Robert Grosseteste

Robert Grosseteste (ca. 1168–1253), Bishop of Lincoln from 1235 to 1253, was one of the most prominent and remarkable figures in thirteenth-century English intellectual life. A philosopher, theologian, and student of nature, Grosseteste also translated and commented on works by Aristotle and Greek patristic thinkers. He played a pivotal role in the development of Aristotelianism, being among the first Latin philosophers to incorporate theories of Avicenna and Averroes, while also drawing heavily from Augustine. Grosseteste crafted a highly original and imaginative account of the creation and fundamental structure of the physical world, grounded in the concept of the action of light. His writings encompass numerous treatises on natural phenomena, as well as works in philosophy and theology. In his ecclesiastical capacity as bishop, Grosseteste actively addressed pastoral care issues, striving to rectify abuses within the church, and in his later years, he even traced some of these issues to the papacy itself. Revered by his contemporaries and later scholars at Oxford, Grosseteste has been often celebrated as an inspiration to scientific developments in fourteenth-century Britain.

• 1. Life
• 2. Works
• 3. Sources
• 4. The Metaphysics of Light
• 5. Infinity, Continuity, and Measurement
• 6. Creation, Eternity, Time, and Being
• 7. Divine Foreknowledge and Human Freedom
• 8. Modality and God’s Power
• 9. Free Decision and Freedom of the Will
• 10. Exemplarism, Truth, and Illumination
  • 10.1 Exemplarism
  • 10.2 Truth
  • 10.3 Illumination
• 11. Scientific Method
• 12. Influence
• Bibliography
  • Bibliographies
  • Biographical Studies
  • Primary Texts in Latin
  • Primary Texts in English Translation
  • Secondary Literature
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Life

Grosseteste was born in the county of Suffolk in England, possibly around 1168 (Callus 1955). Around 1195, in a letter to the Bishop of Hereford, William de Vere, Gerald of Wales commends Grosseteste for his wide reading and skill in business and legal affairs, medicine, and the liberal arts, and remarks on his exceptional standards of conduct. Grosseteste appears as a papal judge-delegate in Litchfield diocese before 1216 and in Hereford diocese between 1213 and 1216, acting with Hugh Foliot, Archdeacon of Shropshire. For at least part of the years 1208 to 1213, when England was under papal interdict, Grosseteste was in France, for in a death-bed conversation reported by the chronicler Matthew Paris he recalls having seen and heard preaching in France by Eustace of Flay, James of Vitry, Robert of Courson and the exiled Archbishop Steven Langton. In 1225, while still a deacon, Grosseteste was presented by the Bishop of Lincoln, Hugh of Wells, to the living of Abbotsley. In 1229 he was made Archdeacon of Leicester and presented with a prebend in Lincoln Cathedral.

Scholars have proposed various reconstructions of Grosseteste’s life between 1200 and 1230. The debate revolves around his activities before moving to France, during his time in France, and upon his return to England. Regarding his pre-France period, Daniel Callus (1945, 1955, with Crombie 1953 and McEvoy 1982, 2000 in substantial agreement) posits that Grosseteste may have taught arts at Oxford. In contrast, Sir Richard Southern (1986) emphasizes that Grosseteste likely held an administrative position with occasional teaching duties. The disagreement continues into Grosseteste’s time in France. Callus suggests that Grosseteste moved to France in 1209 following a town-and-gown dispute in Oxford and studied theology there. Southern rejects this view, maintaining that Grosseteste relocated due to the papal interdict of England, and during this period, he did not engage in theological studies.

The complexity intensifies when examining Grosseteste’s activities upon his return from France. Callus argues that Grosseteste likely returned from France in 1214, becoming Oxford’s first chancellor in function, if not in title. Southern instead suggests that Grosseteste’s permanent association with Oxford started after 1225 when, having received the prebend of Abbotsley, Grosseteste probably became a priest and began lecturing in theology. Joseph Goering (1995), in turn, proposes that Grosseteste returned to England after 1215, working as a master of arts in Oxford throughout the 1220s. During that decade, Grosseteste may have returned to Paris for theological studies, possibly around 1225, after receiving the Abbotsley prebend. According to James Ginther (2000), Grosseteste became regent master of theology around 1229/30, coinciding with his role as a lecturer for the Oxford Franciscans. Nevertheless, Brett Smith (2018: n. 34) expresses doubts about Ginther’s claims.

