Pornography constructs women’s nature

Another central claim advanced by anti-pornography feminists is that pornography constructs a false picture of women’s nature as sexual servants to men. This view of women is presented as capturing their essence as grounded in biology, when, in fact, it is a pernicious socially imposed falsehood.

Mary Kate McGowan offers an interpretation of the claim that pornography constructs women’s natures and that, in so doing, it “tells lies” about women (is a false construction). McGowan points out that the conjunction of the two claims (that pornography constructs women’s natures and that construction is false) is puzzling: technically speaking, social constructions are not the kind of thing that can be true or false because they simply create what is. Like Langton, she draws on Austin’s speech act theory to illuminate the set of claims. Specifically, she shows how verdictive speech acts (authoritative verdicts/rulings) can be erroneous (McGowan 2005, 43). [Pornography] “purports to track antecedent facts about our [women’s] natures while it erroneously constructs what our natures count as being” (McGowan 2005, 43). Much like an umpire’s bad call (calling a runner out, when he, in fact, was safe), pornography purports to describe women’s true nature (as sexual servants to men) while simultaneously creating the social reality in which women are viewed as men’s sexual servants. As such, pornography socially constructs a reality in which women are attributed the natural function of sexually serving men.

Katherine Jenkins also undertakes a reconstruction of the claim “pornography constructs women’s natures in a way that is somehow defective” (Jenkins 2017, 92). Rather than relying on speech act theory, Jenkins draws on John Searle’s account of social ontology to fill out the relevant claims. She introduces Searle’s account of institutional entities—social entities “that cannot be explained merely by referring to their intrinsic properties” (Jenkins 2017, 95). Importantly, gender is one such entity. “Institutional entities are created by the imposition of status functions through collective intentionality, where status functions take the form <X counts as a Y in C>” (Jenkins 2017, 96). Determining who and what counts as a woman, on this view, requires identifying the status assigned to the relevant beings through “collective intentionality.” Jenkins argues that the claim that females count as objects for male use is the status function that defines women as institutional entities within pornography (Jenkins 2017, 100). That is, the sex/gender ‘woman’ is defined as “object for male sexual use.” This analysis can then explain both the subordination claim and the constructivist claim. To say pornography subordinates women is to say pornography brings “into being an institutional reality in which they count as sex objects for male use” (Jenkins 2017, 100). To say that pornography constructs women’s nature is to say through collective intentionality, pornography imposes the status function “women are the sexual servants of men” onto all women (Jenkins 2017, 100). There are two ways in which the defectiveness of the social construction of women as the sexual servants of men can be shown, according to Jenkins. One could follow MacKinnon and rely on feminist consciousness raising as a vehicle for refusing to accept the dominant construal of “woman” (Jenkins 2017, 101). Or, following Haslanger, one could argue that the status function assigned to women, in pornography, is “presented as a brute fact,” when “in fact it is an institutional fact” (Jenkins 2017, 100).

1.2.3 Sexual objectification

The feminist literature on objectification is both enormous and nuanced, covering much broader ground than pornography (see the entry on feminist perspectives on objectification). In the context of pornography, central questions explored include whether pornography constitutes or causes sexual objectification of women and what (if anything) is wrong or harmful about sexual objectification. Exploring the first question requires defining objectification. There are two distinct interpretations of MacKinnon and Dworkin’s use of “sexual objectification” which, in turn, shape subsequent engagement on the topic.

Loosely speaking, to objectify a person is to treat them as an object (a thing) in some sense. Martha Nussbaum develops a Kantian interpretation of objectification and attributes a Kantian inspired view to MacKinnon and Dworkin (Nussbaum 1999, 224). Nussbaum understands objectification to be a cluster concept revolving around seven distinct features: instrumentality, denial of autonomy, inertness, fungibility, violability, ownership, and denial of subjectivity. (Nussbaum 1999, 218). She argues that denial of autonomy, denial of subjectivity, and instrumentality, depending on context, appear to be the most salient ways of treating a human being as an object. She interprets MacKinnon and Dworkin as being committed to the view that objectification concerns the failure to treat persons as ends in themselves. However, she argues not all objectification entails such failure and that the “difference between objectionable and benign uses of objectification will be made by the overall context of the human relationship” (Nussbaum 1999, 227). Contexts in which persons stand in a relation of mutual respect may well mitigate (render benign) what otherwise would seem to be objectifying treatment.

Nussbaum draws on D.H. Lawrence’s Lady Chatterly to argue for a kind of “Lawrentian objectification” as benign. There is no instrumentalization and “the objectification is symmetrical and mutual—and in both cases undertaken in a context of mutual respect and rough social equality” (Nussbaum 1999, 231). Nussbaum argues in such contexts, “the surrender of autonomy” may be joyous. Thus, in some contexts, sexual objectification “can be a vehicle of autonomy and self-expression for women” (Nussbaum 1999, 231).

This Kantian interpretation of Dworkin and MacKinnon has been adopted by others. Langton, for example, draws on Nussbaum’s interpretation to further an analysis of sexual objectification consonant with Dworkin and MacKinnon’s views. Langton argues introduces the concept of “makers knowledge” to explore the connections between one form of objectification and pornography’s harms. Specifically, she is interested in MacKinnon’s claims that in objectifying women, pornographers simultaneously make it true that women are sex objects; this projective feature of objectification is one way in which pornography constructs women’s reality (Langton 2009, 300). Thus, pornography is self-fulfilling: the world conforms to the reality pornographers construct (Langton 2009, 301). Maker’s knowledge is “special knowledge someone has of something, in virtue of making that thing” (Langton 2009, 301). Thus, it is like an architect’s knowledge of a building generated from drafting the blueprints of that building. Langton argues that the maker’s knowledge of pornographers is harmful because it is intimately connected with objectification. “On MacKinnon’s way of thinking, pornography is a certain kind of self-fulfilling projection. That is what makes it a source of knowledge, and that is what makes it a kind of objectification” (Langton 2009, 307). In projecting and creating a reality where women are sexual objects for male use, pornography undermines women’s autonomy. (Langton 2009, 307).

Mari Mikkola critiques Langton’s account of makers-knowledge and its relation to objectification. She argues not all pornography necessarily involves makers-knowledge as such knowledge depends on intentions (Mikkola 2019, 140). First she notes that anti-pornography feminists are committed to the claim that pornography harms women even absent any intention by pornographers to do so. This is in tension with the claim that pornography is a kind of makers-knowledge (Mikkola 2019, 141). Second, some pornographers, such as feminist pornographers, intend capture an authentic women’s sexuality. Insofar as that kind of pornography aims to reflect the world as it is, rather than create an imposed reality, it is not makers-knowledge but run of the mill knowledge (Mikkola 2019, 142). Moreover, according to Mikkola, if some objectification is benign (such as Nussbaum suggests), then even if pornography is makers-knowledge, not all of it will be harmful (Mikkola 2019, 145).

Laurie Shrage, too, offers an interpretation of MacKinnon that emphasizes a Kantian lineage to many of MacKinnon’s claims (Shrage 2005). In particular, Shrage thinks that MacKinnon shares with Kant an especially negative view of sex consisting of three claims: sexual desire is unique for its power to bring about “objectifying, degrading, and dehumanizing” treatment of women; that sexuality under patriarchy (for MacKinnon) necessarily involves the objectification of women and this is incompatible with “moral respect” owed to persons; and, in sexual desire is directed at parts of persons (their genitalia, for example) that is incompatible with treating them as “a whole person” (Shrage 2005, 46). As is well known, Kant’s solution to these problems with sexuality is to argue that only legal marriage can create conditions in which sex is morally permissible. Shrage notes that feminists are, rightly, critical of this kind of “solution.” Shrage’s criticisms of the assumptions she attributes to MacKinnon rest on denying each of these claims. There is no reason to think that sexuality is a unique appetite distinct from other “natural” appetites (Shrage 2005, 52). Drawing on Nussbaum, she argues that some forms of objectification are compatible with moral respect (Shrage 2005, 53). That some forms of objectification are compatible with moral respect also serves to erase the worry about reducing persons to parts, rather than seeing them as full, moral persons.

