Pierre Gassendi

First published Tue May 31, 2005; substantive revision Tue Mar 19, 2024

Pierre Gassendi (b. 1592, d. 1655) was a French philosopher, scientific chronicler, observer, and experimentalist, scholar of ancient texts and debates, and active participant in contemporary deliberations of the first half of the seventeenth century. His significance in early modern thought has in recent years been rediscovered and explored, towards a better understanding of the dawn of modern empiricism, the mechanical philosophy, and relations of modern philosophy to ancient and medieval discussions. While Gassendi is perhaps best known in history of philosophy for his disputes with Descartes, his relations with other major figures, including Kepler, Galileo, Mersenne, Beeckman, and Hobbes, represented even more important transactions of ideas. And while Gassendi also sought to communicate anew the ideas of Epicurus, the Stoics, and other earlier thinkers, his resulting amalgam of perspectives provides a modern view of his own making, one of the touchstones of philosophy and science in his times: our access to knowledge of the natural world is dependent on the constraints and licenses that follow from our epistemic grasp being limited to information provided by senses. Through this arch-empiricism—tempered by his priestly adherence to key elements of Church doctrine—Gassendi views metaphysics as a realm for speculation grounded in the possibility of empirical confirmation, logic as (by turns) a psychologistic and probabilistic enterprise, knowledge of the external world as built on and forever subject to sensory-based evidence, and ethics in quasi-hedonist, possibly quantifiable terms. Gassendi’s philosophy is a constant review of other sources, a thorough consideration of the landscape into which his own empiricism fits and represents an alternative to contrasting claims, past and present. What is sometimes thought of as eclecticism—particularly in the posthumous masterwork, the Syntagma Philosophicum—actually recasts philosophy as a fully-referenced scholarly enterprise, advancing historical styles and rhetorical modes in philosophical research and exposition. In these changes he matches even the magnitude of innovation that marks his atomist matter theory, empiricist perspectives, explorations and defenses of the new physics, objections to the Meditations, and refutations of contemporary Aristotelians and mystical thinkers. It has been argued—perhaps unfairly—that Gassendi’s core ideas are better preserved through the medium of writings by Boyle, Locke, Huygens, and Newton. Yet his presentation of an empiricism, atomism, and new cosmology in historical and philosophical context greatly advanced the community of scholarship in his day, and represents what was then a fairly new model of research and exposition—still in philosophical use today.

1. Historical Background and Gassendi’s Life

Born in 1592 to a family of commoners in the tranquil Haute-Provence town of Champtercier, Pierre Gassendi rose to become the greatest Provençal scholar of his day, a member of the preeminent French intellectual group of his times—the Mersenne circle—and professor of mathematics at the College Royal. At an early age, his instructors recognized great potential, and dispatched him at age sixteen to Aix-en-Provence for studies of further sophistication than his local schooling could provide. In these first years of scholarly pursuit, Gassendi shuttled between Aix and Digne (the provincial capital) and so began a life-long pattern of itinerant travel. His extensive and early education vaulted him to professorship at Aix while still in his mid-twenties. He shuttled between careers as well, attaining success and station not only in academic circles but also in the Catholic Church.

Gassendi’s career as a priest is a crucial facet of his intellectual constitution: his writings reflect an unbending allegiance to Holy Scripture and Church teachings, though not necessarily in orthodox doctrinal lights. He was ordained at the age of 24 or 25 and, while there is no question of the strength of his faith, one motivation for his career in the Church appears to be its provision of a sinecure. Thus Gassendi started at the rank of a low-level local official (Chanoine of the Cathedral) in Digne and rose to the rank of a slightly higher-level local official (Prévôt), still in Digne, some twenty years later. Though he clearly pursued a studied relationship with his higher authority, all the while he wrote letters of support to the Church-embattled Galileo, sought appointment to the secular College Royal, and cultivated deep personal and intellectual ties with his non-Church patrons—the affluent fonctionnaire, Francois Luillier; the Provençal savant, Nicole-Pierre Fabri de Peiresc; the local count of Alais, Louis Emmanuel de Valois; and the Parisian noble, Habert de Montmor.

After some years of instructing pupils in philosophy and theology, Gassendi distanced himself from what he believed to be rigid teachings of the Scholastics in his Exercitationes Paradoxicae of 1624. Thereafter he began a formative partnership in physiological, astronomical, and historical studies with the wise and wealthy Peiresc, summarized in Gassendi’s glowing biography written upon Peiresc’s death in 1637. By this time, Gassendi had also developed his early interests in a variety of questions in basic physics and in restoring the philosophy of Epicurus—much as Thomas had restored Aristotle, integrating his thought with what he held to be theologically viable. His published work in philosophy and natural philosophy captured the attention of the Minim priest, Marin Mersenne. Gassendi spent the last two decades of his life traveling back and forth between Provence and Paris because of varying commitments to patrons, appointment to the College Royal, and ill health. Throughout, he remained informed of and involved with scholarly discussions of the day, owing to his engagement with the group of philosophers and scientists united through correspondence with Mersenne. In the Mersenne circle, debates ranged over numerous topics central to the dismantling of Aristotelian and Scholastic world-views, and Mersenne often used his role as facilitator to bring together opponents on these issues. In that context, Mersenne helped enable the entry of Gassendi’s criticisms of Descartes’s Meditations into the Objections and Replies (Gassendi subsequently published his rebuttals in his Disquistio Metaphysica of 1646) and focused Gassendi’s attention on refuting the mystical attacks on Kepler by Robert Fludd (Epistolica Exercitatio, in qua principia philosophiae Roberti Fluddi medici reteguntur, 1630). Members of this circle regularly reported on each other’s experiments and proposed new challenges, such as Poysson’s well-known puzzling over whether physical indivisibles could or should be identified with mathematical points. Gassendi used this forum to learn about other empirical studies as well as to work out a good many of his views.

His scientific career was varied and complex, if never quite associated with glowing triumph. Some historians consider his greatest accomplishment in this sphere to be his contribution to the revival of ancient atomism but this represents only one end of his anti-Aristotelian physics, and a small, albeit core element of his scientific interests. His other accomplishments in physics includes a study of bodies in free fall (closely modeled on Galileo’s work), a mature enunciation of the principle of inertia, and an early and reasonably accurate interpretation of the Pascalian barometry experiments of the late 1640s. Gassendi also ventured into experimental science: he attempted to measure the speed of sound by cannon fire, arranged to have weights dropped from the mast of a moving ship to enact Galileo’s thought experiment (and so dispel doubts about the motion of the Earth), and conducted numerous chemical trials involving, among other things, the dissolution of salts and formation of crystals (which he took to bolster his molecular theory of matter). These are only some of his better-known exploits. In addition, he offered a wide variety of speculations on the earth sciences based partly on geological fieldwork and biological and physiological observations—and as shaped by his atomist hypothesis. Finally, Gassendi devoted much of his time to astronomical pursuits. He made regular observations of the skies for decades, producing confirmatory evidence for Kepler’s views, observing sunspots, the anses of Saturn, and the passage of Mercury before the Sun (1631), and successfully predicting an eclipse in 1654. Moreover, he commissioned the first map of the moon, defended the Copernican view as plausible save for its conflicts with Church teachings, and offered many disparaging words on what he considered the scurrilous and empirically intolerable practice of astrology.

In his final years, Gassendi relented to pressure from friends and released a major portion of his Epicurean studies to the public, publishing his Latin translation of Diogenes Laertiius’s Book X on Epicurus, along with ample commentary, in his Animadversiones of 1649. He continued to work on this interpretive material, however, steadily incorporating philosophical and scientific insights, until his death in the Paris apartment of Montmor in 1655. Montmor, acting as executor, collected this material in manuscript form and with Gassendi’s other Parisian friends arranged to have it published as the posthumous Syntagma Philosophicum. The Syntagma is more systematic than the Animadversiones, largely eschewing the sometimes philological character of the earlier commentary and principally discussing logic, the natural sciences, psychology, and ethics from the perspective of what Gassendi deems philosophically, historically, and theologically supportable. His interests in Epicurus are ever-present, not least in the structure of the work, which is divided into a Logic (including his textbook-format Institutio Logica), Physics, and Ethics. Happily, we have a rather well-rounded picture of Gassendi’s intellectual pursuits, on top of his Epicurean projects. Montmor and company had the good sense to bundle the Syntagma together with the better part of Gassendi’s other writings (the Animadversiones notably excepted) in six volumes of collected works, the Opera Omnia (Lyon, 1658; Florence, 1727), which includes as well earlier letters on optics and the free fall of bodies, a portion of his voluminous astronomical observations, and a great deal of his correspondence.

(In what follows, we cite passages in Opera Omnia by using the following abbreviations for the volumes: “O I”, “O II”,…, “O VI”.)

In the wake of Gassendi’s death, his general renown, influence on French schooling and popular conceptions of natural science, and rivalry for Descartes’ legacy, all grew. This impact was enhanced by the 1674–1675 publication of a condensed, abridged, reorganized, and occasionally paraphrased version of the Opera Omnia, written in French by Gassendi’s acolyte, François Bernier. Over the following half century, the “Gassendistes” stood as formidable opponents to the “Cartésiennes” in French debates over educational and scientific matters, and Gassendi’s thinking spread—variously influencing Leibniz, Boyle, Locke, and Newton, among others.

2. Method and Nature of Philosophical Inquiry

Commentators and historians conventionally designate Gassendi as an early modern thinker yet there is good reason to at least consider his work as belonging to the tail end of the preceding period. One facet of his work that closely resembles Renaissance philosophy and science is the historical focus of his method of inquiry. For almost every philosophical issue Gassendi deems worthy of discussion, he first introduces a wide range of previous competing views, beginning with the antique schools, which he considers as ‘live’ options. He engages with Aristotle and early (as well as late) Aristotelianism, and allows great debts to Skeptic, Stoic, and Epicurean thought. The history of philosophy is for him a source of vitally important reasoning, the generally correct way to frame our questions, and more occasionally, the answers to those questions. Thus one principal attraction of atomism for Gassendi is that it suggests a way to think about causation among material objects which he finds an attractive alternative to Aristotelian views on one hand and non-physicalist views on the other. In his theory of knowledge we find one more instance of using ancient frameworks to model contemporary problems: no criterion of truth, for example, is adequate unless it satisfies the standard points made by the classical Skeptics. Some may see this as evidence of Gassendi’s modernism, but his broad concerns with Skeptical thought certainly place him among good Renaissance company. (The Skepticist and anti-Aristotelian strains of his Exercitationes are also thought to be influenced by his reading of near-contemporaries, including Juan Luis Vives and Pierre Charron.)

Another Renaissance-type element of Gassendi’s writings is his stylistic obsession with antiquity. His Latin is learned if a bit stultified, rife with quotations from Virgil, Horace, Cicero, Tertullian, and others. An embroidered, ornate quality marks his few extant French writings, too. He quotes frequently and liberally from classical sources, usually in Latin though sometimes in Greek, and his translation of Diogenes Laertius’s Book X on the life of Epicurus is the centerpiece of his 1649 Animadversiones. Gassendi does not, as does Descartes, suggest his work is so modern as to have been invented de novo. Rather, he constantly refers the reader to a wide variety of other, generally classical writers as sources of both like-minded and conflicting perspectives. Finally, the single most time-consuming project of his career consists in his prodigious efforts towards reviving the works and reputation of one particular classical figure, Epicurus.

These Renaissance trappings notwithstanding, there are also at least two reasons to think of Gassendi as very much among the moderns. For one, he embraces the new empiricist’s assessment of the old science: what is wrong with the Aristotelians’ physics is its routine presentation, as well as grounding, in apriori theoretical claims. He is not the only, or the first author of such a view. Galileo breaks with tradition in distinguishing a science of motion that, in principle at least, makes use of observation and experiment. Bacon and Descartes, for their part, also counsel (to varying degrees) a scientific method which builds on experiential knowledge. But among the savants of the early seventeenth century, only Gassendi, whose awareness of empiricism’s roots and implications is evident across his intellectual pursuits, integrates philosophy and science on what he believes to be strictly empiricist grounds. This integration is a natural consequence of his suggestion that we gain all knowledge—outside of the theological—from the senses.