The reconstruction of the later period of Grosseteste’s life benefits from additional historical data. In 1224, the Franciscans arrived at Oxford, and their Minister Provincial, Agnellus of Pisa, established their first school. Agnellus requested Grosseteste to lecture to them and, in 1229/30, Grosseteste began a formal association with the Franciscans at Oxford as their first lecturer (see Panti 2017a). In 1235, he was elected Bishop of Lincoln, a responsibility that clashed with his teaching duties, prompting him to relinquish them. However, Grosseteste maintained close relations with the Franciscans throughout his life.

In 1231, following a recovery from a severe illness, Grosseteste resigned from all his sources of revenue, except his prebend in Lincoln Cathedral. He proceeded to compose a series of significant theological works, with the Hexaæmeron being the most notable. Starting from the early 1230s (see Dionisotti 1988), Grosseteste began studying Greek. Assisted by individuals proficient in the language, he undertook crucial translation projects, including works by John of Damascus, Pseudo-Dionysius (accompanied by his own original commentary), and Aristotle. The list includes the first extant complete Latin translation of the Nicomachean Ethics to circulate in the Latin West (see Beullens 2023b), along with translations of numerous Greek commentary materials (see Panti 2023). Grosseteste also translated substantial parts of Aristotle’s De caelo and Simplicius’s commentary on it, apparently in the late stages of his life.

In the 1240s, the conflict between the emperor and the pope led to the First Council of Lyon in 1245, in which Grosseteste participated. He returned to the papal court in Lyon in 1250, expressing to the pope his concerns about the failings of the church and its deviation from its pastoral mission. In 1253, the last year of his life, Grosseteste wrote an impassioned letter (#128) to the pope, refusing to obey the pontifical instructions to confer a benefice on one of the pope’s nephews, whom he deemed unfit for pastoral care.

Grosseteste passed away on October 8–9, 1253. Although remembered by his contemporaries as a saintly man, three attempts to canonize him (the last in 1307) ultimately failed.

2. Works

Grosseteste’s extensive and diverse body of writings encompasses works of various genres and domains, including scientific and philosophical treatises, commentaries on Aristotle’s and biblical works, theological writings, sermon collections, letters, and a substantial collection of short theological pieces known as the Dicta. Additionally, Grosseteste ventured into Anglo-Norman poetry. His works of philosophical interest can be classified as follows:

• Scientific treatises. Grosseteste’s early scientific works, likely composed in the 1210s and 1220s, include
  • On the Liberal Arts (De artibus liberalibus),
  • On the Generation of Sounds (De generatione sonorum), and
  • On the Sphere (De sphaera).
  Expanding his scientific inquiry, Grosseteste later wrote on specific natural problems in works like
  • On Comets (De cometis),
  • On Lines, Angles, and Figures (De lineis, angulis et figuris),
  • On the Nature of Places (De natura locorum),
  • On the Rainbow (De iride),
  • On Color (De colore),
  • On Local Differences (De differentiis localibus), and
  • On the Movement of the Supercelestial Bodies (De motu supercaelestium)
  (for an outline, see Dales 1961 and Panti 2001). Further works ascribed to Grosseteste, namely,
  • On the Heat of the Sun (De calore solis),
  • On the Tides (De fluxu et refluxu maris),
  • On the Generation of the Stars (De generatione stellarum), and
  • On the Impressions of the Air (De impressionibus aeris)
  are likely inauthentic, with the first two probably written by Adam of Exeter (Panti 2013b).
• Philosophical treatises. Grosseteste composed several short philosophical works, the most renowned of which is On Light (De luce). Another noteworthy piece, On Bodily Movement and Light (De motu corporali et luce) shares a close thematic connection with On Light. In addition to these, Grosseteste authored several treatises, including
  • On Potency and Act (De potentia et actu),
  • On the Halt of Causes (De statu causarum),
  • On the Subsistence of a Thing (De subsistentia rei),
  • On the Truth of the Proposition (De veritate propositionis), and
  • On the Finitude of Movement and Time (De finitate motus et temporis).
• Commentaries on Aristotle. Grosseteste wrote commentaries on two Aristotelian works, namely, the Posterior Analytics and the Physics, which are among the earliest surviving commentaries on these works in the Latin West. The commentary on the Posterior Analytics, likely written in the 1220s, is an important source for Grosseteste’s epistemological views. The commentary on the Physics appears to have been assembled by a later editor(s) from notes Grosseteste had written in his copy of the Physics to serve as the basis for a more structured commentary like that on the Posterior Analytics. Although incomplete, these notes comprise a substantial and coherent work, the bulk of which was also probably written in the 1220s, with some later additions based on Averroes’s long commentary on the Physics (see Lewis 2003). Extant manuscripts also include a paraphrase of the Prior Analytics, attributed to and possibly genuine to Grosseteste, along with a commentary on the Sophistici Elenchi and a second commentary on the Physics which, however, appear to be inauthentic.
• Philosophical-theological works. Grosseteste delved into the intricate intersection of philosophical and theological inquiries through a series of works. Among them is On Free Decision (De libero arbitrio), a relatively lengthy exploration in two versions that confronts arguments challenging the existence of free decision (liberum arbitrium). This work is complemented by shorter treatises such as On Truth (De veritate) and On God’s Knowledge (De scientia Dei), likely composed in the late 1220s or early 1230s. Another notable contribution is found in On the Order of the Emanation of Caused Things from God (De ordine emamandi causatorum a Deo), where Grosseteste challenges the notion that an eternal being can only create eternal creatures. In a lengthy letter addressed to Adam Rufus (Adam of Exeter), Grosseteste explores the idea that God is the form of all things, delving into the relationship between body and soul and the celestial abode of angels. In the manuscripts, this letter is often divided into two distinct works, On the Unique Form of all Things (De unica forma omnium) and On the Intelligences (De intelligentiis).
• Theological works of philosophical interest. Some of Grosseteste’s theological works carry notable philosophical significance. In On the Cessation of the Ceremonial Laws (De cessatione legalium), Grosseteste argues that the Incarnation would have occurred even without the Fall, and touches on the nature of human happiness and natural law. On the Ten Commandments (De decem mandatis) offers glimpses into Grosseteste’s ethical thinking, while his theological masterpiece, the Hexaæmeron, thoroughly explores the issue of the eternity of the world. Philosophically relevant material is also present in the Dicta, some of Grosseteste’s later sermons (most notably the sermon Ecclesia sancta celebrat, where he outlines his account of human nature), and his commentaries on the Pseudo-Dionysius

