Galileo Galilei

Galileo Galilei (1564–1642) plays a central role in any history of science and many histories of philosophy. He is a—if not the—central figure of the Scientific Revolution of the seventeenth century. By middle age, his achievements in physics and astronomy, his support for the Copernican theory of the solar system, and his later condemnation by the Roman Church elevated him to heroic status even during his lifetime. His story has been continuously retold for more than 400 years. This article summarizes his contributions, focusing on some of the issues that have garnered attention from philosophers.

• 1. Introduction
• 2. Brief Biography
• 3. Galileo’s Scientific Achievement
  • 3.1 Early Work in Mechanics
  • 3.2 Astronomy
  • 3.3 Later Work in Mechanics
• 4. Galileo’s Philosophical Influence
  • 4.1 Mathematical Physics
  • 4.2 Empiricism and Rationalism
  • 4.3 Thought Experiments
  • 4.4 Primary and Secondary Qualities
• 5. Galileo and the Church
• Bibliography
  • Primary Sources: Galileo’s Works
  • Secondary Sources
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Introduction

From the seventeenth century onward, Galileo has been seen by many as the “father” of modern science. He is renowned for his discoveries: he was the first to report telescopic observations of lunar mountains, the moons of Jupiter, the phases of Venus, and the rings of Saturn. He invented an early microscope and a predecessor to the thermometer. In mathematical physics—a discipline he helped create—he calculated the law of free fall, conceived of an inertial principle, determined the parabolic trajectory of projectiles, and recognized the relativity of motion. He is sometimes described as the first “real” experimental scientist, who dropped stones from towers and ships’ masts, and played with magnets, clocks, and pendulums. Much of his cultural stature also arises from his advocacy and popularization of Copernicanism and the resulting condemnation by the Catholic Inquisition, which has made him a purported “martyr” to the cause of rationality and enlightened modernity in the subsequent history of a supposed “warfare” between science and religion. This is no small set of accomplishments for a court musician’s son who left the University of Pisa without a degree.

Momentous figures living in momentous times are full of interpretive fecundity, and Galileo has been the subject of manifold interpretations and much controversy. This multiplicity is encouraged by the fact that Galileo was an opportunistic polemicist, who often presented the most incisive argument available, whether or not it fit with overarching programmatic aims, if indeed he had any. The use of Galileo’s work and the invocations of his name make a fascinating history in their own right (Segre 1991; Palmerino and Thijssen 2004; Finocchiaro 2005; Shea and Artigas 2006; Gattei 2019), but this is not our topic. Philosophically, Galileo has been used to exemplify many different themes, usually as a personification of whatever the writer wished to make the hallmark of the Scientific Revolution or of good science—whatever was good about the new science or science in general, it was Galileo who started it. Indeed, “Galilean Science” is often used as a synonym for modern scientific method.

One tradition of Galileo scholarship has divided Galileo’s work into three or four parts: (1) his physics, (2) his astronomy, and (3) his methodology, which might include his method of Biblical interpretation and/or his thoughts about the nature of proof or demonstration. In this tradition, typical treatments deal with his physical and astronomical discoveries, their background, and/or Galileo’s predecessors. More philosophically, many ask how his mathematical practice relates to his natural philosophy. Was he a mathematical Platonist (Shea 1972; Jardine 1976; Koyré 1978), an Archimedean mathematician (Machamer 1998a; van Dyck 2006), an experimentalist (Settle 1967; Settle 1983; Settle 1992; Palmieri 2008; Büttner 2019), an Aristotelian emphasizing experience (Geymonat 1954), an heir of revised Scholastic methods of proof (Wallace 1992; Miller 2018)? Or did he have no method and just fly like an eagle in the way that geniuses do (Feyerabend 1975)? Alongside these claims there have been attempts to place Galileo in an intellectual context that brings out the background to his achievements. Some have emphasized his debt to the artisan-engineer practical tradition (Rossi 1962; Valleriani 2010; Peterson 2011), others his mathematics (Giusti 1993; Feldhay 1998; Renn et al. 2000; Palmieri 2001; Palmieri 2003; Palmerino 2016), his appeal to Scholastic mixed (or subalternate) mathematics (Machamer 1978; Lennox 1986; Wallace 1992; Dear 1995; Machamer 1998a), his debt to atomism (Shea 1972; Redondi 1983), his use of Hellenistic and Medieval impetus theory (Moody 1951; Duhem 1954; Clagett 1959; Shapere 1974), or the idea that discoveries bring new data into science (Wootton 2015).

More recent historical research has shifted foci, bringing new dimensions to our understanding of Galileo by studying his rhetoric (Finocchiaro 1980; Moss 1993; Feldhay 1998; Spranzi 2004), the power structures of his social milieu (Biagioli 1993; Biagioli 2006), his personal quest for acknowledgment (Shea and Artigas 2003), and more generally emphasizing the larger social and cultural history (Reeves 2008; Bucciantini, et al. 2015), in particular the court and papal culture in which Galileo functioned (Redondi 1983; Heilbron 2010).

Still, almost everyone working in this field seems to think the three areas—physics, astronomy, and methodology—are distinct and represent different Galilean endeavors. This entry will address Galileo’s work through three prisms that cut across, to some extent, this traditional distinction. First, we will address his investigations in physics and astronomy, showing how these form a coherent and unified project extending from his earliest work all the way to the Two New Sciences, which stands as the completion of his overall endeavor and not just the reworking of earlier research he reverted to after his trial. Particularly, we shall try to show why both of the two new sciences, especially the first on material strength, were so important—a topic not often treated (Biener 2004; Raphael 2011). Second, we will highlight some of the aspects of Galileo’s work that, though sometimes incidental to his own interests, have captured the attention of philosophical scholars. These include his methodology and mathematics, especially his attempts to fashion a new discipline of mathematical physics, but also his use of empirical evidence and thought experiments. Finally, we shall add some discussion about the interactions between Galileo and the Catholic Church relating to their views on epistemic authority.

2. Brief Biography

Galileo was born in Pisa on February 15, 1564. By the time he died on January 8, 1642 (but for problems with the date, see Machamer 1998b, 24–25), he was as famous as any person in Europe.

Galileo’s father Vincenzo, though of noble heritage, was a semi-itinerant court musician and composer of modest means, who also authored treatises on music theory; his mother, Giulia Ammannati, descended from Pisan cloth merchants. In 1572, they resettled the family in Florence. As a boy, Galileo was tutored privately and, for a time, by the Camaldolese monks at Vallombrosa, where he considered a religious vocation and may have started a novitiate. He was called home, however, and then enrolled for a medical degree at the University of Pisa in 1580. He never completed this degree, but instead studied mathematics, notably with Ostilio Ricci, a teacher attached to the Tuscan court and the Florentine Accademia del Disegno.

After leaving university, Galileo worked as a private mathematics tutor around Florence and Siena and cultivated the support of leading mathematicians. He visited Christoph Clavius, professor at the Jesuit Collegio Romano, and corresponded with the engineer Guildobaldo del Monte, Marchese of Urbino. In 1588, he applied unsuccessfully for a professorship in Bologna, but a year later, with the help of Clavius and del Monte, he was appointed lecturer in mathematics at Pisa. In 1592, he obtained, at a much higher salary, a chair of mathematics at the University of Padua, in the Venetian Republic. Galileo also supplemented his income by producing a calculating instrument of his own design (see Galilei 1606) and other devices in a household workshop staffed by hired artisans, and by private tutoring and consulting on practical mathematics and engineering. During this period, he began a relationship with Marina Gamba. A daughter, Virginia, was born in 1600. Another, Livia, was born in 1601, and a son, Vincenzo, in 1606.