A range of equally modern views follow from his proposed empiricist foundations for the new science and its methods. He suggests a probabilist notion of what counts as warranted empirical belief, and insists that we may license beliefs about the sub- and supra-perceivable but only if they are well-grounded in our beliefs about the perceptually given. Further, he devises rules for accepting or rejecting hypotheses, and guidelines for directing empirical discoveries and our judgments of the same, where all such claims are subject to the test of evidence from experiment or observation. It is far from true that all, or even most, of his own claims about the nature of the physical world meet this test, but the modernity of Gassendi’s philosophy and science lies in his proposal that this is a goal to be set, altogether.

3. Refutations of Aristotelians and Descartes

For many commentators, Gassendi’s empiricist theory of knowledge and objections to Descartes’s Meditations count as his paramount philosophical contributions. In his core epistemology, he offers the first modern model of knowledge from the senses to be integrated with a physiological account of perception. In his objections to Descartes, he rejects the clarity and distinctness criterion, seeks to undermine the reasoning behind the cogito, and assails the ontological argument. Each of these views represents a battle Gassendi has taken up against the Aristotelian tradition or the Cartesian stance; his thoroughgoing empiricism poses an alternative to both of these competing perspectives.

One cornerstone of Gassendi’s anti-Aristotelianism is the suggestion that there is nothing necessary about the way the world is. God, he proposes, could have made the world work in any number of ways, and the contingent history and character of Creation means that there is nothing immutable about the essence of a material thing. (That a ‘substance’, in either the Aristotelian or Cartesian sense, might have an immutable essence, is a different matter, and insofar as Gassendi has such a notion (for example, with respect to space, time, matter, and void) he agrees that such things feature unchangeable sine qua non characteristics.) Moreover, Gassendi maintains, regardless of whether there are any essences and whether they might be mutable, there are none to which we have any epistemic access. The sole originating source of our knowledge is the information the senses provide, such that what we know is closely linked to what we can perceive. However, as Descartes notes, we can perceive only appearances. Gassendi draws from this point the very uncartesian lesson that appearances are all we can know about, too—thereby ruling out knowledge of unperceivable essences. One line of this reasoning can be found in his discussion of classical skeptical tropes concerning the relativity of evidence from the senses to individual experience—that honey tastes sweet to me, though bitter to you; and that fire seems hot to us, though not so to insects that live near fire (O III (DM) 388b; R 535). Since different people have distinct experiences, our knowledge of honey’s taste or fire’s heat differs from person to person and thus is not a reliable guide to invariable characteristics of, for example, the honey or fire. In cases like these we know a thing’s qualities only as we record them on a subjective basis. Such sensory information, based on experiences which vary intersubjectively, cannot yield judgments about a thing’s qualities which do not vary in that (or any other) way. Hence we lack knowledge of the thing’s essence, if indeed there is one. More broadly, from our principal source of ideas—the senses—we know only how things appear to us (O III (DM) 311b-312a; R 184). (If we are to have knowledge of an object’s essence, Gassendi proposes, such requires a “perfect interior examination” of that object, which is apparently not something we may gain from empirical study.)

Gassendi also contests the Aristotelian view that we can know universals, on the grounds that we cannot perceive anything more than particulars in the world (O III (Exercitationes) 159a; EP 280–281). It follows, he suggests, that neither can there be any universals we know about, at least with anything like certainty. Some commentators (including Bloch, Rochot, and Osler) propose that nominalism is a central Gassendist view, on the basis of this rejection of essences and universals, as well as his epistemic reliance on the apparent, and interest in signs and their conventional character. But Gassendi’s nominalism—if it be such, in the orthodox sense—is intended less as an ontological assessment, than as a statement of the limits of human mental capacity, whether epistemic or linguistic.

Further building on the insistence that all knowledge comes from the senses, Gassendi discusses the view (shared as well by Descartes and the Aristotelians) that there are propositions we can know with certainty. Since all propositions are judged as true or false on an empirical basis, none can be deemed indubitable, save those of theology and theologically-derived cosmology. This lack of certainty extends as well to logical demonstration, whether of inductive or deductive character. Nothing is certain about such demonstration, Gassendi suggests, save the limits imposed upon it by the frailty of human intellectual capacities. The natural bounds of our epistemic grasp in the physical sciences, astronomy, or most any other field of study is just what the senses tell us, plus any correctives reason supplies on the basis of sensory-based knowledge we have already accrued.

That Gassendi thinks there is a need for correctives on sensory information makes clear the depths of his rejection of epistemic foundationalism in Aristotelian or Cartesian thought: we cannot trust even information from the senses to give us a failsafe picture of the world. In this he embraces the Skeptical judgment that no source of belief can provide for certain knowledge. Yet he cannot accept their wholesale dismissal of sensory-derived evidence for belief. Knowledge from the senses is possible just in case we have warrant for judgments about appearances, though we may lack warrant for certainty about those judgments. To the limited extent that we have the second sort of warrant, he suggests, we find this in the reliability of our sensory apparatuses (as he describes in his Epicurean-inspired account of perception). We see here a ‘constructive skepticist’ response to the Skeptics who say no knowledge is possible and to those ancient and latter-day ‘dogmatic’ thinkers (including, in his view, the Aristotelians and Descartes) who say knowledge involves the attainment of certain belief—and is readily attainable. While it may not be possible to have certain beliefs, it is quite possible to have knowledge given that we construe it as justified but less-than-certain belief. (Naturally, it must have a veridical character as well, and Gassendi thinks it sufficient that such beliefs are at least truth-resembling.)

Gassendi articulates such disagreements with Descartes in the Objections, where he also rejects the Cartesian criterion of clarity and distinctness, as either a standard for judging ideas or source of epistemic warrant. As regards the former, Gassendi points out that reason, which comprises our intellectual judgments and interpretations of sensory information, is itself prone to error:

…although deception, or falsity, is not to be found in the senses themselves, which merely behave passively and only report things as they appear and as they must appear given their causes, it is to be found in the judgment, or mind, when it does not act with enough circumspection and does not perceive that things which are distant…appear more indistinct and smaller than they do close up…. (O III (DM) 388a; R 532; B 266–267)

If, for all their faults, claims based on sensory information are more reliable than those based on reasoning (about sensory information or anything else), then we ought not appeal to the latter as a basis for judging among claims of the former. One reason he thinks sensory-based claims are the more reliable of the two is that he takes the senses to passively (hence steadily) collect information, in contrast to our mental judgment actively (hence irregularly) organizing or relating information. This is not to say that we will have no problems gauging the warrant for claims based on sensory information as we collect it. Rather, we will have even more problems in gauging claims based on ideas about sensory information after such ideas are that much more removed from a direct and perspicuous relationship to the world as experienced, in our organizing and relating them to other ideas.

Moreover, the Cartesian criterion is irrelevant to judging cases of empirical knowledge, Gassendi suggests—and even if this criterion were not irrelevant, Descartes’s own claims to knowledge should fail all the same. First, in the case of empirical knowledge, Gassendi proposes that the Cartesian criterion fails on classical Skeptical grounds: it is possible for us to have ideas from the senses we take to be clear and distinct which are nevertheless not the basis for warranted claims to empirical knowledge of a general nature. Though we may have clear and distinct ideas about the appearances of, for example, the color of the sky we perceive, we cannot infer from this clarity and distinctness that we know what color the sky is. As the Skeptics warn, the sky could appear to different persons in different colors, and as Gassendi adds, our ideas of such an appearance could each be clear and distinct (O III (DM) 314b; R 198–199). Second, knowledge claims Descartes takes to be demonstrated by reason alone Gassendi dismisses as anyway failing the proposed criterion; they are partial and confused, he suggests, because they lack the immediacy characteristic of judgments we attain by strictly empirical means. Whereas ideas we gain from the senses directly represent worldly objects and events, ideas we attain by deductive proof are but hypothetical analogues to such sensory-derived ideas:

…it is not the same thing for us to conceive something by a veritable idea or a true image, and to conceive that thing by a conclusion that follows necessarily from an anterior hypothesis. In the first case in effect we conceive of the thing as absolutely so; in the second, that it should be some such thing; and also in the first case we know the thing distinctly and as it is in itself, and in the second case we know it only in a confused manner and by analogy, that is, in referring to it as something that must be known by way of some idea (O III DM) 322b; R 234).

In brief, our reasoned claims are less than fully clear or distinct because we arrive at them through the mediation of ideas about our empirical knowledge. Hence Descartes’s most cherished claims about essential properties of mind, God, and matter fail his own criterion for lack of direct foundation in our ideas from the senses.

Not all of Gassendi’s criticisms of the Cartesian criterion are rooted in his advocacy of knowledge from the senses. Thus, he suggests, one other problem with that criterion is its failure to make good on its foundationalist promise. Just in case some of our clear and distinct ideas turn out to be wrong, we will require some further criterion to distinguish them from the correct ideas. And if the new criterion is simply something like ‘more clear and more distinct’, then we are on the road to infinitely many higher-order criteria, which defeats the aims of the foundationalist project altogether. Finally, Gassendi offers what Descartes himself came to call “the objection of objections.” Our ideas being clear and distinct ideas is perfectly consonant with a solipsistic perspective, but then the only thing we can know with certainty is our own thoughts. Yet a viable criterion should (a) also distinguish our knowledge claims about the external world, and (b) mark solipsistic claims as dubitable to begin with. On top of these objections, Gassendi proposes that Descartes has put the cart before the horse by suggesting we can readily recognize what is clear and distinct and use this as a guide to what is indubitable when what we need in the first place is some guide as to what is clear and distinct:

…the difficulty is not, as it seems, to know if one must conceive things clearly and distinctly so as not to be mistaken at all, but to know by what way or method it is possible to recognize that one has a conception so clear and so distinct that it is true and impossible that we are mistaken. (O III (DM) 372b; R 458)

Another well-known set of Gassendi’s objections target Descartes’ views of mind and body. One such objection is a prelude to the well-known puzzle over how mind and body could be thought to interact, posed by Princess Elisabeth of Bohemia. Gassendi wonders how Descartes could take the mind to be thinking substance lacking extension yet claim that it is somehow attached to the body, given that anything joined to a body must itself be extended (O III (DM) 399b-401a; R 584-590). Descartes’s answer is that he does not take mind and body to be attached, which response immediately invites Princess Elisabeth’s puzzle.

In a related vein, Descartes’s cogito reasoning also undergoes close scrutiny. Gassendi understands this reasoning as one person’s inference from his or her indubitable recognition of cognitive activity, to the claim that he or she exists as the selfsame seat of such activity. Against such an inference he points out that recognition that one has a set of thoughts does not imply that one is a particular thinker or another. Were we to move from the observation that there is thinking occurring to the attribution of this thinking to a particular agent, we would simply assume what we set out to prove, namely, that there exists a particular person endowed with the capacity for thought (O III (DM) 289a-290a; R 82-86). Descartes is in dangerous waters at this point, for if indeed the only claim that is indubitable here is the agent-independent claim that there is cognitive activity present, then he can be fairly associated with Averroist panpsychism, and its considerable taint. At a minimum, the argument requires a significant leap of reasoning, and for Gassendi, this is further evidence that Descartes places altogether too much faith in his criterion and the work he thinks it can do.

That Gassendi is primarily concerned here with the character of Descartes’s reasoning is plain enough: in the end and broadly speaking, the two are actually close in their views about mind and body. They are both dualists of one stripe or another, and the particulars of Gassendi’s physically-rooted psychology are reasonably similar to those of Descartes’s model. Gassendi’s model of the mind is often taken to be wholly materialist in design, particularly as seen through the prism of his critique of Descartes. Yet only one facet of the Gassendist soul is the material anima, the locus of physically-determined pleasure and pain. He also posits an immaterial animus, the seat of the intellect or rational understanding. This cognitive faculty is the locus of spiritually-determined pleasures and pains we associate with, for example, love of God or fear of evil. Here we have an echo of the Thomist interpretation of De Anima, according to which vegetative and motive facets of the soul perish with the body though an intellective facet lives on forever.