One challenge for the Kantian interpretation of Dworkin/MacKinnon’s work on pornography is MacKinnon’s avowed rejection of morality as a basis of her view. MacKinnon describes her work as resting on a factual analysis not a normative one. For example, in 2017, in a “Symposium on Toward (25 years later),” she argues, discussing rape, pornography, and sexual harassment:

Actually, these are practices of sex inequality not because they are “bad” or because it would be “good” to treat women as if we are men’s human equals, but because we are treated in the practices mentioned as if we are not. If sex inequality is a system of domination and subordination, a social hierarchy of power in the world, sex equality is not first a moral value and seeking it is not fundamentally a normative project in the conventional philosophical sense. Because men are not (that is the existential verb) women’s biological superiors, women men’s biological inferiors, sex equality is first a fact, denied realization in social orderings. It is the social inequality of the sexes that is normative without grounding, without ever having had to provide a philosophically sound account of itself, almost universally presented as merely reflecting a factual natural “difference,” when the differences between the sexes, such as they are, are equal, i.e., equally different, and as such contain no justification for domination or subordination, a thoroughly normative arrangement. The politics of sex equality are thus first rooted in a recognition of reality—the reality of the sexes’ human equality—not fundamentally based on a moral judgment that it would be good to treat the sexes as if they were equally human. We do not have to argue this proposition anymore. Once a sex equality rule exists in law, there is no more debate as to whether it would be “good” to treat the sexes equally. That has been decided. The only question is what sex equality means in particular instances. In other words, you do not need a normative position to have this critique (MacKinnon 2017, 13).

MacKinnon’s comments here will surely raise interpretative questions. I take the central claim she is aiming to make is that her analysis is not a moral one in the sense that aims to condemn sex inequality as immoral (however that is defined). Rather, she sees her project as both aiming to describe sex inequality, its mechanisms and manifestations in the world (i.e., she offers an explanation of how women are made into social unequals), and to offer a legal pathway for undoing gender inequality and creating a more socially equal world (MacKinnon 1989, xii). The point about not having to argue in favor of gender inequality follows from the fact that sex equality has been enshrined as a legal right, sometimes in national constitutions and under international human rights instruments and treaties.

Perhaps, then, more in keeping with MacKinnon’s self-professed project is Sally Haslanger’s interpretation of sexual objectification. Haslanger does not draw on Kant or Kantian morality as a basis for explaining objectification or its harms. According to Haslanger, women are sexually objectified when:

  1. They are “both viewed as and treated as an object” of men’s desires; and
  2. They are viewed as being for the satisfaction of men’s desires; and
  3. Men have the social power to impose women’s object status (Haslanger 2012, 59–60).

“The category of women is, in a sense, that group of individuals onto which men project and act out their desires” (Haslanger 2012, 60). Thus, on Haslanger’s interpretation what is distinct about objectification is that a person (woman) is viewed (by other persons, men) “as having a nature which makes [women] desirable in the ways [men] desires [women], and which enables [women] to satisfy that desire” (Haslanger 2012, 66). The attribution of an illusory “inherent nature” to women (based on male desire) and male power to enforce that illusory picture upon women is the essence of sexual objectification. Haslanger’s interpretation also reveals the intimate connection between the claims that pornography constructs women’s natures and sexually objectifies women simultaneously.

Jennifer Saul explores a closely related phenomenon of objectification, what she calls “personification” (Saul 2006, 45). Personification is the inverse of objectification insofar as it is understood as using things as persons. Saul reads Langton, Vadas, and MacKinnon as each condemning pornography, in part, because its use involves personification—using “pieces of paper” as women (Saul 2006, 45). Saul explores the connection between objectification and personification with an interest in determining whether objectification entails personification and whether personification entails objectification. She doubts that the connection between personification and objectification that holds men literally use objects (piece of paper) as women can be vindicated. Moreover, she thinks attributing to women the function of sexually satisfying men and claiming that all men see women as such is insulting to both (Saul 2006, 48). Yet she does claim that the connection between personification and objectification can be made good by attending to a particular historical example in which women came to use vibrators (rather than doctors) to treat “hysteria.” (Saul 2006, 51–53) In that case, women did, in fact, use vibrators to serve the function of doctors. However, the women in question did not objectify the doctors in the sense of “treating them as a mere means” and thus personification does not entail objectification. Personification is not sufficient for objectification even if it is a necessary condition. Thus, Saul concludes the worry that personification (through masturbation with pornography) will lead to more objectification of women is unfounded (Saul 2006, 59). Linda Padadaki shares Saul’s conclusion, personification through the use of pornography doesn’t cause objectification; however, she argues pornography does produce the knowledge that women are less than human and so is causally linked to women’s objectification (Padadaki 2017, 154).

Ann Cahill argues that the “concept of objectification is no longer philosophically tenable, due to its reliance on theories of the self that privilege mind over body and autonomy over intersubjectivity” (Cahill 2014, 841). She introduces the concept of “derivation” as an alternative to objectification that, she believes, can better capture the phenomena at issue. “Derivativzation is the mistake of treating something that is not a derivative as a derivative, and it constitutes an ethical wrong because it’s better to be ontologically distinct than ontologically reducible to another” (Cahill 2014, 844–845). Derivatization constitutes a form of degradation insofar as one is treated solely as someone whose “subjectivity (actions, speech, appearance, and so on) can be wholly determined by the subjective needs and desires of another” (Cahill 2014, 845). Cahill argues this new concept helps us to see that not all sex work is problematic. Whether sex work (prostitution) or pornography is problematic depends on whether the subjectivities of the sex workers is respected—not treated as “reducible to the demands of their clients” (Cahill 2014, 847).

The scope and nature of pornography’s harms (to women, in particular) continues to occupy feminist debates about pornography. Despite the various aforementioned attempts to make precise the relevant concepts such as subordination and objectification feminists continue to debate whether pornography uniquely is harmful in any substantive sense and what the relevant arguments imply for state regulation. Regarding regulation, there is an enormous literature on the First Amendment implications for any proposed regulation of pornography; this literature extends well beyond feminist engagement on the topic. For those interested in specific feminist takes on the First Amendment and anti-pornography feminism, see: Brison 1998, Strossen 1995, and MacKinnon 1993.

1.3 Is Pornography a Form of Prostitution?

Some feminists argue that pornography simply is a form of prostitution (Barry 1969; MacKinnon 2005). Recently, the United Nations Special Rapporteur on violence against women and girls, its causes and consequences, Reem Alsalem, defined pornography as “filmed prostitution.” (Alsalem 2024, 2). According to these views, given that pornographic performers are paid to have sex for the purpose of creating pornography, to then sell, and that prostitution is understood as transactional sex (sex for money), drawing any hard distinction between the two is implausible. Why would the presence of filming equipment transform sex acts for money into something other than prostitution for the purpose of recording it? Most states in the United States treat pornography as such—a form of prostitution. However, California does not.

In People v. Freeman (1988), the Supreme Court of California ruled that the state’s pandering statutes (prostitution statutes) do not apply to pornography. Relying on the obscenity-based approach to pornography (as it is the legal framework in the U.S.), the Court held that “the application of the pandering statute to the hiring of actors to perform in the production of a nonobscene motion picture would impinge unconstitionally upon First Amendment values…” (People v. Freeman 1988). “By contrast, the acts of alleged ‘prostitution’ in this case were not crimes independent of and apart from payment for the right to photograph the performance” (People v. Freeman 1988). In other words, the Court holds that sex itself (between consenting adults) is legal and so paying them for the right to “photograph” such acts does not transform the acts into acts of prostitution. The facts of this case raise parallels to websites that offer live sexual acts for paying customers—webcams, Only Fans, and similar sites are, by and large, considered “pornography” rather than prostitution.