In Padua, Galileo worked out much of the mechanics he would publish later in life, and which constitute his primary lasting contribution to physical science. However, these projects were interrupted in 1609, when Galileo heard about the recently invented spyglass, invented an improved telescope, and used it to make astounding celestial discoveries. He announced some of these in Sidereus nuncius (Starry Messenger), which appeared in March 1610 and launched Galileo onto the world stage. Among many others, Johannes Kepler, Imperial Mathematician at Prague, lauded the work (Kepler 1610). Clavius and his colleagues at the Collegio Romano confirmed its results and threw a celebratory banquet when Galileo visited in 1611. During the same Roman sojourn, Galileo was admitted to what was perhaps the first scientific society, the Accademia dei Lincei; he would style himself “Lincean Academician” for the rest of his life. For fascinating treatments of this period of Galileo’s life and motivations, see (Biagioli 2006; Reeves 2008; Wilding 2014).

Galileo also used the Starry Messenger to solicit patronage in his native Tuscany, naming the moons of Jupiter he had found the “Medicean” stars in honor of the ruling Medici family. His negotiations were ultimately successful, and Galileo moved back to Florence as “Chief Mathematician and Philosopher to the Grand Duke” and holder of a sinecure professorship at Pisa. His daughters moved with him and were placed in the convent of Saint Matthew at Arcetri, near Florence. Vincenzo and his mother were left behind in Venice.

Now a courtier, Galileo entered into several public debates on scientific topics. In 1612, he published a Discourse on Floating Bodies, and in 1613, Letters on Sunspots, where he first openly expressed support for Copernican heliocentrism. In 1613–14, Galileo participated in discussions of Copernicanism through his student Benedetto Castelli, and wrote a Letter to Castelli defending the doctrine from theological objections. Meanwhile, it had become known that Copernicanism was under scrutiny by Church authorities. Galileo lectured and lobbied against its condemnation, expanding his Letter to Castelli into the widely circulated Letter to the Grand Duchess Christina in 1615 and travelling to Rome late that year. Nevertheless, in March 1616, Copernicus’s On the Revolutions of the Heavenly Orbs was suspended (i.e., temporarily censored) pending correction by the Congregation of the Index of Prohibited Books. Galileo himself was called to an audience with Cardinal Robert Bellarmine, a leading theologian and member of the Roman Inquisition, and admonished not to teach or defend Copernican theory. (The details of this episode are far from straightforward, and remain disputed even today. See Shea and Artigas 2003; Fantoli 2005.)

In 1623, Galileo published The Assayer, which deals with the nature of comets and argues they are sublunary phenomena. This book includes some of Galileo’s most famous methodological pronouncements, including the claim that the book of nature is written in the language of mathematics. It also contains passages suggestive of atomism, a heretical doctrine, and the book was anonymously referred to the Inquisition, which dismissed the complaint.

Also in 1623, Maffeo Barberini, Galileo’s supporter and friend, was elected Pope Urban VIII. Galileo felt empowered to begin work on his Dialogue Concerning the Two Chief World Systems. The “two systems” are the Ptolemaic and Copernican, and the text clearly, though not explicitly, favors the latter. Printing was completed in Florence by February 1632. Shortly afterwards, the Inquisition banned its sale, and Galileo was ordered to Rome for trial. In June 1633, Galileo was convicted of “vehement suspicion of heresy,” and a sentence of imprisonment was immediately commuted to perpetual house arrest. (There is more about these events and their implications in the final section of this entry, Galileo and the Church.)

In 1634, while Galileo was confined to his villa in Arcetri, his beloved eldest daughter died (Sobel 1999). Around this time, he began work on his final book, Discourses and Mathematical Demonstrations Concerning Two New Sciences, based on the mechanics he had developed early in his career. Though it says nothing at all about cosmology, the manuscript had to be smuggled out of Italy and was published in Holland by the Elzeviers in 1638. Galileo died early in 1642, and due to his condemnation, his burial place was obscure until he was re-interred in 1737.

For detailed biographical material, the best and classic work dealing with Galileo’s scientific achievements is Stillman Drake’s Galileo at Work (1978). More recently, J. L. Heilbron has written a magnificent biography, Galileo (2010), that touches on all the multiple facets of his life.

3. Galileo’s Scientific Achievement

3.1 Early Work in Mechanics

In the study of the motions of bodies, what Galileo accomplished by the end of his life was a reasonably articulated replacement for the traditional set of analytical concepts derived from the Aristotelian tradition of natural philosophy. He offered, in place of the Aristotelian categories, a set of mechanical archetypes that were accepted by most everyone who afterwards developed the “new sciences,” and which, in some form or another, became the hallmark of the new philosophy of nature. Galileo’s central problem—the proper characterization of these archetypes in appropriate physical terms—was the launching point for the new physics of the early modern period.

Galileo’s main move was to dethrone the traditional Aristotelian physical categories used to describe matter and motion. These were the celestial element (aether, or quintessence—i.e., “fifth element”) and the four terrestrial ones (fire, air, water, and earth), along with their respective motive natures (rotation in the heavens; heaviness and lightness in the terrestrial realm). In their place, he asserted a single corporeal matter, whose properties and motions he described using the mathematics of proportional relations typified by the Archimedean simple machines—the balance, the inclined plane, and the lever—to which Galileo added the pendulum (Machamer 1998a; Machamer and Hepburn 2004; Palmieri 2008; Büttner 2019). In doing so, Galileo changed the acceptable vocabulary for talking about matter and motion, and so ushered in the mechanical tradition that characterizes much of modern science. (See Dijksterhuis 1961; Machamer, et al. 2000; Gaukroger 2006; Roux and Garber 2013.) This achievement is sometimes described in psychological terms, as an introduction of new mental models (Palmieri 2003) or a new model of intelligibility (Machamer 1994; Machamer, 1998a; Adams, et al. 2017). But it is perhaps more useful to see him as being fundamentally motivated to find a unified, quantitative theory of matter—a mathematical theory of the material stuff that constitutes the whole of the cosmos. Perhaps he did not realize that this was his grand project until he wrote the Two New Sciences in the mid-1630s, but it is evident even in his early studies from the 1590s, when his programmatic intentions were more limited.

At the outset of his career, Galileo sought merely to apply the rigorous mathematical approach he found in Archimedes to individual problems involving the spontaneous motions of bodies, especially the motion of bodies in fluid media and on inclined planes. In particular, Galileo aimed to assimilate these phenomena to the behavior of Archimedean simple machines, especially the balance, and thence to the mathematical law of the lever, affording quantitative accounts of the physical effects. At first, he showed no animosity toward Aristotelian natural philosophy, and adopted by default its physical doctrines. However, as work progressed, Galileo continually found himself at odds with fundamental Aristotelian assumptions.

Galileo began his critique of Aristotle in manuscript treatises he drafted around 1590, the later version of which has been given the title De motu (On Motion). The first part of this text deals with terrestrial matter and argues that Aristotle’s theory has it wrong. For Aristotle, the matter of the terrestrial realm possesses two formal principles that give rise to its natural motions: heaviness (gravitas; in earth and water) and lightness (levitas; in air and fire). Galileo argues that there is only one principle of motion—heaviness. Bodies move upward not because they have a natural lightness, he says, but because they are displaced or extruded by heavier bodies or media moving downward, just as in fluid media and on the balance. So on Galileo’s view, there is no lightness. Heaviness is the sole cause of all natural terrestrial motion.