Elsewhere on a theological plane, Gassendi shares other core views with Descartes, though some commentators have tried to paint Gassendi as concealing atheist tendencies, owing to his suspected materialist and libertine allegiances. Such a charge is inaccurate. Yet it is also so that Gassendi does not accept the Cartesian route to belief in the Divine, notably rejecting Descartes’ version of the ontological argument.

The Cartesian version of Anselm’s traditional argument suggests that God has the intrinsic property of existence as part of a divine essence, in the same way a triangle has intrinsic properties such as having three internal angles summing to 180 degrees. Further, as with all divinely-held properties, God has that existence property as a perfection—that is, God exists in a perfect way, such that God cannot not exist. Gassendi rejects this reasoning on two grounds. First, we have no irrefutable intuitions of essences, whether such are supposed to be represented by properties of triangles or of God. Descartes’ particular misstep here is to suggest that we may move from the definition of God (which we intuit as a clear and distinct notion) as essentially entailing the property of existence, to the view that there is such a thing as God with said property. A definition of a thing as having such and such properties does not commit us to the thing existing with those properties, even if one of those properties is said to be existence. This much was noted in Gaunilo’s early criticism of Anselm’s version. Yet the more general point Gassendi makes is that no intuitions untested by sensory experience will yield knowledge of God’s essence or anything else, as the primary mode of attaining knowledge (and that by which any intuitions must be tested) is empirical demonstration. Second, presaging the Kantian criticism, existence is neither a perfection nor any sort of property or predicate of things that exist. Rather, existence is simply an aspect of things that exist, the mode or state of being that describes its existing. Existence is accordingly a precondition for bearing perfections (and for perfections being borne by the thing), rather than something which itself can be a perfection. If we refer to a thing’s existence, we are only referring to a fact about the thing, that it exists. Rejecting the ontological argument, then, eliminates a sort of conceptual confusion: although we might think of perfections existing (in a thing), it is hard to conceive of what it would mean for existence to exist (in a thing), or for that matter, to not exist. Along similar lines, there is no reason to accept the underlying claim of the ontological argument that things which do not exist are either imperfect or lacking in any way (O III (DM) 379b-380b; R 490–6).

4. Empiricism and Scientific Method

Another significant difference between Cartesian and Gassendist views of God is that for the latter there is no divine epistemic guarantor—indeed, for Gassendi, there is no absolute or necessary guarantee on our epistemic access altogether. There is only the contingent warrant of the senses. In the textbook account of the early modern debate among empiricists and rationalists, Gassendi plays a bit part in promoting the senses as the ultimate source of our worldly knowledge. His views are painted as a vanguard but ultimately inconsequential Continental counter to Descartes and as a slight influence on Locke’s more ‘mature’ empiricism. Gassendi’s contribution is more noteworthy than all that, however. His theory of knowledge explicitly addresses historical traditions in epistemology, develops a proto-reliabilist theory of epistemic warrant, wrestles with timeless difficulties of empiricism, and forms the basis of a set of allied views on the nature of scientific investigation.

The need for a theory of empirical knowledge in Gassendi’s view stems from the inadequacy of past and contemporary responses to the Skeptics, whose puzzles he finds particularly compelling in the form of the tropes as presented by Sextus Empiricus. The Skeptical tropes call our attention to the general problem of whether, given the fallibility of the senses, any knowledge is possible and in what the warrant for such would consist. Gassendi turns the problem around, limiting its scope to finding warrant for empirical knowledge and declaring the special solution to resolve the general case. His significant move in this regard is to propose, against the Stoics (and, as we have seen, Descartes), that it is not a necessary condition of our knowing some claim that we be certain of it. This probabilism immediately broadens the range of what we can know through the senses—as does his suggestion that we include among such claims to knowledge those assertions about what may be hidden to the senses yet legitimately inferred from evidence of the perceptually given. This is his theory of sign-based inference, which suggests such inferences are legitimate just in case they would be agreed to by a great enough number of experts giving testimony—or else would be false only on pain of contradiction.

Following an Epicurean, physicalist model, Gassendi recommends that Skeptical worries are satisfied by truth-criteria and elements of epistemic warrant rooted in the regularity and reliability of our sensory perception and formation of ideas. Trustworthy evidence from the senses yields warrant for empirical beliefs, albeit without certainty and just in case the evidence for them does not conflict with accepted evidentiary experiences. These claims are built upon the proposals that sensory information has a material form (in the case of vision, Gassendi promotes an atomist theory of effluxions bearing images or light from the viewed object to the viewer), that the mind receives sensory information through a wholly physical process, and that some cognitive faculties dependably allow us to detect truth properties of the objects of knowledge. The physical process underlying this perceptual account is inspired by Epicurus but the physiological details, optics of light transmission, and epistemological lessons are strictly Gassendi’s own. Indeed, this account of justification marks him not merely as a proponent of a causal theory (as may be said of Descartes, relative to the divine epistemic guarantor) but as an early champion of a reliabilist approach to the causal processes, claiming them as the source of epistemic warrant.

The negative side of Gassendi’s theory of knowledge bows in the direction of the classical Skeptics: we cannot be conclusively certain about, nor find ultimate truths among, empirical beliefs. The positive side rejects an absolute Skeptical doubt, however, suggesting that empirical knowledge is possible because we can identify a range of strengths that are normally associated with many beliefs about appearances—their reliability, approximation to the truth, and likelihood by degrees. This approach—what Popkin calls the via media of Gassendi, the ‘constructive’ skepticist—suggests a practicable if approximate understanding of the world is within our grasp.

This adumbrated version of empiricism is not without difficulties, as Gassendi is first to recognize. For one, having extended the warrant for the directly sensed to the indirectly sensed, we must find a way to confidently adduce evidence on behalf of what appears before the senses in indirect fashion only. For another, the supposition that solving for empirical knowledge presents a solution for all knowledge introduces the challenge of accounting for at least two apparent counterintuitive instances—knowledge of abstracta and knowledge of God and the cosmos (Gassendi subsumes the former to empirical knowledge on proto-Millian grounds, but exempts most theological and cosmological truth from empirical grasp (O II 398–424, 440–42)). Finally, he calls our attention to the recursive nature of empiricist doubts. If a lack of adequate sensory data strips away warrant for knowledge of the world then an empiricist theory of knowledge must also appeal to what the senses tell us, about what we can know of the world. The challenge, then, is to fashion an empirically adequate theory of acquiring sensory data. In formulating such an account, he anticipates crucial elements of later reliabilist theories of warrant.

On the basis of these global views of knowledge in general, Gassendi develops elements of a theory of knowledge and method specific to the scientific endeavor. These elements include the proposal that we attain and justify empirical claims with the greatest warrant by deduction—yet those claims are at root probabilistic. He further proposes that we maintain hypotheses as the basis of scientific reasoning so long as there is empirical evidence for them, however broadly construed. Taken together, these elements constitute a commitment to a hypothetico-deductivism (H-D) which is characteristic of some instances of actual scientific reasoning that Gassendi discusses. This is not a typical or modern species of H-D method, however, firmly wedded as it is to his empiricism. Indeed, Gassendi’s method cannot be adequately characterized in its entirety in this fashion, given the several other forms of non-deductive inference that he endorses or makes use of as fundamental to his scientific method, including sign-based inference, analogous reasoning, and inference to the best explanation.

A further element of Gassendi’s scientific method consists in his appeals to indirect evidence for claims about the unobservable, and his willingness to count such evidence as adequate empirical grounds for maintaining viable hypotheses. The most prominent instance of this strategy is his embrace of an atomist matter theory as a ‘most likely hypothesis’. Of necessity, any evidence on behalf of this hypothesis is to be found in the indirect form of ‘indicative’ signs—these are the surface level phenomena for which he takes the existence of atoms to be a sine qua non condition. A paramount instance of such evidence in his view is what we may see through the microscope, when the visual phenomena are explicable only given the existence of the micro-structures we perceive—and in turn those are explicable only in terms of yet smaller structures. Gassendi maintains that the microscopic observations of crystalline formation and dissolution demonstrate the molecular structure of matter, a key aspect of his atomism. Equally innovative is his appeal to this putative source of warrant in support of his matter theory.

Such arguments for atomism highlight Gassendi’s anticipation of the modern notion of inference to the best explanation (IBE) as a means of judging among competing hypotheses. In advancing this strategy, he emphasizes the capacity of a given hypothesis to account for a range of different phenomena as a guide to the degree to which that hypothesis approximates the truth. This strategy for justifying claims about atoms also reaffirms his reliance on empirical data in seeking confirmation of claims regarding the evident and nonevident alike. While much is untenable or unlikely about these views, Gassendi has at least offered a set of proposals towards resolving one of empiricism’s more vexing questions—how to transcend the bounds of sensory data. We can know about unobservables like atoms, he proposes, just in case our empiricism advances scientific knowledge through hypothetical reasoning and warrants the sorts of inferences about physical phenomena allowing for unseen features of the world—for which the sensible features can provide evidence.

5. Atomist Matter Theory

The core of Gassendi’s mature philosophy and natural philosophy is his atomist matter theory. He initially borrows on historical atomist sources—primarily Epicurus—but quickly integrates a range of atomist claims into his proposed empirically defensible complex of physical, metaphysical, and ethical perspectives. Some aspects of his atomism fit poorly with the mechanical philosophy it is supposed to exemplify. Yet Popkin is correct in suggesting that Gassendi’s atomism is a premier instance of his philosophical and scientific pursuits constituting one and the same project. The putative empirical support does not stand up to close inspection, and his particular brand of this matter theory is inconsistent with other elements of the mechanical philosophy. Nonetheless, his atomism provides an innovative and consistent model for micro-level accounts of macro-level physical structures and their behavior, throughout all manner of natural, psychological, and social domains. In this last regard, Gassendi’s views resemble those of his acquaintance, Hobbes, though with greater attention to core physical details of the matter theory, and fine-grained notions as to how the micro-mechanisms may operate.

Gassendi reveals atomist sympathies in his earliest works and correspondence, where he rejects much of the style and some of the substance of philosophy in the late Aristotelian tradition. Indeed, some commentators see Gassendi as a thinker in the Renaissance mold who simply lands on atomism as a central component of a broader Epicurean alternative system to the robust range of received Aristotelian views. However, though he shares most of Epicurus’s claims about atoms (and many Epicurean arguments for those claims), Gassendi disagrees on key points. This suggests it is the merits of the view itself, that it is the most likely physical hypothesis about the underlying structure of matter, and not simply a general restoration of Epicureanism, that leads him to atomism.

The broadest atomist claims Gassendi makes are rooted in his background metaphysics and rejection of the infinite divisibility of matter. He grounds the finer points of his atomism—regarding the qualities of atoms and their aggregates—on observations, experiment, and interpretations of the same, as well as his assessments of alternative perspectives on matter theory. Following the Epicurean model (with debts to Lucretius, Democritus, and others still), he starts with a basic ontology of matter and void, and develops a thoroughgoing account of the physical world rooted in a picture of the inherent features of atoms. The general range of phenomena and entities for which Gassendi offers atomist accounts owes much to the ancients. Many of the particular explananda do not, though, and a significant number of his explanatory arguments are his own, at least in part.

Gassendi introduces notions of absolute space and time according to which the universe is that which contains material Creation. In the colloquial language of metaphysics, he lays out the ‘floor plan’ of his picture of the universe in which he understands God to place the ‘furniture’, namely, atoms and their amalgams. Space, time, accident, and substance are the basic and real (non-ideal) categories of existence: space and time are not modes of substance (see section ten). ‘Matter’ refers to substance that exists in space and time. Indeed, it is the sole and unchanging stuff of physical things and so must exist as long as physical things exist. Gassendi wants bits of matter to have their distinctive qualities without the scholastic imposition of form. In particular, he proposes, matter has essential and accidental qualities, though we can only know the accidental ones, through experience.