In contrast to the U.S. law, recently Sweden adopted legislation that defines such live-sex websites as a form of prostitution, and hence subject to their regulatory model whereby the buyers of sex are criminalized while the women performing sex for money are decriminalized (“The Nordic Model”). Relevant parts of the new law read: “Anyone who, in a case other than those previously referred to in this chapter, induces a person to perform or endure sexual conduct in exchange for compensation, primarily for the purpose of participating in, or having the conduct displayed to them, shall be sentenced for purchase of sexual conduct to imprisonment for a maximum of one year” (Waltman 2025). And further: “Regarding cases involving remote interaction, this may include someone who provides or manages a website that facilitates individuals to get into contact with someone who, upon request, performs sexual conduct for compensation in the form of so-called cam shows. It could also entail that someone, in a more direct manner, commissions another person to perform shows—which include sexual conduct—on request of a third party. Such shows may be performed either digitally or, for example, at a strip club” (Waltman 2025). In this law, like some feminist analysis, there is no bright line between pornography and prostitution, and where the former is considered an instance of the latter (like in live webcams), prostitution specific laws apply. Of course, there are a variety of objections to both the “Nordic Model” for regulating prostitution and the inclusion of some forms of pornography within its purview; these will be taken up in the discussion of the regulation of prostitution below.

Catharine MacKinnon argues that not only is pornography a form of prostitution, but the commercial industry that exhibits, distributes, and manufactures pornography is engaged in sex trafficking, as defined by international law (MacKinnon 2006, 247). Her argument begins with emphasizing that the majority of pornography uses real people in its making. That is, real sex acts are performed for compensation in order to produce pornography. Thus, as an initial matter, according to MacKinnon, women and children are routinely trafficked for the purposes of making pornography. (Trafficking is understood as commercial sexual exploitation.)

Pimps are typically paid for the sexual use of the real people who are bought and sold to engage in the sex acts for money that are what most pornography is made of. The pornographers are then paid to repimp these people in the pornography itself, producing sexual pleasure for the consumers and immense profits for the pornographers, which both seek to repeat. (MacKinnon 2006, 248)

The images, once made, are used in the course of sex acts by consumers (e.g., they masturbate with them). MacKinnon argues that the use of the images for sexual acts constitutes the use of the person in the images for sex. “From the standpoint of the person used to make the materials, the image of the person is still that person. And the sexual use of the person in the materials by the consumer is a real, actual, sexual act for the user” (MacKinnon 2006, 248). MacKinnon then argues that pornography (and the prostitution required to make it) fall under various international laws and human rights instruments. For instance,

The 1949 Convention “binds states parties to punish ‘any person who, to gratify the passions of another … (2) exploits the prostitution of another person, even with the consent of that person.” To make and sell pornography is virtually always to exploit the prostitution of another person. Pornographers are almost all third-party sellers of the prostitution of other people…. (MacKinnon 2006, 252–253)

Additionally, the Palermo Protocol’s (2000) definition of trafficking states:

“Trafficking in persons” shall mean the recruitment, transportation, transfer, harbouring or receipt of persons, by means of threat or use of force or other forms of coercion, of fraud, of deception, of the abuse of power or of a position of vulnerability or of the giving or receiving of payments or benefits to achieve the consent of the person having control over another person, for the purpose of exploitation (quoted in MacKinnon 2006, 254).

MacKinnon argues that pornography falls within the definition of trafficking here:

For pornography, women and children are recruited, transported, provided and obtained for sex acts on account of which, typically, money is given to pornography pimps and received by lesser pimps. Then, each time the pornography is commercially exchanged, the trafficking continues as the women and children in it are transported and provided for sex, sold and bought again. Doing all these things for the purpose of exploiting the prostitution of others—which pornography intrinsically does—makes it trafficking in persons. (MacKinnon 2006, 254)

Those who argue that pornography and prostitution should be understood as voluntary sex work, and thus reject regulatory regimes, tend to agree with the claim that no bright line can be drawn between pornography and prostitution (or other forms of sex work). However, this claim is part of an argument for greater freedoms for sex workers and removal of laws or social stigma that impede sex workers ability to work and achieve social integration.

Theresa A. Reed, a self-proclaimed sex positive feminist, argues that the key distinction between pornography and prostitution lies in the public nature of the former and the private nature of the latter (Reed 2006, 256). Reed understands pornography to be “a form of public artistic and sexual expression,” whereas prostitution often occurs in a more private setting. Additionally, as expression, pornography is afforded legal protection that prostitution is not (at least in the U.S.). Although given the similarities (sexual contact for money), Reed argues that similar protections should be extended to prostitution on the grounds that is also a form of artistic expression. “The right to choose which form of employment or creative expression one wishes to participate in seems a valid right of any adult—and extremely feminist” (Reed 2006, 257).

Norma Jean Almodovar similarly argues that the legal distinction between pornography and prostitution is unfair and unjustified. She argues there should be no legal distinction between the two, and “all those who work in the adult sex industry should join together to make their industry legal and safer for everyone” (Almodovar 2006, 159). Almodovar’s claims embody the claims made by self-identified sex workers; as advocates for sex worker’s rights, they don’t typically draw a distinction between kinds of sex work. Rather, the term sex work is an umbrella term aiming to cover a variety of activities from stripping, to cam girls, to pornography performers, to those who sell sex for money, to even “sugar babies.”

Thus, although there is general agreement that pornography is a form of prostitution or sex work, what conclusions to draw from this fact are a matter of serious dispute. Those who understand pornography and prostitution as forms of sexual exploitation generally conclude that eliminating both is essential to securing women’s social and political equality. Those who understand some forms of pornography and prostitution as freely chosen occupations generally conclude that removal of all criminal laws for prostitution and constitutional protections for pornography are minimum desiderata. Beyond these claims proponents of free or freer markets in sex often disagree as to what, if any, forms of regulation ought to be pursued.

2. Prostitution/Sex Work

While prostitution is a familiar term for describing transactional sex, some feminists and participants in the industry object to the term, preferring “sex work” to describe the industry and “sex worker” to describe those who sell sex. Deciding which term to use is itself a political act—those who continue to use prostitution or prostituted persons generally hold the view that prostitution is exploitative and harmful to women, in particular. Those who prefer the term “sex work” hold that some forms of transactional sex are not only nonobjectionable but may be exercises of agency and freedom of those that participate in them. In what follows, I will follow the terms used by the various thinkers when describing their views; thus, I will use prostitution when the view on offer uses it and likewise will use sex work where appropriate.

2.1 Regulatory Frameworks

Much of the philosophical and legal work on prostitution/sex work is ultimately in service of defending or critiquing a particular regulatory framework. To contextualize the arguments that follow, mapping the various policy positions is necessary. First, there is full criminalization. This is the policy of most nation-states. Under this approach both buyers (consumers) and sellers (prostitutes/sex workers) activities are illegal. Few, if any, current feminists or liberals defend full criminalization. Criminalization disproportionately harms women in prostitution; laws are frequently asymmetrically enforced such that women are arrested and incur criminal sanctions; under criminalization, police are empowered to extort sex from women in prostitution in order to avoid arrest; and, typically justifications for full criminalization rest on controversial moralisms that are inconsistent with liberal democracies commitment to toleration and pluralism (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 4).

A second position, legalization, entails state regulation and oversight of markets in sex. This means prostitution specific laws and policies regulated and enforced by the state. Germany is one nation-state that has fully legalized prostitution. While some note the benefits of legalization, such as eligibility for social benefits like social security and health care, others (including sex workers themselves) argue that legalization undermines the sexual autonomy of women in prostitution and subjects them to rigid oversight by the state. Thus, many sex workers themselves and their scholarly allies advocate for a third position—full decriminalization (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 5).