This move left Galileo with a problem: what is this heaviness and how is it to be mathematically described? In reply, he reached for Archimedean models. In the context of floating bodies, heaviness is the weight of one body minus the weight of the medium. On an equal-armed balance, a body’s effective heaviness is the proportionality of the weight of an object on one arm of the balance to the weight of another body on the other arm. These models led to consideration of specific gravity—i.e., a body’s weight per unit volume—and, in the manuscript Le Meccaniche (On Mechanics, ca. 1600), the introduction of the concept of momento. Though somewhat amorphous even in Galileo’s usage, momento can be thought of as effective weight in a mechanical system; e.g., a body further from a fulcrum has greater momento than a body closer to it (Galluzzi 1979).

Galileo accepted, probably as early as the 1594 draft of Le Meccaniche, that natural motions are accelerated. Particularly in the cases of the pendulum, the inclined plane, free fall, and projectile motion, Galileo must have observed that the speeds of bodies increase as they move downwards. He also saw that the percussive blow delivered by a falling body depended on the height of its fall. Galileo sought to connect these phenomena to the accumulation of weight/momento, but could not devise an adequate account. Here, Galileo was stymied by the Aristotelian conception of motion as change of place (something that happens through time, not at a time). For many years, he thought that the correct science of these phenomena would describe how a body’s momento changes according to where it is in its trajectory. Another problem was the Archimedean simple machines he used as his conceptual models. These are not easily conceived of dynamically (but see Machamer and Woody 1994), since they generally work by establishing static equilibrium. In discussing a balance, for instance, one does not normally think about how fast an arm descends or rises (though Galileo does in his Postils to Rocco circa 1634–45; see Palmieri 2005). The converse is also true. It is difficult to model dynamic phenomena that involve rates of change as balance arms moving upwards or downwards because of differential momenti.

Sometime around 1601, however, Galileo recognized the isochrony of the pendulum—i.e., the period depends only on the length of the cord, regardless of the length of the cord. This led to the realization that time is a crucial parameter, and that a body’s momento could be characterized by when it is in its trajectory. Experiments with inclined planes then led to the discovery of the law of free fall—i.e., a body in free fall from rest traverses a distance proportional to the square of the time elapsed. At first still beholden to the Aristotelian conception of motion, Galileo attempted to express this law as a speed-distance relation, and the equivalent mean proportion. His later and correct definition of natural acceleration relating motion directly to time, without recourse to weight, was an insight gained from the recognition of the physical significance of that mean proportion as a measure of time (Machamer and Hepburn 2004; for a different analysis of Galileo’s discovery of the law of fall, see Renn et al. 2000).

Galileo’s mature law of fall also implies motion is a quantity inhering in a body at each moment—an instantaneous velocity—not as an Aristotelian displacement through time. This idea that motion is a quantity inhering in a body intersects with the medieval impetus tradition. But more significantly, it makes motion part of the characteristic state of a body, and this led to the novel and crucially important inertial concept. Aristotle had categorized all motions as either “natural”—caused by a body’s intrinsic motive nature—or “violent”—caused by extrinsic action. In the course of his early considerations of inclined planes, Galileo noted that a body in equilibrium has neither natural tendency toward nor resistance to motion. Thus, for instance, the motion of a body on a frictionless horizontal surface is neither natural nor forced (i.e., violent), but “neutral.” Developing this idea, Galileo could now propose that, in the absence of extrinsic action, motion is conserved by a body from moment to moment. Galileo eventually made this conservation principle explicit in Sunspot Letters (1613):

And therefore, with all the external impediments removed, a heavy body on the spherical surface concentric to the Earth will be indifferent to rest and to movement toward any part of the horizon, and it will remain in the state in which it has been put; that is, if it has been put in a state of rest it will remain in it, and if it has been put in motion, toward the west, for example, it will remain in the same state. (Galilei and Scheiner 2010, 125)

This became the kernel of the inertia principle fundamental to modern physics.

Notably, Galileo did not consistently associate the state of motion conserved by a body with any particular trajectory. In principle, conserved motion might be rectilinear or curvilinear, translational or rotational. At some points in his corpus, Galileo ascribes a state of rectilinear motion to moving bodies; for instance, the rectilinear tangential tendency of a stone whirled in a sling in the Dialogue. However, Galileo generally held that equilibrium is only maintained by circular rotations around an axis. E.g., strictly speaking, a horizontal surface is spherical, so the body’s conserved motion along it would be circular. This is why Galileo’s principle is sometimes described as circular inertia (Hooper 1998; Miller 2011; van Dyck 2018).

By 1609, Galileo had developed novel and successful accounts of the inclined planes, buoyancy, pendulums, and free fall. In so doing, he had ushered in a conception of terrestrial matter as uniformly heavy, inertial, and whose dynamical state is characterized by specific gravity and instantaneous velocity. He was also conducting experiments to determine the trajectory of projectiles, which combines inertial horizontal motion with vertical fall, and trying to incorporate percussive force into his analyses. Yet publication of most of these advances would have to wait until the Two New Science in 1638. Even as that book went to press, Galileo was still laboring on a “Fifth Day” (not published until 1718) about percussion. Why the long hiatus? Because during a sojourn in Venice in July 1609, Galileo heard about a recent Dutch invention, the spyglass.

3.2 Astronomy

Galileo was already acquainted with optical lenses from his household workshop, and he was able to correctly guess the basic principle of the spyglass even without handling an example. Even more remarkably, while the Dutch instruments could magnify two- or threefold, Galileo soon produced a version capable of magnifying by twenty times. By the late autumn, he was using it to record celestial observations. Galileo regarded details of the Moon’s illumination by the Sun suggesting that its surface was mountainous. He saw that nebulae are not clouds but collections of discrete stars. And, most momentously, he discovered that Jupiter is accompanied by four satellites, today called the Galilean moons. To establish his priority, and curry favor with his Florentine patrons-to-be, he rushed these novelties into print as the Starry Messenger in March 1610.

The short pamphlet’s appearance was a watershed in numerous respects. Scholastic cosmology held that, whereas the terrestrial elemental world with its diversity of natures exhibited multitudinous change, the aethereal heavens at most placidly and eternally rotated in their places. But Galileo’s telescope revealed a very Earth-like Moon, with mountains and valleys, and showed that Jupiter has moons just like the Earth’s. In both cases, the observations drew similarities between celestial objects and the Earth. Later in 1610, Galileo also observed that Venus exhibits phases, indicating that it orbits the Sun, and that Saturn’s appearance also changed (he was seeing Saturn’s rings, although he did not fully understand this). By dissolving the strict Aristotelian dichotomy between terrestrial and celestial realms, these observations all made a planetary earth more plausible, thereby supporting the Copernican hypothesis. They likewise suggested that the heavens are made of the same stuff as the Earth, and thus subject to the same, unified physics. This implied the physical characterization of terrestrial matter Galileo had been slowly developing might be extended universally.

Starry Messenger transformed Galileo into a courtier and intellectual celebrity, famed across Europe, and drew him into numerous disputes regarding the causes of buoyancy (Discourse on Floating Bodies, 1612), sunspots (Sunspot Letters, 1613), comets (The Assayer, 1623), and—most famously—Copernicanism. Galileo had privately declared his belief in heliocentrism as early as 1597 in a letter to Kepler, but he did not publicize his view until the Sunspot Letters, whereupon he became Copernicanism’s best known advocate. He was thus an important party to the Catholic Church’s scrutiny of the doctrine addressed in more detail below. In the meantime, we can sketch Galileo’s arguments for Copernicanism, culminating in his Dialogue Concerning the Two Chief World Systems (1632).

In the Sunspot Letters Galileo established that sunspots are surface features of the sun, and thus another locus of celestial mutability. Tracking the spots’ motions also showed that the sun is rotating on an axis, like the Earth in the Copernican view. Ironically, in The Assayer Galileo rejects the best pre-telescopic evidence in favor of Copernicanism—the comets, which Tycho Brahe had shown to move through the supposedly solid celestial spheres in trajectories around the Sun. But Galileo ridicules the notion that comets are celestial objects, instead insisting that they are sublunary phenomena produced by optical refraction in the atmosphere.