As for the containing space in which atoms reside, Gassendi offers empirical and apriori arguments on behalf of a void. He takes the barometric experiments of his day, including his own at Toulon, to demonstrate the existence of at least a partial, disseminated void. Moving beyond such empirical argument, he echoes ancient atomists’ reasoning. Thus he rehearses the classical arguments that without disseminated void between the parts of bodies, one cannot explain division and separation of matter at the level of basic particles, and that without the inane coacervatum, one cannot explain the motion of bodies through space.

Both atoms and the void are for Gassendi ‘principles’—by which he apparently means ‘primary element’, following a Scholastic tradition. It does not follow from this, however, that they are both substantival in his view. Whereas atoms are primary principles of material substance, voids are non-substantival principles of separation in which bodies are located, and by which they are separated and have their particular sort of supra-atomic structure.

To establish that atoms are the primary principles or elements of matter, Gassendi draws deeply on the well of ancient atomist argument. This sort of ‘historical evidence’ or ‘testimony’ tolerably counts as one manner of support for physical claims at the dawn of the early modern period. Given Gassendi’s pronounced empiricism, though, the degree of his reliance on such testimony is surprising. He strikes an even more surprising anti-empiricist chord in the introductory chapter of his Physics (Physicae Prooemium), pondering a stipulative account of the natural world that consists of the right physical postulates. In the end, though, this approach is unacceptable for Gassendi, as such a stipulative physics raises more questions than it answers. His alternative tack is a series of reasoned defenses of basic atomist tenets—frequently, amplifications and restatements of Epicurean and Lucretian arguments—including claims as to the existence and status of atoms as the primary material principles.

To take one example, Gassendi assumes material objects must have some substratum composed of basic and indivisible elements (‘principles’), and proposes that atoms, as the best candidates for the role of substrata, are the material principles in question. To arrive at this first assumption, he follows Epicurus and Lucretius in adopting the Parmenidean dicta that nothing comes from nothing and (conversely) that all matter must come from something. He further embraces the ancient view that those dicta entail a common substratum for all matter, as the composition and resolution of material things always yield matter. To establish that atoms are the best candidates for serving as this common substratum, he reasons that whatever would serve as matter’s substratum cannot pass from existence. Moreover, elements of such substratum would be incapable of passing from existence only if they were indivisible and thus had no void—that is, were solid. Yet this common substratum cannot be featureless, formless primary matter, as the Aristotelians propose. It should have some identifiable and unchanging features because such features are ineliminable from matter. He concludes that all material objects must be composed of elemental particles sharing the features essential to matter—and the particles with those features just are atoms.

In a second line of Lucretian reasoning, Gassendi argues that atoms are the primary principles of matter on the grounds that some fundamental material elements must be impenetrable if we are to account for varying degrees of resistance in macro-sized objects. He suggests that since all material things resist pressure to some extent, they all have one or another degree of solidity. The only way to explain this range of solidity, or resistance to pressure, he claims, is by supposing that the ultimate constituent elements of all bodies are not soft, which is guaranteed if they are all solid. Otherwise, there could be no bodies harder than the softest ones, for if the ultimate constituent elements were soft, then more solid bodies could never be composed from them. From this he concludes that all material things must be composed of maximally hard elements which, when put together with more empty space between them, yield softer bodies—and, when put together with less empty space between them, yield harder bodies.

As in the previous line of reasoning, Gassendi seeks to establish that some properties of macro-sized objects—variable solidity here, immutable materiality in his first argument—require an underlying atomic architecture. Unfortunately, the atomic account offered by the present argument also is not necessary to explaining the macro-property—for we can still have diverse degrees of resistance to pressure even if the basic elements of matter also range in degrees of solidity. Worse still, this account is not even sufficient to the task. Given that atomic size and the amount of interparticulate void are also variable factors, different combinations of these structural characteristics could yield identical degrees of solidity across the otherwise very distinctive macro-level objects they compose. Then varying atomic architectures is not sufficient for varying degrees of resistance to pressure in objects on the macro scale.

Such arguments and objections aside, Gassendi focuses his greatest efforts to deny matter’s infinite divisibility on the relevance of mathematical and geometrical considerations to physical accounts of matter’s ultimate or near-ultimate particles. While acknowledging the broad conceptual parallel between physical and mathematical continua in ancient discussions (O I 262b), he warns against the mistaken notion that physical magnitudes should be infinitely divisible just because mathematical magnitudes are (O I 263b). This last observation by itself fails to establish that atoms are actually divisible. Yet Gassendi views this notion as the collapse of a major argument against atomism. More generally, though, he is less swayed by any particular arguments for or against atomism than he is by the merits and value of taking atomism as a best working hypothesis, with which we may explain a wide variety of shared properties among macro-sized objects—as well as those properties that differentiate them.

A more fundamental task is the enumeration of atomic properties. Gassendi distinguishes between two sorts: those properties inherent in and essential to all individual atoms, and those which are a feature of atoms in groups. His list of inherent atomic features, which closely follows Epicurus’s list, includes: extension, size (moles, or more recognizably, magnitudo), shape (figura), weight or mass (pondus), and solidity (soliditas). Relative to each of these features all atoms generally resemble one another, there being a limited range of sizes and weights. One exception is shape. In order to account for tremendous variety among natural objects, Gassendi claims, there must be very many different types of atomic shapes (though not infinitely so), and many tokens of each type (again, not infinitely so).

Another notable feature of this list of properties is that it signals Gassendi’s rejection of the cartesian view that extension is sufficient to characterize what is essential to the least bit of matter. Descartes is wrong, then, for the same reason that the Scholastics are wrong to talk about featureless matter in the context of physical theory. As Gassendi argues, while we might abstractly conceive of matter with one feature such as extension (or none at all, per the Scholastics), matter cannot actually come into existence without the features that God assigns at Creation—namely, size, shape, weight, and solidity.

The essential feature of atoms which does the most work in Gassendi’s physics—and also generates the most difficulties—is their inherent weight, which gives them an intrinsic, natural tendency to move. Given this tendency, atomic rest is either provisionary or else an illusion. Atomic weight gives rise not only to a simple capacity for constant motion, but also to a range of more complex behaviors, enabling atoms to “…disentangle themselves, to free themselves, to leap away [prosiliendi, to spring out], to knock against other atoms, to turn them away [retundendi, to check], to move away from them, and similarly [they have] the capacity to take hold of each other, to attach themselves to each other, to join together, to bind each other fast…” Three other facets of atomic motion merit our attention. First, it must be the general tendency of atoms to move in straight lines given that the atoms here do not feature the clinamen, or swerve (contrary to the Epicurean tradition, though perhaps as Epicurus himself would say). Second, Gassendi proposes that God endows atoms with a robust set of capacities for moving themselves to varying degrees—leading some commentators to see Gassendi as a vitalist or animist. Finally, Gassendi subscribes to a seamless compositionality of matter and scalar invariance regarding the nature and laws of motion, each of which lead him into murky waters. On the micro-level, he is committed to a constancy of motion that cannot be permanently arrested, whereas on the macro-level, he holds that a principle of inertia governs the motion and rest of all bodies.

Gassendi’s compositionality thesis consists of the claim that the varied combinations of atoms give rise to all manner of physical, chemical, and biological features of the world and the phenomena they exhibit. Two elements of this thesis are noteworthy. First, atoms combine into particular molecular structures that correspond to particular macro-level features and phenomena. This pre-Daltonian view offers no suggestion that diverse collections of atoms are the source of molecular variety. Yet this molecularism is novel all the same for the broad suggestion that such micro-structures are intermediate-level building blocks of macro-structures, and for the particular proposal that the four Aristotelian basic elements be conceived of as molecular aggregates. Second, molecular structures en gros behave in the same ways as macro-level structures: they can be set in motion, pulled, elongated, compressed, and so on. In the case of molecular crystal structures, they can replicate, much as their macro-level counterparts can. On the other hand, there are significant dissimilarities among atoms and molecules: motion, density, and elasticity are all points of difference, which suggest the difficulty of a unified and internally consistent matter theory, relative to physical norms or laws. Yet Gassendi is confident that, at least in principle, the universe could have been created by God with any given composition of particles, as varying in size, shape, or any other dimension. This suggests that from that level of abstraction the laws governing motion (not contingencies for Gassendi) are intended to be scalar invariant. Even in cursory review, these tantalizing claims suggest significant and controversial consequences of stipulating that atoms have inherent weight and resulting tendencies to motion.

A further hallmark of Gassendi’s atomic and molecular theories is his suggestion, following the views of early atomists (prominently Lucretius), that some atoms are endowed with greater activity than others. The varied activity of such special atoms, or semina rerum, gives rise to a differential dynamism in matter (of purely materialist nature), allowing for special organic structures, as well as growth of crystals. By contrast, neither atoms nor molecules are endowed with powers per se. Nor do atoms bear forces, though certain forces such as gravity can be explained by reference to the behavior of atoms. Chemical forces, on the other hand, have molecular explanations.

One of the greatest challenges to Gassendi’s atomism from an internal perspective is the seemingly quixotic nature of his search for empirical foundations for atomism. In his era there is not the barest hint of perceptually-derived knowledge of anything so small. There is, he thinks, an empirically viable source of at least some claims concerning atoms—the indirect data of indicative signs. Yet the general tenor of his characterization and defense of physical atomism signals a departure from his customary empiricism. As in his defense of an indivisibility thesis, Gassendi relies foremost on reason, not experience, to account for the origin and quantity of atoms and what he takes to be their essential and inessential properties, their internal impetus, motion, and causal role, and their contribution to the motions and qualities we attribute to macrophysical objects. He is hardly to be faulted in this regard given the lack of direct empirical evidence available. Moreover, his responses to ancient and early modern critics of atomism are firmly within their strategic bounds, as they typically rely on reasoned argument without appeal to empirical force.

6. Atomist Natural Philosophy

For Gassendi, the great promise of the atomist hypothesis is the explanatory power across diverse domains of material phenomena (and the great test, where feasible, is the gathering of empirical evidence on behalf of that hypothesis). Gassendi’s advance here is to develop atomist accounts that are mechanically viable, where none previously existed—whether because prior mechanical approaches were thought inapplicable or because no solutions as such approaches yielded were actually successful.

In what we today think of as chemistry and physics, Gassendi develops a great range of applications for his atomist hypothesis. In his optics, the atomist theory of light provides a counter to Descartes’s view of light as pressure. For Gassendi, light is a property carried by particular atoms (atomi lucificae) that are identical with heat atoms. These tend to travel at greater than average velocity because they generally have fewer obstacles in their paths than most atoms (O I 422a-432b). Sound, too, is particulate, and travels as such particles travel. In contrast to a typical sound-wave view, the surrounding medium does not play an important role: Gassendi takes the velocity of sound particles, like that of light particles, to be invariant with respect to the air or wind in which they travel. In an experiment he models after a similar one of Mersenne’s, he judges the velocity of sound to be 1,473 ft/sec [478 meters/sec] (his calculations are off by 435 ft/sec [146.7 meters/sec]) and invariant to the pitch of the sound (O I 418a-419a). Even planetary motion has an ultimately atomist explanation, as the underlying forces driving the planets are magnetic forces borne by dedicated atoms (this is an atomist modification of a view developed, though later abandoned, by Kepler).

Gassendi’s atomist accounts of chemical phenomena are equally ambitious, suggesting among other things how vapors are created and metals are soluble. Vapors are brought about by increases in the distance between atoms in a liquid volume. Heat atoms remove some of the atoms present in the volume, resulting in a greater percentage of void and the matter taking the form of vapors (O I 398b-399a). As concerns solubility, we account for aqua regia dissolving gold, and aqua fortis dissolving silver, as a result of their complementary atomic structures: gold atoms fit the pores of aqua regia and silver atoms fit the pores of aqua fortis (O II 33b ff, 39a-b).