In theory, full decriminalization entails a hands-off policy by the state—that is removing all criminal sanctions without implementing a state regulatory regime. In practice, however, states that understand themselves to have decriminalized prostitution (such as New Zealand) nonetheless have prostitution specific laws including: zoning laws, state requirements for brothel licensing, health and safety requirements (mandatory condom use, e.g.), and age verification requirements. Thus, in practice, legalization and full decriminalization overlap to a degree; yet, sex worker advocates think the model of decriminalization adopted in New Zealand, for example, is compatible with sex worker autonomy. Critics contend that full decriminalization increases demand for sex workers, and so proliferates sex trafficking (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 5). Critics also argue that decriminalization doesn’t achieve its stated aim—harm reduction.

Finally, the “Nordic Model” (also known as the “Equality Model”), developed by Catharine A. MacKinnon, criminalizes buyers (“johns”) and decriminalizes sellers (the activities of persons in prostitution) while providing social support for exit. As such, the Nordic Model is known as an abolitionist approach to prostitution. Advocates of the Nordic Model tend to argue that prostitution is both inherently unequal and produces unequal outcomes for women, as individuals and as a class. Those who object to this model often are the same people who favor full decriminalization; they tend to argue that the Nordic model leaves women in prostitution worse off (by removing an option) and to the extent prostitution harms women either reform or harm reduction better secures the interests of women in prostitution. Critics also contend that the Nordic Model is, in effect, a version of criminalization and brings with it the attendant harms of full criminalization (Watson and Flannigan, 9–12).

(See Watson and Flannigan 2019 and DeMarnefee 2010 for further discussion of regulatory frameworks. For a detailed discussion of the costs and benefits of full decriminalization compared with some form of legalization, see Davis 2015.)

2.2 Prostitution/Sex Work

Arguments against prostitution were a prominent focus of second-wave feminism. Many radical feminists opposed prostitution as a form of “sexual slavery,” or as sexual exploitation, or as a form of “paid rape,” or as a paradigm of sexual objectification (Barry 1969; MacKinnon 2005; Moran 2013). As with radical feminist analysis of pornography, these arguments rest on a deeper analysis of the social construction of sexuality as constituted by male domination. As the social meaning of masculinity is understood in terms of dominance, and femininity as forced subordination, on these analyses, prostitution represents a kind of ground zero for analyzing the condition of all women because it is constituted by that very conception of sexuality—men’s access to women’s bodies on men’s terms.

At the same time that radical feminists were crafting and sharing their arguments, sex workers, themselves, began to organize. Margo St. James is often credited as the first sex worker to start organizing women in sex work to demand decriminalization, unions, better working conditions, and that policy makers listen to the voices of women in sex work. St. James began her work in San Fransico, founding C.O.Y.O.T.E. (Call Off Your Old Tired Ethics) a prostitution rights organization (Pheterson 1989, 5). Subsequently, she participated creating an international organization for sex workers across the globe to meet and self-organize. The International Committee for Prostitutes’ Rights was formed and held several “World Congresses” in which women in prostitution gathered to draft a statement of rights. The World Charter for Prostitutes’ Rights was drafted in 1985 (Pheterson 1989, 40–42). Its demands included: decriminalization of all adult prostitution, guaranteed protection of human and civil rights for those in prostitution, eradication of zoning laws and protection of freedom to chose place of work, elimination of health screening solely for persons in prostitution, provision of equal social benefits for those in prostitution, elimination of any special taxes, and educational programs directed at removing stigma (Pheterson 1989, 40–42).

These competing perspectives still frame much of the contemporary debate, although not all arguments critiquing prostitution rest on radical feminist analyzes of sexuality. Overall, arguments for or against markets in sex can be difficult to evaluate insofar as some approach the questions they raise under the auspices of ideal theory, while others aim to evaluate such markets as they historically and currently function. Those who prefer ideal theory generally want to know whether there is anything wrong about the buying/selling of sex “it itself,” i.e., apart from the array of harms that follow from such markets. Those who center the empirical facts presently structuring and flowing from markets in sex, generally want to know, given the non-ideal facts, which policy approach is preferable.

Among those who investigate the question as to whether markets in sex are intrinsically wrong, bad, or harmful, some conclude even apart from the contingent harms that markets in transactional sex cause, the exchange of sex for money (or other consideration) is inherently harmful, degrading, or unequal.

Carol Pateman locates prostitution within the broader account of “the sexual contract” she develops to analyze and explain male domination (patriarchal rule). The sexual contract is a detailed account of the social construction of sex/gender and (hetero)sexuality. In short, the sexual contract is an account of “the power men exercise over women,” including “establishing orderly access to women’s bodies” (Pateman 1988). Among the aims of Pateman’s reconstruction of male domination is showing how male power is legitimated, treated as “natural,” and “inevitable,” as a means of subordinating women. On Pateman’s analysis “johns”/ “punters” purchase unilateral access to a woman’s body to use for their sexual gratification. This act embodies “the sensation of being a patriarchal master” (Pateman 1988, 203). The prostitution contract is one fundamental way in which “masculinity”—understood as dominant and entitled to rule over women—is shored up. The relative inequality of women to men is constitutive of the exchange; thus, masculine power is expressed in the very act of “buying” a woman.

Anne Phillips also argues prostitution is intrinsically unequal. She argues that markets in body parts or bodies themselves (prostitution) are distinct from other markets because there is no imaginable benign reason that persons would be drawn into selling body parts or their bodies except for inequality. Her argument for this claim rests on the fact that everyone has a body but only some people are motivated to sell their body parts or bodies themselves. What could motivate some persons to market their bodies in these ways? She answers: “The inequality that attends such markets is not just contingent; its and intrinsic feature” (Phillips 2011, 738).

Christine Overall argues that prostitution is distinct from other forms of labor because it is “an asymmetrical relationship of exchange in which the sex worker provides sexual services and the customer provides recompense…” (Overall 1992, 716–717). Thus, she argues prostitution is constituted by an “asymmetrical economic exchange.” In other words, the value of money and the value of access to one’s body are not commensurable goods. Lori Watson also offers an argument from asymmetry: “When sex is transactional—motivated, in part, by the need for money, even if voluntary—the person paying for sexual services and the person selling sexual services are asymmetrically situated with determining the encounter. Their respective abilities to exit any engagement are unequal, and the terms of the exchange are structurally such that the risk to the seller is potentially loss of bodily autonomy and integrity which further underscores the asymmetrical position each is in” (Watson 2022, 546).

Among those who find nothing inherently wrong or objectionable with markets in sex, one line of argumentation rests on the claim that sex cannot be distinguished from other goods or forms of labor we find markets in unobjectionable. Sex worker advocates have adopted this line of reasoning in endorsing the slogan “sex work is work like any other form of work.” Both Martha Nussbaum and Sybil Schwarzenbach argue that there is no principled distinction between prostitution and other uses of the body. Schwarzenbach objects to analogies between prostitution and slavery, arguing that if properly reformed and regulated prostitution is more like hiring a dancer (Schwarzenbach 1991). Nussbaum argues that prostitution cannot be distinguished from various other kind of work that we find unobjectionable (Nussbaum 1998 [2006]) According to Nussbaum, prostitution is highly and unjustly stigmatized, and removing such stigma should be an aim of those wanting to improve the conditions for women in prostitution (Nussbaum 1998 [2006]). Both Schwarzenbach and Nussbaum claim that the only basis for treating sex work as distinct from other forms of labor is a prior claim that sex is somehow unique and special. Finding no argument for that claim persuasive, each thinks that feminist arguments against prostitution fail to justify anything other than full decriminalization.