By the late 1620s, Galileo had resolved to produce a text defending Copernicanism, as far as was permitted by the Church’s 1616 condemnation of the doctrine. This became the Dialogue, published after extended negotiations with the censors. In the book, Galileo is not concerned with the cosmographic arrangement and parameters of the planetary orbits, as Copernicus himself had been. Rather, his focus is on the physical possibility of the Earth’s motion. While never openly avowing the geokinetic view, the book marshals many arguments in its favor. (For a detailed overview of the Dialogue, see Finocchiaro 2014.)

In the first two Days of the Dialogue, Galileo argues negatively, aiming to show that available evidence, especially its apparent stability, does not decide between a moving or stationary Earth. That is, “… all experiments [tutte l’esperienze] practicable upon the earth are insufficient measures for proving its mobility, since they are indifferently adaptable to an earth in motion or at rest” (Galilei 1967, 6). Here, Galileo’s earlier physics comes to the fore, and his arguments already depend on the thesis that all matter moves according to the same physical principles. On the basis of his inertial principle, he holds that all terrestrial bodies conserve the Earth’s rotation, even when disconnected from its surface. Since we cannot observe shared motion—the principle of Galilean Relativity—experiments will not disclose it. For instance, a cannonball dropped from the top of a tower will fall at its foot whether the earth is moving or not, since the ball continues moving eastward along with the tower even after it is released.

Having thus deflected arguments against the Copernican system, Galileo then argues positively in its favor. In Day Three of the Dialogue, Galileo’s avatar Salviati has Simplicio, the ever-astounded Aristotelian, make use of astronomical observations, especially the facts that Venus has phases and that Venus and Mercury are never far from the sun, to construct a diagram of the planetary orbits. The resulting diagram neatly corresponds to the Copernican solar system. Then in Day Four, Galileo offers a putative proof of Copernican theory on the basis of the tides. He argues that the combination of the Earth’s diurnal rotation and its annual revolution around the sun can account for the flux and reflux of the seas. At a spot on the Earth’s surface, the directions of the two motions are aligned in the daytime and contrary at night. Thus, in the frame of the fixed stars, the surface slightly accelerates and decelerates over the course of a day, causing the seas to slosh back and forth in their basins. Monthly and annual variations of the tidal cycle can likewise be attributed to features of the Earth’s orbit that affect the alignment of the two motions. As Galileo acknowledges, however, this “primary” variation can only account for one tidal cycle per day, whereas two are actually observed. To account for this “secondary” effect, Galileo suggests that the impetus acquired by an ebbing sea will carry it past equilibrium until it rises against the opposite shore, like the bob of a pendulum, giving rise to the second tide. More local differences in tidal flows, meanwhile, are due to the physical conformations of the basins in which they occur (for background and more detail, see Palmieri 1998).

Galileo’s tidal argument has always been skeptically received, even by his contemporaries (Aiton 1954; Naylor 2007; Palmieri 1998). The main trouble is that it poorly aligns with observations. For one thing, the timing of tides moves around the clock from day to day; they are not anchored to noon and midnight as Galileo’s theory implies. Galileo also ignores completely the apparent correlation between the tides and the location of the moon. This had already led Kepler and others to hypothesize they were due to the moon’s influence, an idea Galileo dismisses out of hand as occult nonsense. And even if one were to grant Galileo’s argument, it would only establish the Earth’s motion, not the central position of the Sun or arrangement of the planets around it as proposed by Copernicus. So, at best, Galileo’s argument is an inference to the best partial explanation from a limited set of features of Copernicus’s theory. Meanwhile, there were compelling considerations about the size of celestial bodies that weighed against the Copernican cosmology, stemming from a lack of understanding of the telescope’s optics (Graney 2015). Ultimately, Galileo’s reliance on the tides to make his case for Copernicanism is a mistake to modern eyes, but it is still further evidence of Galileo’s consolidating conception of a universal matter, subject only to mechanical causes acting by contact.

3.3 Later Work in Mechanics

The publication of the Dialogue triggered the climax of Galileo’s confrontation with the Church and his condemnation to house arrest. Henceforth, Galileo could not safely comment on astronomical matters, and he returned to his earlier work on mechanics, leading to the Two New Sciences in 1638.

Galileo’s second new science, in Days Three and Four of the Two New Sciences, has been much commented upon in the literature. This is where Galileo finally publishes his mathematical description of local motion and the laws governing it, thereby completing the departure from Aristotelian categories he had developed over the previous decades. This is now the motion of all matter, not just sublunary stuff, and the treatment takes the categories of time and acceleration and the principle of inertia as basic. The First Day contains Galileo’s account of the acceleration of falling bodies, leading to the enunciation of his law of free fall (Palmerino 2010). And, in the Second Day, he combines vertical motion subject to the law with inertial horizontal motion to demonstrate the parabolic trajectory of projectiles, thereby solving an important outstanding problem in practical mathematics. Incidentally, this would open the way towards analyzing motions as vector quantities (Miller 2017).

Galileo’s first new science, discussed in the first two Days, has been misunderstood and infrequently discussed. It has misleadingly been called the science of the strength of materials, and so seems to have been placed in the history of engineering. However, this science is not about the strength of materials per se. It is Galileo’s attempt to provide a mathematical science of his unified matter (see Machamer 1998a; Biener 2004; Machamer and Hepburn 2004). Galileo realizes that, before he can work out a science of the motion of matter, he must have some way of showing that the nature of matter still may be mathematically characterized. That is, he needs to reconcile mathematical descriptions with the physical constitution of material bodies.

So it is in Day One that Galileo begins to discuss how to describe mathematically (or geometrically) the causes of the breaking of beams as a way of characterizing the internal, microphysical properties of macroscopic objects. In this vein, Galileo rejects using finite atoms as a basis for physical discussion, since they are not representable by continuously divisible mathematical magnitudes. Instead, he treats matter as composed of infinitely many indivisible—which is to say, mathematical—points. This allows him to give mathematical accounts for various properties of matter. Among these are the density of matter, its coherence in material bodies, and the properties of the resisting media in which bodies move. The Second Day lays out the mathematical principles concerning how bodies break. Galileo does all this by reducing the problems of matter to problems of how a lever and a balance function, which renders them mathematically tractable via the law of the lever. He had begun this back in 1590, though this time he believes he is getting it right, showing mathematically how bits of matter solidify and stick together, and how they break into bits.

The sketch above provides the basis for understanding Galileo’s career. He offered a new science of matter, a new physical cosmography, and a new science of local motion. In all these, he used a mathematical mode of description based upon, though somewhat changed from, the proportional geometry of Book VI of Euclid’s Elements and of Archimedes (for details on the changes, see Palmieri 2001). In this way, Galileo developed the categories of the mechanical new science, the science of matter and motion. Throughout, he was working out the details of the nature of matter so that it could be understood as uniform and universal, and treated in a way that allowed for coherent discussion of the principles of motion. It was due to Galileo that a unified matter became accepted and its nature became one of the problems for the science and philosophy that followed, especially in the so-called Mechanical Philosophy that dominated the next century. After him, matter really mattered.

4. Galileo’s Philosophical Influence

4.1 Mathematical Physics

As the title of his last book suggests, even Galileo took himself to be doing something novel. Wherein lies the novelty, though, is hard to pin down, especially given Galileo’s prioritization of rhetorical effect over ideological principle. As noted above, this has made for interpretive fecundity, but it also entails that Galileo’s appraisal has mainly been in the eye of the beholder. Nevertheless, Galileo was instrumental in the creation of a new field of inquiry—that of mathematical physics, wherein mathematical calculations are taken to be informative about the causal structure of the natural world.