In the realm of biological phenomena, Gassendi offers greatly diverse accounts drawing on an atomist framework. His most significant proposal in this regard is an account of generation and inheritance in terms of a material ‘soul’ or animula bearing ontogenetic information. In sexual reproduction, two sets of seminal matter and corresponding animulae meet and jointly determine the division, differentiation, and development of matter in the new organism. The determination of inherited traits requires combining or choosing among each parent’s contributions, entailing competition and dominance among the animulae (O II 284b-285a). The animula is defined in terms of its constituent atoms, which must be uniform in order that animulae may operate equivalently across different modes of generation, whether ‘pre-organized’ or spontaneous. Further, Gassendi offers his molecular model as a material means of storing ontogenetic information received from the souls of parent organisms (O II 170b-171a, 280b).

Rather more curious stories are found in his accounts of development, physiology, and behavioral psychology. Thus, the root cause of increased shellfish growth and marrow production during full moons is increased humidity, stemming from the excitement of lunar moisture corpuscles by sunlight. These corpuscles are then transported to the Earth by rays from the sun reflected off the moon (O I 450a-451a). He accounts for toxicological phenomena, such as the stunning capacity of electric rays (torpedine), as emission of corpuscles with a dulling power (O I 454b-455a). Other poisons provoke strange behavior, such as those of the tarantula. These may work by producing activity in the victim sympathetic to the attacker’s activity, a result of chemical alterations the poisons bring about in the victim’s sensory capacities and attunements (O I 456a). As concerns animal psychology, Gassendi endorses Lucretius’s suggestion (RN IV) that lions avoid roosters at dawn because the latter can inject harmful corpuscles into the former’s eyes (O I 453b-454a). Sheep avoid unfamiliar wolves because wolves emit corpuscles of an odor offensive to sheep (O I 456a).

As concerns human psychology, Gassendi offers a materialist (hence ultimately atomist) account of the passions as a function of the vegetative soul, including desire and fear, and motivating pleasure and pain (O II 474f, 495f); these are ultimately governed, however, by the rational and immaterial soul. There are, broadly, any number of cognitive faculties and attributes that may be built out of or be produced by atoms, Gassendi suggests, countering Lactantius’s complaint that the ‘senses, thought, memory, the mind, genius, [or] reason’ cannot so be constructed. As with the passions, though, there are limits. A viable atomist story can be told of sensory phenomena and idea-formation though not reason and its allied phenomena (O I 282b). Yet there is clearly some grey area, as memory in particular seems open to a purely materialist account. Memory loss results from a physical change in the brain resulting from undernourishment; folds in brain matter preserve the physical embodiment of memory, but a deficiency in nutrition leads to the deterioration of those folds (O II 406b-407b; a similar Cartesian view appears in the Treatise on Man (AT XI 177–178)).

7. Materialism, Libertinism, and Ethics

The thoroughgoing nature of Gassendi’s atomism has led numerous commentators from Descartes to Marx to view him as taking all worldly structures and behaviors to be explicable by the interaction of material bodies. According to this picture, Gassendi leaves little if any room for the existence of non-material substance or its relevance to metaphysical or natural accounts. One piece of putative evidence for materialism in Gassendi’s corpus is his extension of atomist explanation, from all physical phenomena to a large range of non-physical phenomena, including aspects of the mental, social, and ethical. This is not entirely compelling, as we have seen that the material underpinnings of our mental apparatuses is relevant to only some portion of his psychology.

A second piece of suggestive evidence for Gassendi’s materialism is historiographical and rhetorical in character. Epicurus and Lucretius were the great ancient materialists, Gassendi is their great early modern exponent, hence Gassendi too was a materialist—his Church-oriented misgivings notwithstanding. This thesis requires thinking of Gassendi as holding closeted views relative to the Church and Holy Writ, and indeed many of his views are highly nuanced in this regard (q.v. his stance on Galileo). It is not clear, however, that Gassendi intends anything other than a carefully delimited set of accounts of materialist ilk, within what he considers to be the proper realm of the physical. Strictly speaking, though, materialism is not a doctrine by degrees, and that Gassendi’s proposed realm of the material extends beyond the reach of other, competing views of his time does not make him a materialist in the pure sense.

A third piece of suggestive evidence was Gassendi’s membership in the group known as the libertins érudits. Other members of this diverse group, on a broad construal, included Guy Patin, Pierre Charron, François Le Vayer La Mothe, Gabriel Naudé, Théophile de Viau, and Cyrano de Bergerac. Molière is also sometimes considered to have belonged to the libertins, and he is thought to have studied under Gassendi’s informal tutelage (Sortais 1922). Gassendi’s ties to the libertins also brought him in contact with a range of other intellectuals and artists—the latter including, most notably, Nicolas Poussin. The libertins, constituting more of a literary salon than the philosophically- and scientifically-oriented Mersenne circle, promoted a morality determined by reason, stripped of theological considerations, and defined on an individualist basis. In their commitment to intellectual liberty, they professed a diverse mix of metaphysical and epistemic views, especially materialism, skepticism, rationalism, deism, and Epicureanism—each party to the group offering a different mix. They were politically and socially savvy enough to promote their libertine views in a manner and style that verges on the secretive. Such secrecy as a guiding stylistic force can be seen in aspects of Gassendi’s writing and rhetorical style, as he frequently makes allusions likely to be understood only by his friends or the equally erudite, constantly draws on expressions from ancient sources to make his own points, and offers a variety of quasi-coded rhetorical elements, most famously including his somewhat hesitant and qualified endorsement of the Copernican model.

Owing to their largely individualist conception of ethics—and in keeping with late Renaissance tradition, the libertins tended to avoid political theory and larger social issues, focusing instead on self-governance and morality understood in terms of character. Gassendi generally follows this conception in his ethics (Sarasohn 1996), though he also outlines a broader political theory (Paganini, 1989–1990). Aside from elements of his ethics and rhetoric, it is an open question as to how much effect Gassendi’s association with the libertins had on his views—or for that matter, how much influence he may have had on them. In one area in particular—obeisance to the Church and its teachings—he diverges significantly from his libertin counterparts. Gassendi routinely emphasizes the sacred nature of Holy Writ and the necessity (as well as benefits) of amending Epicurean thought to meet strictures of accepted dogma. This adherence suggests that Gassendi’s interests in personal responsibility, empirical investigation, and the underlying nature of matter did not signal a consummate atheistic humanism, denial of spiritual activity, or materialism. If anything, one might suppose that his innovative ethics, scientific method, and physics were artificially constrained by his canonical beliefs. A more accurate reading is that he trod a line between Church orthodoxies and the most radical alternatives associated with the mechanical philosophy and early modern ethics, such as we find in Hobbes. Gassendi was a moderate modern thinker, promoting the new against a background of opposition the potential of which he knew quite well.

Though we lack grounds for calling Gassendi a complete materialist moralist, a broad look at his ethics may suggest strong links to his physics, in a Hobbesian manner (Sarasohn 1996). This parallel should not be taken too far: Gassendi and Hobbes diverge in their views of human agency and disagree about our unfettered, non-physically determined capacity for moral deliberation. However, they each accept that pleasure in some way motivates moral choice (though Gassendi also makes allowance for the role of irrational appetite).

Indeed, insofar as Gassendi considers pleasure to be a materially-realized phenomenon, he shares Hobbes’s view of the morally correct as something that can be defined in physical terms. However, according to Gassendi and the lessons he draws from his Epicurean and Stoic sources, any spirtually-related pleasure trumps any materially-related one (O II 710a-b). The truest pleasures—hence goods—are defined along the lines of Epicurean ataraxia (attainment of tranquility) and Christian virtues, including in particular love of God, and friendship and good will among persons. The guarantee of our ability to seek tranquility or fulfill these virtues is our free intellectual judgment (libertas). Such a freedom consists in the ability of our intellects to choose between good and evil, and this is turn yields our capacity for volition, or free will (O II 821b-822b).

Free will and the ability to exercise conscience are also key concepts underlying Gassendi’s views on society and the body politic. Gassendi agrees with Hobbes (and shares a Lucretian inspiration (Sarasohn 1996)) that individuals in a pre-social setting are motivated by fear and desire for betterment, which leads them to join in a commonwealth and concede at least some rights. For Hobbes, this motivation is driven mechanically, and the commonwealth entails foregoing individual rights in return for security. For Gassendi, on the other hand, the motivation is driven by irreducible reasoned consideration, in favor of the stability of social convention. Further, this social contract leaves intact at least those freedoms and liberties which, to begin with, figured in rational choice of the contract over the state of individual insecurity. Gassendi veers from a strict physicalism, proposing that societies are organized by social agreements chosen through operations of the immaterial animus (O II 795a).

8. Space and Time

Even putting aside the framework of atoms and void, the Gassendist ontology poses an alternative to rival Aristotelian and Cartesian views, with respect to space and time. Gassendi’s conception of time and space is absolute. Time flows uniformly irrespective of any motion, and space is uniformly extended regardless of any objects that may be contained within it (O I 183, 285). Indeed, both space and time pre-date Creation, and are infinite in character.

Gassendi borrows heavily on themes set out by earlier Italian space and time theorists, including Campanella, Bruno, Telesio, and Patrizi. One possible advance is suggested by his discussion of such an ontology as a prelude to his matter theory: space and time are pre-conditions for the existence of substance, rather than properties of substances (as the Aristotelians would have it). In this regard, Rochot (1971) proposes that Gassendi’s ontology provides atoms as stable entities and absolute space-time as a stable environment, which together allow for a greater reliability of empirical data hence a greater reliability of our data reception. The notion is that those data have some fixity at the source, at least, given that the space-time environment that contains material elements giving rise to such data are unbended by relativistic position to anything else. Naturally, such fixity would be only a necessary condition, and even fails to provide guarantees at the level of basic sensory data, which Gassendi recognizes in his discussion of the Skepticist tropes.

Gassendi’s notion of non-relative space stands in direct contrast to the Cartesian plenist account, which suggests that space just is place, as defined by the extension of the resident (and universal) matter. This contrast bears a clear result relative to matter theory: Descartes is locked into a view of matter as infinitely divisible, in order to account for the absence of void or, what amounts to the same thing, the omnipresence of matter. Gassendi, on the other hand, is free to pose the existence of atoms and the void, where matter is located in space but is neither defined by nor definitive of that space.

9. Logic

Broadly speaking, Gassendi expresses some three notions of logic in the Syntagma. The first, enunciated in the history of logic section that appears immediately prior to the Institutio Logica, suggests a picture of logic along heuristic and didactic lines, in the manner of Ramus, whose theory Gassendi lauds as a guide to organizing and presenting existing knowledge (O I 59a-62b). The second suggests that logic consists in the Aristotelian syllogistic, the understanding thereof, and related methodological concerns. The third suggests that logic consists in the study and use of causal reasoning, and related methodological concerns—most notably including an exposition of regressus demonstrativa theory in the manner of Zabarella and Nifo (this notion expressly contradicts his Exercitationes view that such causal reasoning cannot be justified). These latter two notions yield the main thrust of the Institutio (though the discussion of demonstration in Book IV has clear Ramist debts). They also have great currency for Gassendi, who typically crafts his use of syllogism and causal inference and method after his Institutio conceptions, or at least signals that he intends to do so. The same may not be said for his Ramist conception. For although he makes ample use of rhetoric, he does not turn to definition, distribution, or division for the purposes of diagramming or expounding existing knowledge—per the logic of Ramus—in any way that matches his interest in the traditionally Aristotelian conception of analysis as problem-solving.

It has been suggested that a fourth notion—a psychologistic account of cognitive operations, and perception in particular—is a prominent goal of Gassendi’s logic (Michael, 1997). While such discussion forms part of the Institutio presentation, it is by no means the main goal of the work or of Gassendi’s conception of logic. This can be seen from the thrust and length of his discussion of the first three elements, and in particular syllogistic and causal reasoning, and their attendant methodologies.