Some advocates of free markets in sex take a stronger position. It’s not just that there are no good arguments for limiting or prohibiting such markets, but individuals have rights to buy and sell sex (provided the exchange is consensual). In addressing the moral permissibility of markets, Jason Brennan and Peter Jaworski advance the following principle for evaluating all kinds of markets that many find objectionable (babies, kidneys, sex): “if you can give it away, then you can sell it” (Brennan and Jaworski 2016, 10). Applying this standard to transactional sex, Brennan and Jaworski and Jessica Flannigan argue because the underlying act (consensual sex) is morally permissible, markets in sex are morally permissible. In other words, markets themselves are morally neutral and so, markets don’t morally transform some permissible act into a non-permissible act (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 178). Flannigan extends this argument to a rights-based argument for both participants in any sexual exchange. Adults have a right to have consensual sex for any reason, including when the reason is for money (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 178–179). Those who buy sex also have a right grounded in their broader rights to sexual freedom and intimacy, to purchase sex from any willing participant (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 194). Given such rights, Flannigan argues it is presumptively wrong for any third-party (the state, for example) to interfere with the exercise of such rights. For this reason, and others (see below), Flannigan supports full decriminalization. Cecile Fabre also has a rights-based view; she argues that there are no good reasons to restrict any individual from selling sex, if they so choose, nor are there any compelling arguments for preventing persons from buying sex, if they so choose (Fabre 2008). Thus, she insists that individuals have a right to do either. However, she supports a moderated form of legalization rather than full decriminalization, as she is convinced that industry specific regulations need to be in place, given workplace vulnerabilities (Fabre 2008).

Within a rights-based framework, some argue that limits or prohibitions on sex markets not only deprive people of rights to consensual sex generally but disproportionately deprive persons with disabilities from sexual outlets. In this vein, some argue that sex workers should be understood to be a kind of therapist—a sex therapist. Critics counter that this view rests on an unsubstantiated claim—that person’s with disabilities rely on sex workers more than other and can’t have fulfilling sex lives without paying someone for sex (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 112).

Non-rights-based arguments for or against markets in sex consider the empirical conditions internal to sex markets as well as their potential effects. Specific considerations include concern for sex workers’ autonomy, concern for their welfare (health and safety are primary concerns), and potential third-party effects. Different arguments highlight and weigh these concerns differently, and hence authors draw conflicting conclusions about regulation depending on the balance of reasons deemed to be most salient.

Margaret Radin argues that complete commodification of sex—fully open markets in every aspect of sexuality—would transform our “discourse about sex, and in particular about women’s sexuality.” (Radin 1996, 133). “The open market might render an understanding of women (and perhaps everyone) in terms of sexual dollar value impossible to avoid” (Radin 1996, 133). The result would be a transformation of our “very conception of sexuality” (Radin 1996, 133). Ultimately, such a transformation would undermine human flourishing and the pursuit of relationships according to an ideal of equal sharing (Radin 1996, 134). However, Radin does not draw the conclusion that markets in sex should be prohibited. Prohibition, according to Radin, makes women in prostitution worse off than they already are. Prohibition creates a double bind for “[p]oor women who believe that they must sell their sexual services in order to survive…” and subjects them to “moral opprobrium, disease, arrest, and violence” (Radin 1996, 132). Yet, she does not favor full “laissez-faire” decriminalization. Instead, she emphasizes that the decriminalization of “the sale of sexual services” needs to be coupled with regulations to prevent complete commodification of sex, such as, banning pimping, banning “recruitment,” and refusal to enforce contracts (Radin 1996, 135).

Debra Satz, too, regards markets in sex as potentially noxious. For Satz, the key to evaluating markets in sex turns on whether they promote and further gender inequality. There is nothing intrinsically wrong with the exchange of sex for money or money for sex, in her view (Satz 2010, 136). Rather, it is an empirical question as to whether prostitution harms both the individual women in it and women as a class. Insofar as prostitution “represents women as the sexual servants of men” and rests upon “an idea of women as inferior,” it is wrong and unjust, she argues (Satz 2010, 143–144). If prostitution fosters gender inequality by embodying these ideas of women and proliferating such an image of all women, then it may reinforce women’s inferior status in society. Satz thinks that as such prostitution may be contingently wrong, but we require a lot more empirical evidence to make that determination. She argues forcefully against criminalization (banning) on the grounds that such policies only further harm women (Satz 2010, 151). Instead, she argues for certain policies to mitigate prostitution’s negative effects (such as protection against coercion into prostitution, availability of birth-control and STI protection, protection of women’s rights to refuse sex, minimum age requirements, and protections against pimping) (Satz 2010, 152). She favors full decriminalization in Western, liberal democracies, where she thinks voluntary prostitution is more frequent.

Elizabeth Anderson, in contrast, regards the costs of open markets (or even decriminalization) as too burdensome to warrant any policy of toleration. She argues that even if adults have the underlying right to engage in the activity, certain externalities (harms to third parties) can give us reasons to prohibit certain markets in sex. Anderson argues that when certain goods (like sex) are subjected to market norms, the non-market value of such goods can be debased. Non-market (i.e., intimate and personal) engagement in sex acts “is founded upon a mutual recognition of the partners as sexually attracted to each other and as affirming an intimate relationship in their mutual offering of themselves to each other” (Anderson 1993, 154). Such a shared good is “destroyed” by the commodification of sex (Anderson 1993, 154). Transactional sex involves the relevant parties valuing the other “only instrumentally.” Moreover, where men pay women for sex, they are generally using them solely for their own sexual gratification with no consideration of the woman’s interests or needs. Commodified sex, as such, is “degrading and degraded.” Anderson further argues, the state should prohibit the commodification of sex because permitting it allows pernicious norms of masculinity and femininity to proliferate undermining women’s status and the possibility of sexuality as a sphere of “shared goods” among partners.

Scott Anderson defends the radical feminist position on prostitution (prohibition, as he understands it) by “showing that prohibition of prostitution is of a piece with a wide-range of social regulations that serve to protect sexual autonomy” (Anderson 2006, 750). Common regulations or norms such as prohibiting businesses from requiring sex as a condition of work (i.e., sexual harassment laws), the norm that grounds a right to refuse sex for any reason, the prohibition on using sex as a form of consideration in contractual exchanges, and the like, are grounded in the value of sexual autonomy (a value nearly everyone holds). Anderson argues these norms would be threatened by any normalization of prostitution because, in so doing, we would embrace a new norm that sex is just another form of commerce (sex is a legitimate form of consideration). Adopting such a norm would undermine the bases for various protections of sexual autonomy now in place; under prohibitionist policies sexual autonomy is protected by creating a separation between our sexual lives and our commercial and work lives (Anderson 2006).

Halie Liberto responds to Anderson by arguing that he conflates two kinds of prostitution—sexual-rights-alienating prostitution and sexual-rights-preserving prostitution (Liberto 2009, 139). Rights-alienation implies that during the contracted encounter, the seller alienates all specified transactional rights to the buyer. Rights-preservation entails that the agent in question retains “jurisdiction over that which the right regards” (Liberto 2009, 143). Thus, in the context of prostitution, this means that persons in prostitution maintain authority over their sexual activities and retain the right to exit or refuse. Anderson’s argument only applies to rights-alienating forms of prostitution, not rights-preserving forms, according to Liberto.

Laurie Shrage argues that “commodified exchanges in sexual services between men and women” vary historically and culturally (Shrage 1989, 348). Thus, she objects to feminist analyses that rest on treating all prostitution alike. From her investigation of varied practices, Shrage concludes that there are examples of commercial sexual exchanges that are “free of gender and class domination.” (Shrage 1994, 241) Thus, there is nothing inherently exploitative about transactional sex, on her view. Given that criminalization and stigmatization proliferate harms against persons in prostitution, Shrage argues for full decriminalization (though with some industry specific regulations in order to protect sex workers from exploitation and abuse) (Shrage 1994, 243). Moreover, she argues that feminist work should aim at “overcoming the discriminatory structures” that sustain prostitution, and in succeeding, they will undermine prostitution as we know it (Shrage 1989, 360–361).