At the start of his working career, Galileo inhabited the social role of mathematicus, someone skilled at computation hired to execute calculations necessary for other, mostly artisanal, professions (Biagioli 1989; Garber 2010; van Dyck 2021), including astrology and engineering. Historically, the mathematicus had been starkly distinct, both socially and disciplinarily, from the university professors of philosophy who explained the causal principles by which the natural world operates. In the sixteenth century, university chairs, like those Galileo held at Pisa and Padua, were created to answer the need for mathematical instruction among the upper classes, especially future military officers after the advent of gunpowder artillery. When Galileo was young, this social elevation of mathematici occasioned a debate—the so-called Quaestio de certitudine mathematicarum—about the status of mathematics vis à vis natural science. In particular, its participants debated whether mathematics could generate understanding of the natural world. Aristotelians and Platonists alike enforced the old distinction, the former because they held mathematical categories to be merely accidental to physically causal essences; the latter because the natural world cannot instantiate mathematical perfection. But the debate eventually eroded the disciplinary boundary between mathematics and philosophy. Some participants held that the rational necessity of mathematics entails causal necessity in nature, such that the physical world itself obeys mathematical laws and, conversely, mathematics is explanatory, thereby legitimating the application of mathematics to natural philosophy. Recent scholars have pointed to the novel syncretic positions arising in the Quaestio de certitudine as an important context of Galileo’s thought (Giacobbe 1981; Mancosu 1996; Feldhay 1998; Miller 2021).

Galileo exploited the weakness in the social and disciplinary bounds. The persona Galileo launched into public discourse with Starry Messenger was a novel hybrid that blended traditional roles and disciplines. As his title pages henceforth proclaimed, he was simultaneously mathematician and philosopher—as both mathematicus and professor—licensed to draw conclusions about fundamental natures from mathematical demonstrations. He takes it as a matter of course that mathematics is informative about the natural world. This is the upshot of his famous pronouncement in The Assayer:

Philosophy is written in this grand book—I mean the Universe—which stands continually open to our gaze, but it cannot be understood unless one first learns to comprehend the language and interpret the characters in which it is written. It is written in the language of mathematics, and its characters are triangles, circles, and other geometrical figures, without which it is humanly impossible to understand a single word of it; without these, one is wandering around in a dark labyrinth. (Galileo et al. 1960, 184)

That is, nature is essentially subject to mathematical characterization and can only be fully understood with the aid mathematical reasoning.

While a narrative account of Galileo’s evolving thought is offered above, it is nevertheless true that he never offered much in the way of programmatic consideration or justification of his methodology. This has engendered disagreement among scholars trying to discern his methodological commitments and various interpretations of the passage above. Much of the debate has been colored by Koyré’s (1978) placement of Galileo among the Platonists, against which scholars have argued in subsequent decades. (Palmerino 2016 gives an overview; see also the sources cited in the Introduction of this entry.) Whatever his motivations, Galileo’s amalgamation of physics and mathematics has been seen to stand athwart tradition by critics and supporters alike, both in his time and now.

4.2 Empiricism and Rationalism

Empiricism is another central feature of modern science often attributed to Galilean roots. But one must be careful not to exaggerate this empirical turn or Galileo’s role in it. For one thing, it is not correct to say pre-Galilean natural philosophy was not empirical. Even in Aristotelian science, observations help establish knowledge of the natural world, via natural history for instance. For another thing, Galileo certainly was not the only one contributing to the shift. At the very least, one must also look to Johannes Kepler and Francis Bacon, who were working at the same time. Still, Galileo’s lifetime was a period in which the epistemic value of observation markedly increased, such that methods of inquiry that came afterward are recognizably different from what came before.

The key epistemological issue in this context was the relationship between the universal propositions of natural philosophical theorizing and the particular instances of empirical research. On the traditional view, natural philosophy concerned what was true in general, “always or for the most part” as Aristotle put it (Physics II.8), and one could not learn anything from particulars (Posterior Analytics I.31). Consequently, natural philosophy started with what was known generally to be the case, often as abstracted and handed down in some authoritative text, whereas particular observations, even in aggregate, could neither support nor refute theoretical generalizations. Speculating about nature ex cathedra was not only possible, but in some respects the preferred method.

Galileo, by contrast, was contemptuous of the natural philosopher who learns only from books. Referring to his opponent in the Assayer, he wrote, “… Sarsi says he does not want to be one to give affront to wise men by contradicting what they say and refusing to believe them, I say that I do not want to be among those ignoramuses and ingrates toward nature and toward God who, being given senses and reason, should wish to defer such great gifts to the mistakes of one man” (Galilei et al. 1960, 301–2). Galileo clearly enjoyed going from the armchair to the workbench. He devised and constructed apparatuses to try out ideas, such as armored lodestones, inclined planes, and pendulums. His construction of a telescope on the basis of a mere verbal report is another example. Importantly, Galileo was remarkably careful to validate his instruments and diligently record detailed measurements, quantifying where he could (Brown 1985; Hamou 2021). His descriptions of the moon and Jovian satellites in Starry Messenger and of the sunspots in the Letters were early paragons of observational practice. They, and especially their accompanying engravings, also had an important popularizing effect, insofar as readers sought to make their own observations. Indeed, several of Galileo’s acolytes were inspired to found the short-lived Accademia del Cimento in 1657 for the purpose of carrying out experiments. (See Reeves 2008; Miller 2013.)

While experimentation certainly helped Galileo arrive at his theoretical views, observational evidence plays a more circumscribed role in his published justifications of them. Again, Galileo is more interested in rhetorical effect than methodological consistency, so it is difficult to generalize about his method, even if his publications are filled with described experiences, real and imagined. That said, Galileo’s use of such empirical evidence is predominantly post hoc. He presents particular observations to confirm or reject theoretical proposals derived from rational considerations, not as inductive support for a theory. (Day 3 of the Dialogue is a notable exception.) As one can see in the narrative of his scientific work above, his aim was to develop the proper (quantitative) categories and principles by which one could construct rational, ideally mathematical accounts of phenomena (van Dyck 2005). Only then would empirical observations come into play. On the one hand, this means that theories are answerable to particular cases. Observations have probative value, such that “one single experiment” might “suffice to overthrow” a principle (Galileo et al. 1960, 122). On the other hand, the justifications of his principles ultimately rest on a priori grounds. Intelligibility is more important than adequacy.

There are many places in Galileo’s work where he appeals to actual observations to reject hypotheses. For example, he refutes alternative explanations of the moon’s secondary light (i.e., earthshine) in the Starry Messenger and of suspots in the Sunspot Letters by comparing their predictions to what is observed. But he also thinks that empirical confirmations can be dispensed with. There is an emblematic example in the Dialogue. Responding to the anti-Copernican objection that a stone dropped from a tower would land to the west, left behind by the Earth’s eastward rotation, Galileo analogizes the situation to dropping a stone from the mast of a uniformly moving ship, and holds that the stone will conserve the “neutral” horizontal motion imparted by either ship or Earth before the drop and fall at the base of the mast or tower. Thus, “the experiment” on the ship or on the earth is inconclusive about the motion of either. But when one of the characters in the Dialogue asks whether Salviati has “made a hundred tests, or even one,” the response is:

Without experiment, I am sure that the effect will happen as I tell you, because it must happen that way …. (Galilei 1967, 145)

Galileo is so confident that this account makes sense of the phenomenon, experimental confirmation is superfluous. In sum, an adverse result would refute the view, but such an experimental failure is unintelligible.