10. The Scientific Endeavor: Astronomy, Optics, and Mechanics

Gassendi’s science is philosophically noteworthy in the way that Descartes’ or Kepler’s science is, drawing on a robust set of views on the nature of the world and what we know of it. His scientific work in astronomy, optics, and mechanics is of particular import in suggesting how we should pursue a purely empirical picture of the world, within the limitations of our sensory access and the constraints of tradition.

The principal elements of Gassendi’s astronomy include a global embrace of empirical method, advanced instrumentation, and measurement, an interest in unusual celestial phenomena, and a partially masked defense of Copernicanism. His embrace of an empiricist astronomy can be gauged by his voluminous recorded observations—some presumably with the telescope lenses sent by his friend Galileo—carried out in concert with a league of fellow observers strung across Europe and the Near East. A primary goal of these recorded observations was to confirm and extend the Rudolphine Tables, the project set up by Tycho Brahe and completed by Kepler, to facilitate calculation of the planet’s positions (which goal in itself suggests Gassendi’s adherence to a Keplerian heliocentrism). Another facet of Gassendi’s empiricist astronomy was his denunciation of astrology as crafted independent of any ideas from the senses, impervious to correction by experiment or observation, and thus as failing to qualify as natural or experiential knowledge. This view brought him into direct and bitter conflict with Jean-Baptiste Morin, who also suspected Gassendi of an arch-Copernicanism that was not only against Church teaching but would obviate the astrological structures central to Morin’s theories. Gassendi’s close interests in observation also led to employing the camera obscura to gauge variations in the apparent diameter of the moon—in accordance with its orbit of the Earth and the apparent diameter of the Sun. Further, in his work with Peiresc, Gassendi tackled the problem of determining longitude by reference to lunar eclipses, later working towards this goal with Claude Mellan on the first effort to chart the moon.

Gassendi’s interests in unusual celestial phenomena dates back as early as 1621, when he observed the colorful illumination of the sky and dubbed these lights ‘aurora borealis’. Based on his correspondence with observers as far away as the Levant, he located the source of the illumination at very high altitude, above the Northern Polar region. In 1629, he observed the rare phenomenon of parhelia, or false suns, which he explained in his Parhelia seu soles…, in terms of the reflection of sunlight by ice or snow crystals at high altitude. This account, shown to be accurate in the nineteenth century, relies on the views of Gassendi and Peiresc—based on their microscopical observations—that crystal formations of snow and ice are highly reflective. The great triumph of Gassendi’s scanning of the skies was his observation of Mercury’s transit before the Sun (1631), the first such recorded observation and a confirmation of Kepler’s prediction of the planetary orbits in accordance with the Three Laws. This confirmation in turn enabled the subsequent calculations (Halley and Gallet, 1677) of the distance between the Earth, the Sun, and the other planets.

The most controversial element of Gassendi’s astronomy concerns whether, and to what extent, he may be counted as a defender of Galileo and the Copernican view. There is little question that he sympathized with Galileo, and that he was fully aware of the merits of Copernicanism, at times defending the view and some of its main planks openly. Yet he was also clearly concerned with allegiance to Holy Writ as interpreted by the Church, and to this end offers a Church-friendly account of the condemnation that focuses not on the underlying heliocentrism but on particularities of the Galilean model (O V 60b). His considered judgment is that the Tychean model is preferable to the Ptolemaic model, but also to the Copernican model—in the latter case simply because the heliocentric picture does not fit with Church teachings. He hastens to suggest, however, that those teachings are themselves warranted by our own current empirical evidence—the implication being that such truths and the concomitant rejection of Copernicanism might well be revisable.

Closely related to Gassendi’s interests in astronomy are a number of issues in optics, where he sought to articulate a physiological model of vision and a physical model of light. In so doing, Gassendi contributed to early modern efforts that would eventuate in distinguishing these two ends of traditional optics.

His integrated optics model follows an Epicurean and Lucretian intromission view, that vision is a function of rays of light atoms or image-bearing atoms that are received by our internal apparatus for vision. The structure of this apparatus was of great concern to Gassendi and his early collaborator on naturalist projects, Peiresc. The premise of their work was that Kepler was largely correct in postulating an optical image that gathers many rays into a coherent representation in the eye, focused on the retina by the crystalline lens. What troubled Gassendi and Peiresc, however, was the notion that such an image as cast upon the retina would be inverted, leaving the problem of identifying how we see the world as right-side up. Seeking a physiological solution—as against any psychological capacity that rights the inverted image—they suggested that the retina itself acts as a mirror which rights the inverted image projected upon it.

Another aspect of this integrated approach to optics was a reliance on internal perceptual phenomena to account for external phenomena regarding appearances, illusory or otherwise. This was not a universally-held view, even in the age of the optics of light and vision. In addition to Gassendi’s interest in parhelia, he also sought to explain apparent discrepancies in the size of the sun and moon at different hours by reference to visual experience produced by light phenomena (De apparente magnitudine…, 1642). Thus, these bodies appear larger on the horizon than at their apogee because the pupil dilates from the differential exposure to the light at the horizon. (In fact, all such apparent differences are produced by the distance effect of surface features of the area from which the celestial body is viewed.) One key driver of such an appeal to the interaction of light behavior and our visual apparatuses is Gassendi’s view that some explanatory role must be played here by the common atomic structure underlying the images intromitted into our eyes and the light rays cast by celestial bodies which are understood as creating such images.

Gassendi’s mechanics shows the strong influence of the Galilean programme. He addresses the law of free-fall twice, first in a faulty treatment in De Motu (1642), and next in corrected fashion in De proportione qua gravia decidentia accelerantur (1646). In the earlier work, Gassendi focuses on forces compelling the falling body, which he takes to comprise the attractive force of magnetism and the propelling force of air behind the falling body. This combination of forces, he suggests, allows for the Galilean law that the distance traveled by bodies in free-fall is proportional to the time of fall squared. However, Gassendi mistakenly takes increases in velocity and in distances to be equivalent, leading him to manufacture a false need for greater velocity attained than what would be produced by the attractive forces alone. In De Proportione, he acknowledges this error, amends his calculations, and retreats to a causal account that rests on the single force of the terrestrial magnetic attraction. This is not one of Gassendi’s empirical triumphs, though—in neither work does he make any specific reference to observations or experiments.

One notable success in the experimental domain is his performance of the Galilean test of dropping a stone from the mast of a moving ship, recorded in De Motu. Once dropped, Gassendi shows, the stone conserves its horizontal speed (equal to that of the ship, before being released) and its motion describes a parabola given its downward fall. This result successfully refutes one simple anti-Copernican argument, by showing that the Earth can move without superadding motion to terrestrial objects otherwise in motion (which superaddition, opponents of Copernicanism correctly maintained, would generate much havoc in the motion of terrestrial objects). This much Galileo surmised in his original thought experiment, though the performance was excellent publicity for the Galilean perspective and an opportunity for Gassendi to think through the issues at stake.

In this regard, Gassendi was able to take a step beyond Galileo’s conclusions, drawing from this test a generalized principle of inertia (the Galilean version of inertia was fundamentally circular, given that bodies in motion would trace the earth’s curve). Gassendi saw that the motion of the dropped stone at a sustained speed—in the absence of any contrary force or obstacle—is an instance of inertial motion, albeit one where the motion is compositional (describing the parabola). Indeed, neither compositionality nor directionality had any impact on inertial motion, Gassendi concluded: any body set in motion in any direction continues, unless impeded, in rectilinear path.

Other accomplishments in physics included a compelling measurement of the speed of sound (showing that sound travels at the same speed, no matter the nature of its pitch), and the first satisfactory interpretation of the Pascalian barometry experiment. In his account of the Puy-de-Dôme experiment, Gassendi proposes that variations in air pressure are relative to atmospheric conditions and altitude, as the air is an elastic gas. He also suggests that this experiment (which he repeats at Toulon in 1650) shows that created vacuum is possible, at least as accumulated among part of the air particles in the instrument ‘sealed’ by the mercury column in the experimental apparatus. In establishing the elasticity of air as a gas and accumulated void as a result of particle displacement, Gassendi evokes his ontology of atoms and the void.

11. Impact and Influence

Gassendi’s views were often transmitted in the early modern era through the medium of François Bernier’s Abrégé (1678/84), which work highlights the atomist views and materialist tendencies of Gassendism. Such themes, as well as empiricist threads of Gassendism, were attractive to a number of late seventeenth century physicists and physicians (viz. Nicholas de Blégny, Guy Patin, Antoine Menjot, and Guillaume Lamy) and other philosophers (viz. Gilles de Launay), as well as those among the Montmor circle or libertins érudits (viz. Samuel Sorbière, Jean Chapelain, and Cyrano de Bergerac). Still others, especially Cartesians such as Desgabets and Cordemoy, were rather distasteful of those themes, as were hard-line theologians such as Louis Le Valois.

As Lennon (1993), Brockliss (1997), and others have noted, Gassendi’s overall influence in the French education system was not a match for the Cartesian alternatives, and his views were considered especially unworthy after his atomist views gained currency in England.

The British success of Gassendism had three textual sources. In addition to the Opera Omnia and Bernier’s Abrégé, Walter Charleton produced a selective and amended English translation of parts of the Animadversiones, intermingled with other sources and his own perspectives (1654). There was as well a group of atomist enthusiasts in the Newcastle Circle, and a small existing British Epicurean club, whose members included Kenelm Digby and Nathaniel Highmore. This backdrop of sympathetic sources, not entirely faithful to the original, allowed a substantial and diffuse influence of Gassendi’s views in British thought. We see Gassendism shaping the work of lesser figures such as Francis Glisson (who embraced a vis motrix) and Thomas Willis (who crafted a materialist theory of neural transmission based on Gassendi’s view (Wallace 2003)) but also such major thinkers as Boyle, Locke, Newton, Hume, and Reid. Those sources of influence themselves were sufficiently diffuse that it is difficult to make precise Gassendi’s imprint on these later authors, except where they explicitly acknowledge their debts.

Boyle finds Gassendi’s thinking agreeable in three respects. First, he embraces Gassendi’s criticism of Descartes’ ontological argument as rooted in an assumption as to the nature of God impervious to proof. Second, he follows in the Gassendist model of placing empiricism and experiment at the center of a viable scientific method. Third, he praises Gassendi’s corpuscularian theory as a worthy ontology for the mechanical model of explanation, hastening to add that further experimentation should give sufficient demonstration of the verity of atomism. Indeed, he refuses to judge between the Gassendist and Cartesian alternatives, presumably on the grounds that we cannot produce evidence to decide the issue of matter’s infinite divisibility.

As Locke is concerned, it is by now well established that he may have read Gassendi directly, and almost certainly read Bernier. The evidence of influence shows up in some central Lockean theses: the corpuscularian philosophy (here he follows Boyle as surely as he does Gassendi), primary and secondary qualities distinction (a view also held by Boyle, Descartes, Galileo, and others still), and broad commitment to empiricism, including the negative thesis against innate ideas and the positive thesis identifying sensory data as the primary source of ideas. We also see Gassendi’s likely inspiration in Locke’s probabilist embrace of an understanding of natural philosophy through less-than-certain claims about the world, though his sub-par ranking of ‘sensitive apprehension’ of the world is a rejection of the Gassendist picture of sensory knowledge as the best for which we might hope. Locke’s theory of language, too, reveals Gassendi’s influence: the notion of nominal essences resonates with the proposal in the Institutio Logica that the meaning of general terms is a function of our sensory-based ideas, which contribute to our picture of the properties we typically associate with the objects of those terms. Finally, in regard to ethics, Locke offers a perfectly Gassendist linkage between good and evil on the one hand and pleasure and pain on the other, and like Gassendi celebrates the notion of personal autonomy, though he locates the seat of moral judgment in external norms (most prominently, the natural law) rather than any internal ideals or virtues such as Gassendi upholds.