Lori Watson examines the claim often advanced by sex workers themselves or those advocating for decriminalization or legalization that sex work is work just like any other form of work. She argues that basic occupational health and safety standards, guaranteed to workers, cannot be observed in the context of sex work (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 78–102). Drawing an analogy to medical work that involves exposure to potential blood borne pathogens, Watson highlights that those in prostitution are regularly exposed to the bodily fluids of others. Medical professionals vulnerable to such exposure are required to wear personal protective equipment that reduces any risk from exposure to adequate and safe levels. The only personal protective equipment for persons in prostitution are condoms (and perhaps gloves) and these are not adequate to guarantee health and safety. Moreover, clients often demand condomless sex, and persons in prostitution are relatively powerless to refuse or negotiate. (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 96). Further Watson argues that worker autonomy is insufficiently protected where persons in prostitution are either full employees or independent contractors. (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 102–114). Employees are under the power of employers, and this can greatly reduce one’s ability to refuse any given client. Independent contractors fail to receive many of the benefits of an employee status and are still required to provide services in a non-discriminatory fashion (as are employees). Watson points out that under current law, refusal to serve a member of a protected class is a violation of civil rights, and only if one accepts that sex is distinct from other kinds of work can you justify and exemption from such laws. (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 109). Additionally, Watson argues that treating sex like other forms of work would have unacceptable implications concerning the enforcement of contracts. (Watson and Flannigan 2019, 114–127). Here, again, sex must be recognized as distinct and unique in order to justify various exceptions to contract law that would be needed to prevent persons in prostitution from being penalized for refusing sex.

2.2 Sex Trafficking

Although feminists are divided on the question of prostitution/sex work, nearly everyone, feminist or not, opposes sex trafficking. Many people believe that the distinction between prostitution and sex trafficking concerns movements across boarders—that is, transporting a person from one location to another for purposes of sexual exploitation. However, this is not the legal or conceptual basis for the distinction (MacKinnon 2009). Catharine A. MacKinnon shows that the distinction turns on third-party involvement (i.e., pimps or pimping). Where prostitution involves pimping (including brothel owners) it is sex trafficking under legal definitions. Legally, some states and international instruments further distinguish between trafficking (prostitution) and extreme forms of trafficking, where the latter is defined in terms of the use of force, fraud, or coercion. It is this extreme form of trafficking that is the shared target of all feminist critiques; no one should be forced, coerced, or defrauded into prostitution/sex work. The crux of feminist debates concerning sex trafficking, then, rests on discerning what constitutes voluntary prostitution (and determining whether it occurs) and accounting for what constitutes force, fraud, and coercion.

Radical feminists, like MacKinnon, hold the position that the overwhelming majority of prostitution, if not all of it, rests on force and coercion. Evidence for this view includes: the fact of sex inequality means that women, as a group, have fewer options than do men, this is especially true of trans women and women of color; under conditions of sex inequality women are socialized to a conception of femininity that implies women are the natural sexual servants of men; the empirical fact that poverty, often extreme poverty, is the reason women are led into prostitution; the fact that many persons in prostitution began as children; the fact that most persons in prostitution are also members of other social disadvantaged groups (based on race, caste, and ethnicity, for example); the fact that many of those in prostitution have a history of child and adult sexual abuse; and, finally, the fact that money itself coerces the sex acts in question (i.e., the sex acts are undertaken for monetary or other compensation rather than other reasons which would indicate that sex was wanted). Thus, in short, a range of inequalities explain why persons are in prostitution and what keeps them here. (MacKinnon 2009 and Alsalem 2024)

Critics argue that radical feminists conflate voluntary prostitution with sex trafficking and, in so doing, perpetuate a range of harms against sex workers. Kempadoo argues that the forced/voluntary distinction serves to create distinctions among sex workers that paint all persons in sex work as victims, on the one hand, and serves to further stigmatize women who choose sex work, on the other. Moreover, in focusing so much international attention on victims of trafficking, states and international bodies ignore the real needs of persons in sex work (Kempadoo and Doezema 1998).

In addition to arguing that trafficking “discourse” paints all sex workers as victims, Kempadoo argues that those feminists who analyze prostitution as violence against women discount the agency of sex workers. (Kempadoo and Dozema 1998). Although many of the women (and men) in sex work are persons of color or from developing nations, Kempadoo argues that many such persons exercise forms of agency in their labor choices. Recognizing their agency, and affording them accompanying respect, requires understanding sex work as a form of labor, and one performed, largely, by marginalized people (Kempadoo and Dozema 1998). Feminists interested in improving the lives of persons in sex work should create space for them to articulate their own needs, desires, and hopes. Any policy decisions should be directed by sex workers themselves and not imposed from above. Additionally, as vulnerable workers, legal priorities should include protection of sex workers human and civil rights and guaranteeing safe and non-exploitative working conditions.

Kemapoo rejects the claim that poverty itself should be uniformly understood as a basis for coercion (Kempadoo and Dozema 1998). Many migrants aim to leave their home country precisely because of poverty, and their decision to leave is an exercise of their rational agency under difficult circumstances. Legislation that prevents migrants from entering sex work takes away an option that may be necessary for meeting their needs without providing any alternative.

The core issue that divides analyzes of sex trafficking concerns how to best characterize consent under conditions of inequality. No one disagrees that various forms of inequality (often compounding ones) best explain why women are disproportionately overrepresented in systems of prostitution. The disagreement over what constitutes sex trafficking turns on whether and when such forms of inequality should be considered to vitiate any meaningful consent.

3. Conclusion

Feminist debates about sex work—pornography and prostitution, specifically—continue to develop and evolve. Feminist philosophical engagement, to date, has largely centered on those forms of sex work in which living human beings (women, in particular) perform the sex acts. New developments in technology, such as artificial intelligence, virtual reality, and sex robots pose hosts of new questions for those working on these topics. There has been some philosophical engagement with these new technologies, but there is no systematic debate or dialogue occurring at present. Whether such technologies will simply reproduce the kinds of harms radical feminists identify as constitutive of women’s oppression or alleviate those harms remains a fertile ground for future research.