Galileo’s ambivalence towards empirical evidence led some commentators to think his method was entirely a priori (Koyré 1966). Subsequent studies of Galileo’s manuscripts showing his careful experimental practice have cast doubt on this view (Drake 1978; Drake 1990; Settle 1967; Settle 1983; Settle 1992; Palmieri 2008; Büttner 2019). Other scholars have pointed to artisanal practices as a source of Galileo’s empirical method (Renn 2005; Valleriani 2010; Peterson 2011), or to the influence of contemporary responses to Aristotle, particularly the method of regressus (Randall 1940; Wallace 1984; Wallace 1992; Miller 2018; but see Jardine 1976).

Note that mathematical and empirical science is only possible if one can reconcile the precision of calculations with the variability observed in nature. For example, if the outcome does not exactly match what is predicted, does that vitiate the theory? The reconciliation necessitates an error theory that attributes deviations from mathematical exactitude to “impediments,” like friction or air resistance, that can be set aside in the empirical evaluation of a mathematical theory. Galileo establishes such a method to defend his mathematical conception of nature:

Just as the computer who wants his calculations to deal with sugar, silk, and wool must discount the boxes, bales, and other packings, so the mathematical scientist (filosofo geometra), when he wants to recognize in the concrete the effects which he has proved in the abstract, must deduct the material hinderances, and if he is able to do so, I assure you that things are in no less agreement than arithmetical computations. The errors, then, lie not in the abstractness or concreteness, not in geometry or physics, but in a calculator who does not know how to make a true accounting. (Galilei 1967, 207–8)

Nature really is as the mathematical principles have it. Any discrepancy is the fault of “hinderances,” not the theory itself. Conversely, a theoretical value is measured by controlling for and ignoring the effect of perturbations in one or more observations. As the quote above suggests, the idea perhaps derives from practical mathematics or from observational astronomy, but Galileo is one of the first to avow a version of this sine qua non of modern scientific method. (See Koertge 1977; Bertoloni Meli 2004.)

4.3 Thought Experiments

Galileo’s appeals to observational evidence in his published work typically serve to establish or demolish the intelligibility of explanatory principles, descriptive categories, and so on. To this end, it does not especially matter whether an experiment is carried out in concrete experience or in the realm of imagination. One can “see” what will happen either way, and the argumentative effect is the same. Accordingly, Galileo’s texts are full of illustrative scenarios he does not pretend to have carried out.

This feature of his rhetoric has made Galileo a locus classicus in contemporary discussions of thought experiments. In particular, the treatment of falling bodies in the First Day of the Dialogue has been subjected to much analysis. Here, Galileo uses a thought experiment to refute the Aristotelian theory of fall, according to which the speed of a body’s fall is proportional to its weight. Galileo supposes that two bodies, one heavier than the other, are suddenly conjoined in the midst of falling. On the one hand, according to the Aristotelian doctrine, the faster fall of the heavier body should be retarded by the slower motion of the lighter body, so that the conjoined body will fall slower than the original heavy body. And yet, the conjoined body is heavier than either original body, so it should also fall faster. This “short and conclusive” argument is meant to persuade the reader that there is an incoherence in the Aristotelian account of motion.

While much ink has been spilled about how this argument and others are supposed to work (Gendler 1998; Norton and Roberts 2012; Brown and Fehige 2023), it must be noted that much of this literature takes Galileo’s work out of its historical context, equating his method with modern approaches and discounting the peculiar sensitivities of his seventeenth-century audience. More historically sensitive scholars have pointed out the wide variety of functions thought experiments play in Galileo’s work (Palmieri 2005; Palmerino 2011; Camilleri 2015; Palmerino 2018; van Dyck 2005). In sum, Galileo did not hold a unified doctrine of thought experimentation, if he would have recognized the category at all. He never intended his thought experiments to be read in any uniform way. They are deployed to suit the dialectical needs of the moment.

4.4 Primary and Secondary Qualities

There is another feature of Galileo’s writing that has caught the retrospective attention of modern scholars, even if it was incidental to his own program: a distinction between primary and secondary qualities. We find this in a passage of the Assayer addressing the nature of heat, where Galileo denies that it is “a real attribute, property, and quality which actually resides in the material by which we feel ourselves warmed” (Galilei et al. 1960, 309). He goes on to argue that there are certain qualities that are inextricable from the concept of a corporeal body, while others seem to inhere in the “sensorium” of a sentient creature:

Therefore I say that upon conceiving of a material or corporeal substance, I immediately feel the need to conceive simultaneously that it is bounded and has this or that shape; that it is in this place or that at any given time; that it moves or stays still; that it does or does no touch another body; and that it is one, few, or many. I cannot separate it from these conditions by any stretch of my imagination. But that it must be white or red, bitter or sweet, noisy or silent, of sweet or foul odor, my mind feels no compulsion to understand as necessary accompaniments. Indeed, without the senses to guide us, reason or imagination alone would perhaps never arrive at such qualities. For that reason I think that tastes, odors, colors, and so forth are not more than mere names so far as pertains to the subject wherein they reside, and that they have their habitude only in the sensorium. Thus, if the living creature (l’animale) were removed, all these qualities would be removed and annihilated. (Galilei et al. 1960, 309)

Corporeal bodies must have shape, location, a state of motion or rest, contact or separation from other bodies, and number, since we cannot conceive of a body without these features. But other sensory qualities are not intrinsic to the conception of body itself. We suppose that they arise only when bodies interact with the senses. For instance:

Those materials which produce heat in us and make us feel warmth, which we call by the general name fire, would be a multitude of minute particles having certain shapes and moving with certain velocities. Meeting with our bodies, they penetrate by means of their consummate subtlety, and their touch which we feel, made in their passage through our substance, is the sensation which we call heat. (Galilei et al. 1960, 312)

Material fire, that is, is not hot. It merely consists of bodies of such shapes and motions that cause a sensory experience of heat when they impinge upon a body.

Galileo’s position here aligns with his reconceptualization of physical substance as essentially subject to mathematical description. His primary qualities are the properties of mathematical volumes in geometric space (as Descartes would later emphasize). At the same time, Galileo is rejecting the standard Aristotelian account of sensory qualities, which holds that they somehow inhere in the natures of substances, and the relegation of quantification to the status of mere accidents. But it should be noted that the passage is out of character for Galileo, who is generally skeptical about our ability to discern ultimate constitutions. More typical is a passage from the Sunspot Letters where Galileo insists “I consider investigating the essence of the nearest elementary substances an undertaking no less impossible and a labor no less in vain than that of the most remote and celestial ones. … And likewise I do not understand any more of the true essence of Earth or of fire than I do that of the Moon or of the Sun” (Galilei and Scheiner 2010, 254). Indeed, as noted, Galileo’s epistemology emphasizes the intelligible explanation of observed phenomena. To achieve this end, he usually eschews speculation about essences as unnecessary and irrelevant. Nevertheless, the passage above is generally recognized as the first clear argument for the primary and secondary quality distinction (Bolton 2025).

5. Galileo and the Church

No account of Galileo’s importance to philosophy can be complete if it does not discuss the Galileo Affair—the sequence of interactions with the Church that resulted in Galileo’s condemnation. The end of the affair is simply stated. In late 1632, in the aftermath of the publication of the Dialogue Concerning the Two Chief World Systems, Galileo was ordered to appear in Rome to be examined by the Congregation of the Holy Office; i.e., the Inquisition. In January 1633, a very ill Galileo made an arduous journey to Rome. From April, Galileo was called four times to hearings; the last was on June 21. The next day, June 22, 1633, Galileo was taken to the church of Santa Maria sopra Minerva, and ordered to kneel while his condemnation was read. He was declared guilty of “vehement suspicion of heresy,” and made to recite and sign a formal abjuration:

I have been judged vehemently suspect of heresy, that is, of having held and believed that the sun in the center of the universe and immoveable, and that the Earth is not at the center of same, and that it does move. Wishing however, to remove from the minds of your Eminences and all faithful Christians this vehement suspicion reasonably conceived against me, I abjure with a sincere heart and unfeigned faith, I curse and detest the said errors and heresies, and generally all and every error, heresy, and sect contrary to the Holy Catholic Church. (Shea and Artigas 2003, 194)

Galileo was sentenced to “formal imprisonment at the pleasure of the Inquisition,” but this was commuted to house arrest, first in the residence of the Archbishop of Siena, and then, from December 1633, at his villa in Arcetri, under which condition he lived out his days.