Newton reveals various interests in Gassendist themes, dating to an early reading in his student days (see the Trinity Notebooks). For one, he adopts the notion that Aristotelian substance and accident fail to define all existents, and (along with Barrow, who likely read Gassendi as well) suggests that absolute space and time represent the fundamental ontological framework into which matter and its phenomena are located. For another, he espouses a form of the mechanical philosophy, albeit one that departs from orthodoxy (as pronounced by Gassendi) in that God plays a significant and sustained role in determining the course of natural phenomena. Here he follows Gassendi’s thought most closely in admitting atoms to his ontology, nearly replicating Gassendi’s list of atomic properties, proposing that atomic structures yield chemical bonds that account for the structures of larger bodies, and endorsing the Gassendist notion of light as flowing in a stream of atoms (in opposition to the Cartesian wave theory promoted by Hooke and Huygens). In the spirit of Boyle, though, Newton tends to treat his matter theory as instrumentally useful rather than as a universal hypothesis in search of further instances. In this way he hopes to avoid the hard questions about our ability to summon empirical verification of their existence or precise character. One famous Newtonian methodological dictum indicates there are aspects of atoms we can know, however. In the Principia (1687), Newton suggests a transdictive principle of Gassendist provenance (also embraced by Locke), according to which the basic properties of bodies on the micro-scale (“the least particles of all bodies”) may be inferred from such properties of bodies as we have evidence of, on the macro-scale.

Hume is less interested in affirming ontologies than in showing why we have no good reason to invest belief in them, and accordingly picks up on the rather different Gassendist theme of coming to terms with the ancient Skeptics. His moderate or constructive skepticism (pace Popkin) is founded on doubts concerning the possibility of justified belief, focusing on the problem of induction as the great difficulty undercutting our ability to know about the world. Lacking rational justification, we simply fall back on induction as a practicable means of grasping and managing our experience of events. Here we see a striking similarity with Gassendi’s assessment—beginning with the observation that justifying any generalization on particulars requires something beyond our cognitive powers, namely, our empirical knowledge of all such particulars. From this point, Hume draws the Gassendist lesson that induction cannot be demonstrative, for lack of this generalization step or the supposition “that apart from those enumerated there occurs none which is different” (O I (Institutio Logica) 113a). Finally, Hume’s proposed resolution also resembles Gassendi’s notion that we might simply posit, as a matter of utility, the conformity of all remaining unenumerated particulars.

Into the late eighteenth century, we see Gassendi’s influence in Reid’s theory of external knowledge. This theory is centered on the notion of what he calls ‘suggestion’, or the evincing in us by our sensory data of concepts corresponding to the qualities of things in the world. In its broad sense, ‘suggestion’ consists in a signing relationship—as a matter of convention, custom, or biology—between things or events in the world which may be construed as signs (in the case of conventional signs, these may be linguistic or symbolic entities) and what those things or events signify. Here Reid draws on the long tradition of theories of signs, likely relying in this instance on Gassendi in particular, relative to the distinction between conventional (‘artificial’) and customary and biological (‘natural’).

Gassendi’s influence spread further still, beyond Britain or the modern era. The young Leibniz consciously followed Gassendi in embracing atomism, later retaining high regard for mechanism but abandoning the material model of substance in favor of the monadology (Moll 1982). Christiaan Huygens pursued numerous Gassendist themes, including anti-Aristotelianism, probabilism, a method of hypothesis, and atomist matter theory. Gassendi’s libertine, atomist, empiricist, and quasi-heliocentrist views also met with keen interest further afield, among like-minded philosophers and natural scientists in early modern Poland, Italy, and Spain (Murr, 1997). In more recent times, Gassendi would come to be seen as anticipating such notable views as Mill’s proposal that mathematical knowledge is empirical, and Popper’s notion that empirical falsifiability is a test of a hypothesis’ prima facie viability.

12. Recent Commentary on Gassendi

The precise place of Gassendi in the history of early modern philosophy and science is only partly articulated by recent scholarship, which has tended to focus on one aspect or another of his thought, and to portray Gassendi primarily as an opponent of one or another contemporary, to the neglect of his positive theses. The laudable goal of such contextualist studies is to demonstrate his key role in important debates of the era, yet the picture that emerges from deliberation on these commentaries is rather Gassendi’s relative eclipse by other figures, notably Descartes. For example, one historical approach (Brundell, 1987) highlights a strong anti-Aristotelian strain which guides Gassendi’s earlier criticisms of the Scholastics as well as his later Epicurean works. From this perspective, Gassendi may be seen as fighting the same battles as Descartes, and losing in any such comparison because he engages his foes with generally lesser flash and apparently less sophisticated, or at least less novel, weaponry. Another common approach (Joy, 1987; Darmon, 1998; Mazauric, 1998; Taussig, 2001 and 2003) is to emphasize historicist and rhetorical elements of Gassendi’s method, as employed in his conversations and correspondence with members of the Mersenne circle. Gassendi’s role in that context was by no means marginal, and it is impossible to downplay the centrality of that circle in early modern scientific debate. Yet the most important figure to this group was not actually an active participant in it, and this was Descartes. Mersenne, of course, is the other core personality in this context, and so Gassendi by default is at best a third. Gassendi perhaps fares worst in comparison with Descartes in recent discussions of their direct conflict over the Meditations, where Gassendi’s anti-Cartesian views are presented as a prism through which we may best perceive the spectrum of his views (Osler 1994, Lennon 1993, Grene and Ariew 1995). There is undoubtedly a case to be made that he represents the most prominent alternative to Descartes in his times. However, highlighting this story encourages the view that Gassendi deserves no more than footnote status and emphasizes, at least historically speaking, his role as the losing alternative.

Another fashion has it that Gassendi’s doctrinal beliefs form the foundation of, or otherwise influence, his philosophical and scientific views. One such perspective suggests that his spiritual concerns and materialist ontology jointly shape the character of his metaphysics—leading to irresolvable internal conflict (Bloch 1971, Sortais 1922). Another perspective has it that his theological views, and specifically his voluntarism, lead him to his empiricism (Osler 1994, Sarasohn 1996). But it is not clear that Gassendi is best understood as laboring in service of a doctrinal credo, or as motivating his philosophical views by appeal to his theological sensibility. He indeed tailors his Epicurean views to meet theological constraints and endorses the only astronomical world-view he believes acceptable to the Church, that of Tycho Brahe. Yet Gassendi’s definitive criterion for any physical, metaphysical, or epistemological thesis is approximation to the truth, which is empirically-determined. On the other hand, some theologically inspired claims are woven into the fabric of his metaphysics and psychology. For example, there are two souls, one sensitive and the other spiritual, and the latter is required in order to satisfy religious demands for an immortal unity attached to, but not susceptible to the fate of, the material body. But in such cases Gassendi is generally clear about non-philosophical motives, introducing such corrections or additions to his reasoned or empirically demonstrated views as are necessary by the dictates of faith or Scripture. He frequently defends the primacy of Roman Catholicism and faith over natural reason (O I 5a, O I 49a, O II 237a-b) yet easily distinguishes between objects of scientific and theological investigation and reflection (O III (De Proportione) 636a). To suggest that he arrives at the core tenets of his metaphysics or epistemology in order to draw out the ultimate consequences of his theology thereby misconstrues his broad philosophical motives as well as his particular reflective and investigative strategies.

By contrast, another element of recent scholarship highlights Gassendi’s philosophical motivations and strategies in sensu strictu. In the years during and following the Second World War, Bernard Rochot began this trend by bringing to light numerous lesser-known texts as well as the manuscript background to Gassendist atomism. More recently, Fred and Emily Michael have called attention to empiricist sources and features of Gassendi’s psychology and epistemology. Others offering assessments of Gassendi’s views in similarly strict philosophical terms include Wolfgang Detel, Marco Messeri, and Antonia LoLordo. In this interpretive tradition, Richard Popkin elegantly poses the global character of the empiricism linking Gassendist philosophy and science. Popkin (1967) ties together two central facets of Gassendi’s thought, proposing that the ‘constructive skepticism’ at the core of his epistemology is an attempt (among other things) to show how to have an atomist science—through inferences based on our data concerning appearances.

The starting point of Gassendi’s philosophy, in Popkin’s view, is skepticism about knowledge of essences, mitigated by allowance for warranted beliefs about appearances and causal knowledge to which we are entitled just because it helps us to make sense of beliefs about appearances. Among the intriguing elements of Popkin’s assessment is the suggestion that Gassendi promotes an early prototype of inference to the best explanation (IBE), defending atomism by appealing to its explanatory value. Gassendi’s strategy is a bit more complicated, for he cannot grant that the evidence could be equally compelling for all competing theses, given his view that atomism is the physical thesis which best makes intelligible our experiential data to begin with. The underlying methodological suggestion is that, in considering among physical theses, the way we understand and interpret correlative data about appearances may depend on which such thesis we are entertaining. In calling attention to Gassendi’s appeal to IBE, Popkin identifies a principal challenge in binding together principal themes of Gassendi’s corpus, how to be an atomist and a thoroughgoing empiricist at once (Fisher 2005).

Bibliography

Gassendi’s Principal Works

  • Exercitationes paradoxicae adversus aristoteleos, in quibus praecipua totius peripateticae doctrinae fundamenta excutiuntur, opiniones vero aut novae, aut ex vetustioribus obsoletae stabiliuntur, auctore Petro Gassendo. Grenoble: Pierre Verdier, 1624 [Book One]; Lyon: Laurent Anisson and Jean Baptiste Devenet, 1658 [Book Two].
  • Epistolica exercitatio, in qua principia philosophiae Roberti Flvddi medici reteguntur; et ad recentes illius libros, aduersus r.p.f. Marinvm Mersennvm ordinis minimorum Sancti Francisci de Paula scriptos, respondetur. Cum appendice aliquot obseruationum coelestium. Paris: Sebastian Cramoisy, 1630.
  • Parhelia, sive soles quatuor, qui circa verum apparuerunt Romæ, die xx. mensis Martij, anno 1629: et de eisdem Petri Gassendi ad Henricum Renerium epistola. Paris: Antoine Vitré, 1630.
  • Mercvrivs in sole visvs, et Venvs invisa Parisiis, anno 1631: pro voto, & admonitione Keppleri. Paris: Sebastian Cramoisy, 1632.
  • Viri illvstris Nicolai Clavdii Fabricii de Peiresc, senatoris aqvisextiensis vita. Paris: Sebastian Cramoisy, 1641.
  • De motu impresso a motore translato. Epistolæ duæ. In quibus aliquot præcipuæ tum de motu vniuersè, tum speciatim de motu terræattributo difficulatates explicantur. Paris: Louis de Heuqueville, 1642.
  • De apparente magnitvdine solis hvmilis et svblimis epistolae qvatvor: in qvibvs complvra physica, opticaque problemata proponuntur, & explicantur. Paris: Louis de Heuqueville, 1642.
  • Disquisitio metaphysica. seu, Dubitationes et instantiæ adversus Renati Cartesii Metaphysicam, & responsa. Amsterdam: Johann Blaev, 1644.
  • Oratio inavgvralis habita in Regio collegio die nouembris xxiii. Paris: Louis de Heuqueville, 1645.
  • De proportione, qva gravia decidentia accelerantvr epistolae tres: quibus ad totidem epistolas R.P. Petri Cazraei Societatis Iesv respondetur. Paris: Louis de Heuqueville, 1646.
  • De vita et moribus Epicuri libri octo. Lyons: Guillaume Barbier, 1647.
  • Institvtio astronomica, iuxta hypothesis tam vetervm, qvam Copernici, et Tychonis. Dictata à Petro Gassendo … Eivsdem oratio inauguralis iteratò edita. Paris: Louis de Heuqueville, 1647.
  • Syntagma philosophiae Epicuri cum refutationibus dogmatum quae contra fidem christianam ab eo asserta sunt. Lyon: Guillaume Barbier, 1649
  • Apologia in Io. Bap. Morini librum, cui titulus, Alae tellvris fractae: epistola IV. de Motu impresso a Motore translato. Vnà cum tribus Galilaei Epistolis de conciliatione … nune primùm M. Nevraei cura prodeunt. Lyon: Guillaume Barbier, 1649.
  • Animadversiones in decimum librum Diogenis Laertii: qui est De vita, moribus, placitisque Epicuri. Continent autem Placita, quas ille treis statuit Philosophiae parteis 3 I. Canonicam, …; – II. Physicam, …; – III. Ethicam, … Lyon: Guillaume Barbier, 1649.
  • Opera omnia… haetenus edita auctor ante obitum recensuit… posthuma vero, totius naturae explicationem complectentia, in lucem nunc primum prodeunt ex bibliotheca… Henrici-Ludovici-Haberti Mon-Morii… [Accessit Samuelis Sorberii praefatio, in qua de vita et moribus Petri Gassendi disseritur.] Lyon: Laurent Anisson and Jean Baptiste Devenet, 1658

Early Translation and Commentary

  • François Bernier. Abrégé de la philosophie de Gassendi. Lyon : Anisson, Posuel et Rigaud, 1684. Reprint edition. Sylvia Murr et Geneviève Stefani, eds. Paris : Fayard, 1992.
  • Walter Charleton. Physiologia Epicuro-Gassendo-Charltoniana, or, A fabrick of science natural, upon the hypothesis of atoms founded by Epicurus, repaired [by] Petrus Gassendus ; augmented [by] Walter Charleton. London : Printed by Tho. Newcomb for Thomas Heath…, 1654.

