Notes to Fitting Attitude Theories of Value

1. This example is borrowed from Howard 2022.

2. Moreover, assuming that different kinds of normative relations are to be individuated according to the grounds of facts involving those relations (Leary 2020), an object-focused view would entail, e.g., that the fittingness of admiration is a different kind of normative relation than the fittingness of love, insofar as facts involving each are ultimately grounded in different kinds of evaluative fact. Thus, object-focused views would need to posit not only a plurality of different kinds of fundamental evaluative facts, but also a plurality of different kinds of fittingness (or reasons), each corresponding to the specific kind of evaluative fact in terms of which they explain facts involving the relation in question. Object-focused views in this way disunify the normative relation(s) they purport to explain.

3. Moore’s view may be more complex than this. In particular, he seems to hold that what’s valuable is never a response itself, but rather a whole (an organic unity) consisting of something being responded to in a requisite way, e.g., a whole consisting of something valuable being valued. For ease of exposition, I talk of the value of responses, as opposed to that of wholes, but the reader may substitute accordingly if they wish. In any case, it’s possible to be a response-focused primitivist without being a Moorean in this regard. Thanks to an anonymous referee for prompting this clarification.

4. Not all competing explanations of the relevant normative-evaluative connections are canvassed here; see, e.g., Rowland 2022.

5. The discussion to follow draws from the discussion of the same issues in Howard 2019.

6. For further criticisms of the alethic view, see esp. Naar 2021.

7. Whether fittingness is a deontic normative relation is controversial; see, e.g., Berker 2022, which argues that fittingness is neither deontic nor evaluative but rather belongs to a third, distinctive family of normative categories—the fittingness categories.

8. That being said, certain proposed solutions to the problem, e.g., that in Elliott 2017, may work better for reasons-based FA theories than for fit-based ones (or vice versa). Thanks to Jonathan Way for this point.

9. For a novel approach to the partiality problem proposed in work that was published as the present entry was being finalized, see McHugh and Way 2022a, 2022b.

Copyright © 2023 by
Christopher Howard <chris.howard@mcgill.ca>

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