The details and interpretations of these proceedings have long been debated. One point of controversy is the legitimacy of the charges against Galileo, both in terms of their content and the judicial procedure. Galileo was charged with teaching and defending the Copernican doctrine that holds the sun is at the center of the universe and the Earth moves. The status of this doctrine was cloudy. In 1616, an internal commission of the Inquisition had determined that it was heretical, but this was not publicly proclaimed. Instead, Copernicus’s book had been placed on the Index of Prohibited Books as “suspended until corrected.” Even more confusingly, the corrections had duly appeared in 1620, so the suspension was nominally rescinded, but the book nevertheless remained on the Index until 1835. In fact, the Church’s first public pronouncement that Copernicanism is a heresy appears in Galileo’s condemnation.

Galileo’s own status was also problematic. In 1616, at the same time that the Inquisition was evaluating Copernicanism, they were also investigating Galileo personally—a separate proceeding of which Galileo himself was not likely aware. The outcome was Cardinal Bellarmine’s admonition not to “defend or hold” the Copernican doctrine. This “charitable admonition” may (or may not) have been followed by a “formal injunction” “not to hold, teach, or defend it in any way whatever, either orally or in writing.” When the records of this disposition of the 1616 case were discovered in 1633, it made Galileo appear guilty of recidivism, having violated the Inquisition’s injunction by publishing the Dialogue. It has even been argued (Redondi 1983), that the charge of Copernicanism was the effect of a plea bargain meant to cover up Galileo’s genuinely heretical atomism, though this latter hypothesis has not found much support.

To confound issues further, the case against Galileo transpired in a fraught political context. Galileo was a creature of the powerful Medici and a personal friend of Pope Urban VIII, connections that significantly modulated developments (Biagioli 1993). There were also pressures stemming from the Counter Reformation, the Thirty Years War, and resulting tensions within Urban’s papacy (McMullin 2005; Miller 2008; McMullin 2009; Finocchiaro 2019).

Historical context aside, the legitimacy of the underlying condemnation of Copernicus on theological and rational grounds has been a focus of philosophical concern. Galileo had addressed this problem in 1615, when he wrote his Letter to Castelli and then the Letter to the Grand Duchess Christina. In these texts, Galileo argues that there are two truths: one derived from Scripture, the other from the created natural world. Since both are expressions of the divine Will, they cannot contradict one another. However, Scripture and Creation both require interpretation in order to glean the truths they contain—Scripture because it is a historical document written for common people, and thus accommodated to their understanding so as to lead them towards true religion; Creation because the divine act must be distilled from sense experience through scientific enquiry. While the truths are necessarily compatible, biblical and natural interpretations can go awry, and are subject to correction. Much philosophical controversy, before and after Galileo’s time, revolves around this doctrine of the two truths and their seeming incompatibility.

Bellarmine viewed Scripture as divinely inspired, of course, so its literal interpretation must be maintained, even against scientific inquiry, lest the Holy Spirit be accused of error. Since the stability of the Earth is expressly in the several scriptural passages, one should not assert its motion, except as a mere hypothesis. Bellarmine was willing to accommodate Scriptural interpretation to scientific truth if the latter could be proven or demonstrated (McMullin 1998). But for Bellarmine, working in the Scholastic paradigm, scientific proof was derived from causal principles known generally to be true. To impugn the literal interpretation, a natural proposition had to achieve the status of an established universal principle. Moreover, Bellarmine thought that the planetary theories of Ptolemy and Copernicus (and presumably Tycho Brahe) were merely mathematical conceits. They could predict planetary positions, but they could not indicate the physical structure of the solar system and were therefore not even susceptible to scientific proof. This instrumentalist, anti-realist position (Machamer 1976; Duhem 1985) went hand-in-hand with the traditional distinction between mathematical and philosophical disciplines. In the traditional hierarchy, physics could constrain what models were really possible, but not so the other way around. Galileo, by contrast, held that the planetary models corresponded to physical realities. Empirical confirmations of the Copernican model, and refutations of the Ptolemaic, therefore had implications for their truth. Such proofs determined which causal principles God could have realized, and thus which interpretations of Scripture were legitimate. Consequently, inquiry into nature should be left independent of Scriptural interpretation, lest the faithful fall into dogmatic error.

It did not help Galileo’s case, though, that the proof he offered was not very convincing. This was his flawed argument concerning the cause of the tides, contained in On the Ebb and Flow of the Tides, a manuscript he composed and circulated in 1616 while Copernicanism was under the Inquisition’s scrutiny, and the main thrust of which reappears in Day Four of the Dialogue (see above for details). While one can see why Galileo thinks he has some sort of proof for the motion of the Earth, and therefore for Copernicanism, it is equally clear why Bellarmine and others thought it did not rise to the level of established principle.

Nevertheless, when the tidal argument was compounded with his earlier telescopic observations showing the improbabilities of the older celestial picture—the mountainous Moon, Jupiter’s satellites, the phases of Venus, and so on—and the neutralization of physical arguments against a moving Earth—via the principles of inertia and relativity—it was enough for Galileo to believe that he could convince his opponents. Unfortunately, people were not ready for such proofs until after Galileo’s death and the widespread acceptance of a unified material cosmology, utilizing the characterization of matter and motion elaborated in his corpus. But this could occur only after Galileo had changed the acceptable parameters for gaining knowledge and theorizing about the world.

To read many of the documents of Galileo’s trial, see Finocchiaro 1989; Mayer 2012. To understand the long, tortuous, and fascinating aftermath of the Galileo affair see Finocchiaro 2005. And for Pope John Paul II’s 1992 rehabilitation of Galileo, see Coyne 2005.

Bibliography

Primary Sources: Galileo’s Works

The main body of Galileo’s work is collected in:

• Favaro, Antonio (ed.), 1890–1909, Le Opere di Galileo Galilei, Edizione Nazionale, 20 vols., Florence: Barbera; reprinted 1929–1939 and 1964–1966. [available online]

English translations:

• 1586, The Little Balance (La Bilancetta)
  • Fermi, Laura, and Bernardini, Gilberto (trans.) in Fermi, Laura, and Bernardini, Gilberto, 1961, Galileo and the Scientific Revolution, New York: Basic Books; reprinted 1965, New York: Fawcett; and 2003 and 2013, Mineola, NY: Dover.
• ca. 1590, On Motion (De motu)
  • Drabkin, I. E. (trans.) in Galilei, Galileo, 1960, On Motion and On Mechanics, Madison: University of Wisconsin Press.
  • Fredette, Raymond (trans.), 2000, De Motu Antiquiora, Berlin: Max Planck Institute for the History of Science. [available online]
• ca. 1600, On Mechanics (Le Meccaniche)
  • Drake, Stillman (trans.) in Galilei, Galileo, 1960, On Motion and On Mechanics, Madison: University of Wisconsin Press.
• 1606, Operations of the Geometric and Military Compass (Le Operazioni del Compasso Geometrico e Militare, Padua: Pietro Marinelli.)
  • Drake, Stillman (trans.), 1978, Operations of the Geometric and Military Compass, Washington, D.C.: Smithsonian Institution.
• 1610, The Starry Messenger (Sidereus nuncius, Venice: Thomas Baglioni.)
  • Van Helden, Albert (trans.), 1989, Sidereus Nuncius, or The Sidereal Messenger, Chicago: University of Chicago Press; 2nd edition, 2016; reprinted, with facsimile of Library of Congress’s first edition and expository essays, in De Simone, Daniel, and John W. Hessler (eds.), 2013, The Starry Messenger: From Doubt to Astonishment, Washington, D.C.: Library of Congress/Levenger Press.
  • Barker, Peter (trans.), 2004, Sidereus Nuncius, Oklahoma City: Byzantium Press.
  • Shea, William R. (trans.), 2009, Galileo’s Sidereus Nuncius, or A Sidereal Message, Sagamore Beach, MA: Science History Publications; 2nd revised printing, 2012.
• 1612, Discourse on Floating Bodies (Discorso intorno alle Cose che Stanno in su l’Acqua, Florence: Cosimo Giunti.)
  • Drake, Stillman (trans.) in Drake, Stillman, 1984, Cause, Experiment, and Science, Chicago: Chicago University Press.
• 1613, Letters on the Sunspots (Istoria e Dimostrazioni intorno alle Macchie Solari, Rome: Giacomo Mascardi.)
  • Reeves, Eileen, and Van Helden, Albert (trans.) in Galilei, Galileo, and Scheiner, Christoph 2010, On Sunspots, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• 1623, The Assayer (Il Saggiatore, Rome: Giacomo Mascardi.)
  • Drake, Stillman (trans.), in Galilei, Galileo, Grassi, Horatio, Guiducci, Mario, and Kepler, Johannes, 1960, The Controversy on the Comets of 1618, Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press.
• 1632, Dialogue Concerning the Two Chief World Systems (Dialogo sopra i Due Massimi Sistemi del Mondo, Florence: Giovanni Batista Landini.)
  • Drake, Stillman (trans.), 1967, Dialogue Concerning the Two Chief World Systems, Berkeley: University of California Press; reprinted 2001, New York: The Modern Library.
  • Davie, Mark (trans.), Shea, William R. (ed.), 2022, Dialogue on the two Greatest World Systems, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• 1638, Discourses and Mathematical Demonstrations Concerning Two New Sciences (Discorsi e Dimostrazioni Matematiche intorno a Due Nuove Scienze, Leiden: Elsevier.)
  • Crew, Henry, and de Salvio, Alfonso (trans.), 1954, Dialogues Concerning Two New Sciences, New York: Dover Publications. This inferior translation, first published in 1914, has been reprinted numerous times and is widely available.
  • Drake, Stillman (trans.), 1974, Two New Sciences, Madison: University of Wisconsin Press; 2nd edition, 1989, reprinted 2000, Toronto: Wall and Emerson.

Collections of primary sources in English:

• Drake, Stillman (ed.), 1957, The Discoveries and Opinions of Galileo, New York: Anchor Books.
• Finocchiaro, Maurice A. (ed.), 1989, The Galileo Affair: A Documentary History, Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Finocchiaro, Maurice A. (ed.), 2008, The Essential Galileo, Indianapolis: Hackett.
• Shea, William R., and Davie, Mark (ed.), 2012, Galileo: Selected Writings, Oxford: Oxford University Press.

Secondary Sources

• Adams, Marcus P., Zvi Biener, Uljana Feest, and Jacqueline A. Sullivan (eds.), 2017, Eppur si Muove: Doing History and Philosophy of Science with Peter Machamer, Dordrecht: Springer.
• Aiton, E. J., 1954, “Galileo’s Theory of the Tides.” Annals of Science, 10 (1): 44–57.
• Bertoloni Meli, Domenico, 2004, “The Role of Numerical Tables in Galileo and Mersenne,” Perspectives on Science, 12 (2):164–190.
• Biagioli, Mario, 1989, “The Social Status of Italian Mathematicians, 1450–1600.” History of Science, 27: 41–94.
• –––, 1990, “Galileo’s System of Patronage,” History of Science, 28 (1): 1–62.
• –––, 1993, Galileo, Courtier: The Practice of Science in the Culture of Absolutism, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• –––, 2006, Galileo’s Instruments of Credit: Telescopes, Images, Secrecy, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Biener, Zvi, 2004, “Galileo’s First New Science: The Science of Matter,” Perspectives on Science, 12 (3): 262–287.
• Bolton, Martha, 2025, “Primary and Secondary Qualities in Early Modern Philosophy,” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Winter 2025 Edition), E. N. Zalta and U. Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/win2025/entries/qualities-prim-sec/>.
• Brown, Harold I., 1985, “Galileo on the Telescope and the Eye.” Journal of the History of Ideas, 46 (4): 487–501.
• Brown, James Robert, and Yiftach Fehige, 2023, “Thought Experiments,” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Winter 2023 Edition), E. N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/win2023/entries/thought-experiment/>.
• Bucciantini, Massimo, Michele Camerota, and Franco Giudice, 2015, Galileo’s Telescope: A European Story, C. Bolton (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
• Büttner, Jochen, 2019, Swinging and Rolling: Unveiling Galileo’s Unorthodox Path from a Challenging Problem to a New Science, Dordrecht: Springer.
• Camilleri, Kristian, 2015, “Knowing What Would Happen: The Epistemic Strategies in Galileo’s Thought Experiments,” Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science, 54: 102–112.
• Carugo, Adriano, and Alistair C. Crombie, 1983, “The Jesuits and Galileo’s Ideas of Science and Nature,” Annali dell’Istituto e Museo di Storia della Scienza di Firenze, 8 (2): 3–68.
• Clagett, Marshall, 1959, The Science of Mechanics in the Middle Ages, Madison: University of Wisconsin Press.
• Coyne, George V., 2005, “The Church’s Most Recent Attempt to Dispel the Galileo Myth,” in E. McMullin (ed.), The Church and Galileo, Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press, pp. 340–359.
• Crombie, Alistair C., 1975, “Sources of Galileo’s Early Natural Philosophy,” in M. L. R. Bonelli and W. R. Shea (eds.), Reason, Experiment, and Mysticism in the Scientific Revolution, New York: Science History Publications, pp. 157–175.
• Dear, Peter, 1995, Discipline and Experience: The Mathematical Way in the Scientific Revolution, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Dijksterhuis, E. J., 1961, The Mechanization of the World Picture, C. Dikshoorn (trans.), Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Drake, Stillman, 1976, Galileo Against the Philosophers, Los Angeles: Zeitlin & Ver Brugge.
• –––, 1978, Galileo at Work, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• –––, 1999, Essays on Galileo and the History and Philosophy of Science, N. M. Swerdlow and T. H. Levere (eds.), 3 vols, Toronto: University of Toronto Press.
• Duhem, Pierre, 1954, Le Systeme du monde, 6 vols, Paris: Hermann.
• –––, 1985, To Save the Phenomena: An Essay on the Idea of Physical Theory from Plato to Galileo, A. Roger (trans.), Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
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• Galileo Galilei’s Notes on Motion, Joint project of the Biblioteca Nazionale Centrale, Florence; Museo Galileo, Florence; Max Planck Institute for the History of Science, Berlin.
• The Galileo Project, maintained by Albert Van Helden; contains Dava Sobel’s translations of all 124 letters from Suor Maria Celeste to Galileo in the sequence in which they were written.
• Museo Galileo, The Institute and Museum of the History of Science, Florence, Italy.

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Acknowledgments

This entry was originally written by Peter Machamer. David Marshall Miller co-wrote the revision with Machamer in 2021. Machamer died in 2023, and Miller is the sole author of the revision published in December 2025.

Thanks to Zvi Biener and Paolo Palmieri for commenting on earlier versions of this entry.