Modern Editions and Translations

  • Exercitationes Paradoxicae Adversus Aristoteleos (1624). Ed. and trans. Bernard Rochot. Paris: J. Vrin, 1959.
  • Disquisitio Metaphysica (1644). Ed. and trans. Bernard Rochot. Paris: J. Vrin, 1964. Cited above as ‘R’.
  • Opera Omnia. Six Volumes. Reproduction of 1658 Edition with introduction by Tullio Gregory, Stuttgart-Bad Cannstatt: Friedrich Frommann Verlag, 1964. Cited above as ‘O’.
  • Pierre Gassendi’s Institutio Logica 1658: a critical edition with translation and introduction. Ed. and trans. Howard Jones. Assen, The Netherlands: Van Gorcum, 1981.
  • Selected Works. Trans. Craig Brush. (Texts in Early Modern Philosophy). New York: Johnson Reprints, 1972. Cited above as ‘B’.
  • Pierre Gassendi (1592–1655): Lettres Latines. Two volumes. [Book VI (Latin correspondence) of Opera Omnia.] Trans. Sylvie Taussig. Turnhout: Brepols, 2004.
  • Pierre Gassendi, Du principe efficient, c’est-à-dire des causes des choses (Syntagma philosophicum. Physique, Section I, Livre IV). Trans. Sylvie Taussig. Turnhout: Brepols, 2006.
  • Pierre Gassendi, De la liberté, de la fortune, du destin et de la divination (Syntagma Philosophicum, Éthique, Livre III). Trans. Sylvie Taussig. Turnhout: Brepols, 2008.
  • Pierre Gassendi, Le principe matériel, c’est-à-dire la matière première des choses (Syntagma philosophicum, Physique, Section I, Livre III). Trans. Sylvie Taussig. Turnhout: Brepols 2009.
  • Gassendi, La Logique de Carpentras. Trans. Sylvie Taussig. Turnhout: Brepols, 2012.

Secondary Sources

Selected Books and Collections of Articles

  • Centre international de synthèse, 1955. Pierre Gassendi, sa vie et son oeuvre, Paris.
  • Bellis, Delphine, Daniel Garber, and Carla Rita Palmerino (eds.), 2023. Pierre Gassendi. Humanism, Science, and the Birth of Modern Philosophy, New York and London: Routledge.
  • Bloch, Olivier, 1971. La philosophie de Gassendi. Nominalisme, matérialisme et métaphysique, La Haye: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • Brundell, Barry, 1987. Pierre Gassendi: from Aristotelianism to a new natural philosophy, Dordrecht; Boston: D. Reidel.
  • Chalmers, Alan, 2009. The Scientist’s Atom and the Philosopher’s Stone: How Science Succeeded and Philosophy Failed to Gain Knowledge of Atoms (Boston Studies in the Philosophy of Science 279), Dordrecht: Springer.
  • Darmon, Jean-Charles, 1998. Philosophie Épicurienne et Littérature au XVIIè Siècle en France: Études sur Gassendi, Cyrano de Bergerac, La Fontaine, Saint-Evremond, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
  • Detel, Wolfgang, 1978. Scientia Rerum Natura Occultarum: Methodologische Studien zur Physik Pierre Gassendis, Berlin; New York: De Gruyter.
  • Fisher, Saul, 2005. Pierre Gassendi’s Philosophy and Science, Leiden; Boston: Brill.
  • Gregory, Tullio, 1961. Scetticismo ed empirismo: Studio su Gassendi, Bari: Laterza.
  • Grene, Marjorie and Roger Ariew (eds.), 1995. Descartes and His Contemporaries: Meditations, Objections, and Replies, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Herrera Balboa, Samuel, 2019. Pierre Gassendi. El Proyecto de una Filosofia de la Naturaleza, Barcelona: Herder Editorial.
  • Joy, Lynn Sumida, 1987. Gassendi the Atomist: Advocate of History in an Age of Science, Cambridge; New York: Cambridge University Press.
  • Lennon, Thomas M., 1993. The Battle of Gods and Giants: The Legacies of Descartes and Gassendi, 1655–1715, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • LoLordo, Antonia, 2007. Pierre Gassendi and the Birth of Early Modern Philosophy, Cambridge; New York: Cambridge University Press.
  • Mazauric, Simone, 1998. Gassendi, Pascal, et la Querelle du Vide, Paris: Presses Universitaires du France.
  • Messeri, Marco, 1985. Causa e Spiegazione: la Fisica di Pierre Gassendi, Milan: F. Angeli.
  • Moll, Konrad, 1982. Der junge Leibniz II. Des Übergang vom Atomismus zu einem mechanistischen Aristotelismus: der revidierte Anschluß an Pierre Gassendi), Stuttgart-Bad Cannstatt: Fromann-Holzboog.
  • Murr, Sylvia (ed.), 1997. Gassendi et L’Europe (1592–1792), Paris: J. Vrin.
  • Osler, Margaret J., 1994. Divine Will and the Mechanical Philosophy: Gassendi and Descartes on Contingency and Necessity in the Created World, Cambridge; New York: Cambridge University Press.
  • Popkin, Richard, 2003 [1960, 1979], The History of Scepticism: From Savonarola to Bayle, revised and expanded edition, Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press.
  • Rochot, Bernard, 1944. Les travaux de Gassendi sur Epicure et sur l’atomisme, 1619–1658, Paris.
  • Sortais, Gaston, 1922. La Philosophie Moderne depuis Bacon jusqu’à Leibniz: Études Historiques, Paris: P. Lethielleux.
  • Sarasohn, Lisa T., 1996. Gassendi’s Ethics, Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press.
  • Sorell Tom, G. A .J. Rogers, and Jill Kraye (eds.), 2009. Scientia in Early Modern Philosophy: Seventeenth-Century Thinkers on Demonstrative Knowledge from First Principles (Studies in History and Philosophy of Science 24) Dordrecht: Springer.
  • Taussig, Sylvie (trans., intro, annot.), 2001. Pierre Gassendi: Vie et Mœurs d’Épicure, Paris: Éditions Alive.
  • Taussig, Sylvie, 2003. Pierre Gassendi (1592–1655): Introduction à la Vie Savante, Turnhout, Belgium: Brepols.
  • Taussig, Sylvie (ed.), 2008. Gassendi et la Modernité (Les styles du savoir 7), Turnhout, Belgium: Brepols.
  • Wilson, Catherine, 2008. Epicureanism at the Origins of Modernity, Oxford; New York: Oxford University Press.

Biographies

  • Taussig, Sylvie, 2003. Pierre Gassendi (1592–1655). Introduction à la vie savante, Turnhout: Brepols.
  • Jones, Howard, 1981. Pierre Gassendi (1592–1655): An Intellectual Biography, Nieuwkoop: B. de Graaf.
  • Bougerel Joseph, 1970. Vie de Pierre Gassendi, prévot de l’église de Digne et Professeur de Mathématiques au Collège Royal, Paris: Jacques Vincent, 1737; Geneva: Slatkine Reprint.

Bibliographies

  • Bloch, Olivier and Thomas Lennon, 1993. “Gassendi, Gassendismus, Libertinismus”, in Jean-Pierre Schobinger (ed.), Grundriss der Geschichte der Philosophie. Die Philosophie des 17. Jahrhunderts, Band 2: Frankreich und Niederlande, Basel: Schwabe & Co.

Dedicated Journal Issues

  • XVIIe siècle (Journée d’étude de la Société d’étude du XVIIe siècle) 233 (2006) 4: “Pierre Gassendi”.

Selected Articles or Essays Not Appearing in Collections Listed Above

  • Alexandrescu, Vlad, 2013. “Regius and Gassendi on the Human Soul”, Intellectual History Review, 23: 433–452.
  • Begley, Justin, 2023. “Pierre Gassendi (1592–1655): Vegetarianism and the Beatific Vision”, in Andrew Linzey and Clair Linzey (eds.), Animal Theologians, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press, 25–43.
  • Bloch, Olivier René, 1966. “Gassendi critique de Descartes”, Revue Philosophique de la France et de l’Etranger, 156: 217–236.
  • Bloch, A.G., 1963. “Pierre Gassendi and his Scientific Expedition of 1640”, Archives internationales d’histoire des sciences, 63: 133–134.
  • Forgie, J. William, 2007. “Gassendi and Kant on Existence”, Journal of the History of Philosophy, 45: 511–523.
  • Galluzzi, Paolo, 2000. “Gassendi and l’Affaire Galilée of the Laws of Motion”, Science in Context, 13: 509–545.
  • Garau, Rodolfo, 2021. “Who was the Founder of Empiricism After All? Gassendi and the ‘Logic’ of Bacon”, Perspectives on Science, 29: 327–354.
  • Johnson, M. R., 2003. “Was Gassendi an Epicurean?”, History of Philosophy Quarterly, 20: 339–360.
  • LoLordo, Antonia, 2005. “Gassendi on Human Knowledge of the Mind”, Archiv für Geschichte die Philosophie, 87: 1–22.
  • Michael, Fred, 1997. “Why Logic Became Epistemology: Gassendi, Port Royal, and the Reformation in Logic”, in Logic and the Workings of the Mind: The Logic of Ideas and Faculty Psychology in Early Modern Philosophy (North American Kant Society Studies in Philosophy 5), ed. Patricia A. Easton, Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview Publishing Company, 1–20.
  • Michael, Emily and Fred S. Michael, 1989. “Two Early Modern Concepts of Mind: Reflecting Substance vs. Thinking Substance,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 27: 29–48.
  • Michael, Emily and Fred S. Michael, 1991. “Hierarchy and Early Empiricism,” in Antifoundationalism Old and New, ed. Beth Singer and Tom Rockmore, Philadelphia: Temple University Press.
  • Paganini, Gianni, 1989–1990. “Epicurisme et philosophie au XVIIe Siècle, Convention, Utilité et Droit selon Gassendi”, Studi Filosofici, XII–XIII: 5–45.
  • Palmerino, Carla Rita, 2004. “Gassendi’s Reinterpretation of the Galilean Theory of Tides”, Perspectives on Science, 12: 212–237.
  • Popkin, Richard, 1967. “Gassendi, Pierre,” in The Encyclopedia of Philosophy, ed. Paul Edwards, New York: Macmillan and the Free Press, Volume 3, 269–273.
  • Rochot, Bernard, 1971. “Pierre Gassendi”, Dictionary of Scientific Biography, ed. Charles S. Gillespie, New York: Scribner.
  • Sakamoto, Kuni, 2009. “The German Hercules’s Heir: Pierre Gassendi’s Reception of Keplerian Ideas”, Journal of the History of Ideas, 70: 69–91.
  • Willis, Wes, 2003. “The Vibrating Nerve Impulse in Newton, Willis and Gassendi: First Steps in a Mechanical Theory of Communication”, Brain and Cognition, 51: 66–94.

Other Internet Resources

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