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  • Jenkins, Katherine, 2017, “What Women are For: Pornography and Social Ontology,” in M, Mikkola (ed.), Beyond Speech: Pornography and Analytic Feminist Philosophy, New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 91–112.
  • Kempadoo, Kamala (ed.), 1999, Sun, Sex, and Gold: Tourism and Sex Work in the Caribbean, Lanham: Rowman and Littlefield Publishers.
  • –––, 2001, “Women of Color and the Global Sex Trade: Transnational Feminist Perspectives”, Meridians, 1: 28–51.
  • Kempadoo, K. and J. Doezema (eds.), 1998, Global Sex Workers: Rights, Resistance, and Redefinition, New York: Routledge.
  • Langton, Rae, 1995, “Speech Acts and Unspeakable Acts”, in Dwyer (ed.) 1995: 203–19.
  • –––, 2009, Sexual Solipsism, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Leigh, Carole, 1997, “Inventing Sex Work”, in Nagle 1997: 225–31.
  • LeMoncheck, Linda, 1985, Dehumanizing Women, New Jersey: Rowman & Allanheld.
  • Lerner, Gerder, 1986, The Creation of Patriarchy, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Liberto, Hallie, 2009, “Normalizing Prostitution versus Normalizing the Alienability of Sexual Rights: A Response to Scott A. Anderson”, Ethics, 120: 138–45.
  • Longino, Helen, 1980, “Pornography, Oppression, and Freedom: A Closer Look”, in L. Lederer (ed.), Take Back the Night: Women on Pornography, New York: William Morrow and Company, pp. 40–54.
  • MacKinnon, Catharine A., 1987, Feminism Unmodified: Discourses on Life and Law, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 1989, Toward A Feminist Theory of the State, Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 1993, Only Words, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 2005, Women’s Lives, Men’s Laws, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 2006, Are Women Human? And Other International Dialogues, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • –––, 2009, “Trafficking, Prostitution, and Inequality,” Harvard Civil Rights-Civil Liberties Review, 46: 272–309.
  • –––, 2017, “Response to Five Philosophers: Toward a Feminist Theory of the State Some Decades Later”, in Special Issue: Symposium on Catharine A. MacKinnon’s Toward a Feminist Theory of the State, of Feminist Philosophy Quarterly, 3(2): Article 6. doi:10.5206/fpq/2017.2.6
  • MacKinnon, Catharine A. and Andrea Dworkin (eds.), 1997, In Harm’s Way: The Pornography Civil Rights Hearings, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • McGowan, Mary Kate, 2003, “Conversational Exercitives and the Force of Pornography,” Philosophy & Public Affairs, 31(2): 155–189.
  • –––, 2005, “On Pornography: MacKinnon, Speech Acts, and ‘False’ Construction”, Hypatia, 20: 23–49.
  • –––, 2017, “On Multiple Types of Silencing,” in M. Mikkola (ed.), Beyond Speech: Pornography and Analytic Feminist Philosophy, New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 39–58.
  • McGowan, Mary Kate, A. Adelman, S. Helmers, and J. Stolzenberg, 2011, “A Partial Defense of Illocutionary Silencing”, Hypatia, 26: 132–49. doi:10.1111/j.1527-1.2010.01122.x
  • Mikkola, Mari, 2008, “Contexts and Pornography”, Analysis, 68: 316–20.
  • –––, 2011, “Illocution, Silencing and the Act of Refusal”, Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, 92: 415–37.
  • –––, 2019, Pornography: A Philosophical Introduction, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Mikkola, Mari (ed.) 2017, Beyond Speech: Pornography and Analytic Feminist Philosophy, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Millet, Kate, 2000, Sexual Politics, Chicago: University of Illinois Press.
  • Miller-Young, Mirelille, 2014, A Taste for Brown Sugar: Black Women in Pornography, Raleigh, NC: Duke University Press.
  • Moen, Ole Martin, 2012, “Is Prostitution Harmful?” Journal of Medical Ethics, 40: 73–81.
  • Morgan, Robin, 1980, “Theory and Practice: Pornography and Rape,” in L. Lederer (ed.), Take Back the Night: Women on Pornography, New York: William Morrow and Company, pp. 134–140.
  • Nagle, Jill (ed.), 1997, Whores and Other Feminists, New York: Routledge.
  • Nash, Jennifer, 2014, The Black Body in Ecstasy: Reading Race, Reading Pornography, Raliegh, NC: Duke University Press.
  • Nussbaum, Martha, 1998 [2006], “‘Whether From Reason Or Prejudice’: Taking Money For Bodily Services”, The Journal of Legal Studies, 27(S2): 693–723, doi:10.1086/468040; reprinted in Spector (ed.) 2006: pp. 175–208.
  • –––, 1999, Sex and Social Justice, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Oddone-Paolucci, Elizabeth, Mark Genuis, and Claudio Violato, 2000, “A Meta-Analysis of the Published Research on the Effects of Pornography,” in C. Violato and E. Oddone-Paolucci (eds.), The Changing Family and Child Development, New York: Routledge.
  • Overall, Christine, 1992, “What’s Wrong with Prostitution?: Evaluating Sex Work”, Signs, 17: 705–24.
  • Pateman, Carole, 1988, The Sexual Contract, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
  • Papadaki, L., 2017, “Treating Pornography as a Woman and Women’s Objectification,” in M. Mikkola (ed.), Beyond Speech: Pornography and Analytic Feminist Philosophy, New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 137–156.
  • Parent, William A., 1990, “A Second Look at Pornography and the Subordination of Women,” The Journal of Philosophy, 87(4): 205–211.
  • People v. Freeman, 1988, 250 Cal. Rptr. 598, 46 Cal. 3d 419, 758 P.2d 1128, Supreme Court of California, No. S000070. [People v. Freeman 1988 available online]
  • Pheterson, Gail (ed.), 1989, A Vindication of the Rights of Whores, Seattle: Seal Press.
  • Phillips, Anne, 2011, “It’s My Body and I’ll Do What I Like With It: Bodies as Objects and Property”, Political Theory, 39: 724–48.
  • Radin, Margaret, 1996, Contested Commodities, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Rea, Michael, 2001, “What is Pornography?” Noûs, 35(1): 118–145.
  • Reed, Teresa, 2006, “Private Acts versus Public Art: Where Prostitution Ends and Pornography Begins”, in J. Spector (ed.), Prostitution and Pornography: Philosophical Debates about the Sex Industry, Stanford: Stanford University Press, pp. 249–257.
  • Rubin, Gail, 1984, “Thinking Sex: Notes for a Radical Theory of the Politics of Sexuality”, in C. Vance (ed.), Pleasure and Danger: Exploring Female Sexuality, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
  • –––, 1993, “Misguided, Dangerous and Wrong, an Analysis of Anti-pornography Politics”, in A. Assiter and A. Carol (eds.), Bad Girls and Dirty Pictures: The Challenge to Reclaim Feminism, London: Pluto Press, pp. 18–40.
  • Russell, Diana (ed.), 1993, Making Violence Sexy: Feminist Views on Pornography, New York: Teachers College, Columbia University.
  • Satz, Debra, 1995, “Markets in Women’s Sexual Labor”, Ethics, 106: 63–85.
  • –––, 2010, Why Some Things Should Not Be for Sale: The Moral Limits of Markets, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Saul, Jennifer, 2006a, “On Treating Things as People: Objectification, Pornography, and the History of the Vibrator”, Hypatia, 21: 45–61.
  • –––, 2006b, “Pornography, Speech Acts, and Contexts”, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 106: 229–248.
  • Schwarzenbach, Sybil, 1991, “Contractarians and Feminists Debate Prostitution”, New York University Review of Law and Social Change, 18: 103–30.
  • Shrage, Laurie, 1989, “Should Feminists Oppose Prostitution?” Ethics, 99: 347–61.
  • –––, 1994, Moral Dilemmas of Feminism: Prostitution, Adultery, and Abortion, New York: Routledge.
  • –––, 1996, “Prostitution and the Case for Decriminalization”, Dissent, 43: 41–45.
  • –––, 1999, “Do Lesbian Prostitutes Have Sex with Their Clients? A Clintonesque Reply”, Sexualities, 2: 259–61.
  • –––, 2005, “Exposing the Fallacies of Anti-Porn Feminism”, Feminist Theory, 6: 45–65.
  • –––, 2016, “Prostitution”, in J. Petrik and A. Zucker (eds.), Philosophy of Sex and Love, Farmington Hills: Macmillan Reference USA.
  • Shrage, Laurie and R. S. Stewart, 2015, Philosophizing About Sex, Peterborough, Ontario: Broadview Press.
  • Spector, Jessica (ed.), 2006, Prostitution and Pornography: Philosophical Debate About the Sex Industry, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
  • Stark, Cynthia A., 1997, “Is Pornography an Action?: The Causal vs. the Conceptual View of Pornography’s Harm”, Social Theory and Practice, 23(2): 277–306.
  • Stark, Christine and Rebecca Whisnant (eds.), 2004, Not for Sale: Feminists Resisting Prostitution and Pornography, North Melbourne: Spinifex Press.
  • Steinem, Gloria, 1980, “Erotica and Pornography: A Clear and Present Difference,” in L. Lederer (ed.), Take Back the Night: Women on Pornography, New York: William Morrow and Company, pp. 35–39.
  • Strossen, Natalie, 1995, Defending Pornography: Free Speech, Sex, and the Fight for Women’s Rights, New York: Scribner.
  • Taormino, Tristan, Celine Shimiuz, Constance Penley, and Mireille Miller-Young, 2013, The Feminist Porn Book: The Politics of Producing Pleasure, New York: The Feminist Press.
  • Vadas, Melinda, 1987, “A First Look at the Pornography/Civil Rights Ordinance: Could Pornography be the Subordination of Women?” The Journal of Philosophy, 84(9): 487–511.
  • –––, 2005, “The Manufacture-for-use of Pornography and Women’s Inequality”, The Journal of Political Philosophy, 13: 174–93.
  • Van Brabant, Petra, 2017, “In/Egalitarian Pornography: A Simplistic View of Pornography,” in M. Mikkola (ed.), Beyond Speech: Pornography and Analytic Feminist Philosophy, New York: Oxford University Press, pp. 221–243.
  • Vance, Carole (ed.), 1984, Pleasure and Danger: Exploring Female Sexuality, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
  • Walker, Alice, 1981, You Can’t Keep a Good Woman Down, Orlando, FL: Hardcourt Books.
  • Waltman, Max, 2021, Pornography: The Politics of Legal Challenges, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • ––– (trans.), 2025, “Unofficial Translation of Swedish Government Bill and Materials 2024/25:124” on file with author, Lori Watson.
  • Watson, Lori, 2019, “Philosophical Debates About Prostitution: The State of the Question”, The Southern Journal of Philosophy, 57: 165–93.
  • –––, 2022, “An Equality Approach to Prostitution”, in The Routledge Handbook of Philosophy of Sex and Sexuality, B. Earp, C. Chambers, and L. Watson (eds.), London: Routledge, 538–550.
  • –––, 2024, “On Domination”, in Ruth Chang and Amia Srinivasan (eds.), Philosophical Conversations, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Watson, Lori and Jessica Flannigan, 2020, Debating Sex Work, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • West, Caroline, “Pornography and Censorship”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Winter 2022 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/win2022/entries/pornography-censorship/>.
  • Zheng, Robin, 2017, “Race and Pornography: The Dilemma of the (Un)Desirable”, in M. Mikkola (ed.), Beyond Speech: Pornography and Analytic Feminist Philosophy, Oxford Scholarship Online.

Other Important Works

  • Adler, A., 2001, “The Perverse Law of Child Pornography”, Columbia Law Review, 101: 209–273.
  • Barry, K., 1979, Female Sexual Slavery, New York: Avon Books.
  • Bell, L., 1987, Good Girls/Bad Girls: Feminists and Sex Trade Workers Face to Face, Toronto: Seal Press.
  • Bell, S., 1994, Reading, Writing, and Rewriting the Prostitute Body, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
  • Burstyn, V. (ed.), 1985, Women Against Censorship, Vancouver: Douglas and McIntyre.
  • Butler, J., 1997, Excitable Speech: A Politics of the Performative, New York: Routledge.
  • Carse, A., 1995, “Pornography: An Uncivil Liberty?” Hypatia, 10: 155–82.
  • Cawston, A., 2019, “The feminist case against pornography: a review and re-evaluation”, Inquiry, 62: 624–58.
  • Chancer, L., 1998, Reconcilable Differences: Confronting Beauty, Pornography, and the Future of Feminism, Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • Chapkis, W., 1997, Live Sex Acts: Women Performing Erotic Labor, New York: Routledge.
  • Dewey, S. and P. Kelly (eds.), 2011, Policing Pleasure: Sex Work, Policy, and the State in Global Perspective, New York: New York University Press.
  • Drabek, M., 2016, “Pornographic Subordination, Power, and Feminist Alternatives”, Feminist Philosophy Quarterly, 2(1): 1–19.
  • Gauthier, J., 2011, “Prostitution, Sexual Autonomy, and Sex Discrimination”, Hypatia, 26: 166–86.
  • Gibson, P.C. and R. Gibson (eds.), 1993, Dirty Looks: Women, Pornography and Power, London: BFI Publishing.
  • Grebowicz, M., 2011, “Speech, Rights, Privacies, and Pleasures in Conflict”, Hypatia, 26: 150–65.
  • –––, 2013, Why Internet Porn Matters, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
  • Griffin, S., 1981, Pornography and Silence: Culture’s Revenge Against Nature, New York: Harper and Row.
  • Gubar, S. and J. Hoff (eds.), 1989, For Adult Users Only: The Dilemma of Violent Pornography, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
  • Itzin, C. (ed.), 1992, Pornography: Women, Violence, and Civil Liberties, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Kappeler, S., 1986, The Pornography of Representation, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • Kipnis, L., 1996, Bound and Gagged: Pornography and the Politics of Fantasy in America, New York: Grove Press.
  • Kulick, D., 1998, Travesti: Sex, Gender and Culture among Brazilian Transgendered Prostitutes, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Kuo, L., 2002, Prostitution Policy: Revolutionizing Practice Through a Gendered Perspective, New York: New York University Press.
  • Leidholdt, D. and J. Raymond (eds.), 1990, The Sexual Liberals and the Attack on Feminism, New York: Pergamon Press.
  • Levine, J., 2002, Harmful to Minors: The Perils of Protecting Children from Sex, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • Levine, P., 2003, Prostitution, Race, and Politics: Policing Venereal Disease in the British Empire, New York: Routledge.
  • Marshall, S.E., 1999, “Bodyshopping: The Case of Prostitution”, Journal of Applied Philosophy, 16: 139–50.
  • Matrix, C., (ed.), 1996, Tales from the Clit: A Female Experience of Pornography, Edinburgh: AK Press.
  • Miller v. California, 1972, U.S. Supreme Court, 413 U.S. 15.
  • Mintz, K., 2014, “Sexual Intimacy, Social Justice, and Severe Disabilities”, The Journal of Philosophy, Science & Law, 14: 4–15.
  • Outshoorn, J. (ed.), 2004, The Politics of Prostitution: Women’s Movements, Democratic States and the Globalisation of Sex Commerce, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Moran, Rachel., 2013, Paid For: My Journey Through Prostitution, Gill & MacMillian, Ltd.
  • Pheterson, G. (ed.), 1989, A Vindication of the Rights of Whores, Seattle: Seal Press.
  • Russell, D., 1998, Dangerous Relationships: Pornography, Misogyny, and Rape, Newbury Park: Sage.
  • ––– (ed.), 1993, Making Violence Sexy: Feminist Views on Pornography, New York: Teachers College Press.
  • Stark, C., 1997, “Is Pornography an Action?: The Causal vs. the Conceptual View of Pornography’s Harm”, Social Theory and Practice, 23: 277–306.
  • Vadas, M., 2005, “The Manufacture-for-use of Pornography and Women’s Inequality,” The Journal of Political Philosophy, 2: 174–193.
  • Walkowitz, J., 1980, Prostitution and Victorian Society: Women, Class, and the State, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Watson, L., 2007, “Pornography and Public Reason”, Social Theory and Practice, 33: 467–88.
  • –––, 2010, “Pornography”, Philosophy Compass, 5: 535–50.
  • Weitzer, R., 2011, Legalizing Prostitution: From Illicit Vice to Lawful Business, New York: NYU Press.
  • –––, (ed.), 2009, Sex For Sale: Prostitution, Pornography, and the Sex Industry, 2nd Edition, New York: Routledge.
  • West, D. and C. Haycroft, 1993, Male Prostitution, New York: Routledge.
  • Widdows, H., 2009, “Border Disputes across Bodies: Exploitation in Trafficking for Prostitution and Egg Sale for Stem Cell Research”, International Journal of Feminist Approaches to Bioethics, 2: 5–24.
  • Williams, L., 1989, Hard Core: Power, Pleasure, and the “Frenzy of the Visible”, Berkeley: University of California Press.

Other Internet Resources

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