3. Sources

Being among the first Latin philosophers to systematically engage with Aristotle, Grosseteste utilized a vast array of diverse sources. Among them, a crucial role is played by philosophers from the Aristotelian tradition and, crucially, the works of Aristotle, Avicenna, and Averroes, which Grosseteste pioneered (Gauthier 1982). These sources are complemented by theological works from both the Western tradition (particularly Augustine, but also Boethius, Anselm, and Bernard of Clairvaux) and, later in his life, the Eastern tradition (especially John of Damascus, Basil, and Pseudo-Dionysius). Further sets of sources used by Grosseteste encompass scientific works written or translated into Latin, as well as Roman literature (especially Cicero and Seneca).

Grosseteste’s Tabula (Rosemann 1995) offers an unusual insight into these sources. This work is a topical concordance in which Grosseteste lists readings on a wide range of topics of theological and philosophical interest. For each topic, Grosseteste associated a sign, allowing him quick access to the material in question.

While Grosseteste was undoubtedly influenced to some extent by his contemporaries, his works display little concern to engage in debates with them, contrasting with the practices of his peers in Paris. This may reflect the provincial origin of Grosseteste’s works and/or a conservative preference to engage with the ideas of the great thinkers of the philosophical and theological traditions.

4. The Metaphysics of Light

The concept of light holds a prominent position in Grosseteste’s writings, extending from his natural treatises to his ontological, theological, and epistemological theories. Philosophically, his utilization of the concept of light in explaining the fundamental structure and origin of the physical universe stands out as profoundly important and original. While he expounds on this theory most comprehensively in On Light, traces of it also surface in his commentaries on the Posterior Analytics and the Physics, in On Bodily Movement and Light, and in his commentary on Ecclesiasticus 43: 1–5, also known as On the Operations of the Sun.

Grosseteste’s metaphysics of light is anchored in his hylomorphic account of the constitution of bodies. According to him, all natural bodies are compounds of prime matter and substantial form. Likely influenced by either Avicenna, Avicebron, or both (see Polloni 2021a, Lewis 2023), Grosseteste posits that all bodies possess a bodily form (forma corporalis) extending prime matter into three dimensions. This assertion suggests Grosseteste’s adherence to formal pluralism—a theory positing that physical hylomorphic compounds have more than one substantial form alongside prime matter (see Polloni 2021a). For example, in On Light, Grosseteste maintains that the firmament (i.e., the outermost heavenly sphere) is the simplest body, consisting solely of prime matter and the first form (i.e., the bodily form). However, in his commentary on the Physics, Grosseteste discusses the element fire, attributing to it, in addition to the first form, the substantial form of fire.

The most original aspect of Grosseteste’s account, however, lies in his identification of the bodily form with light (lux). On Light begins with an argument supporting this identification. Grosseteste posits that the first form and prime matter are inherently simple substances. Yet, the nature of bodiness necessitates the extension of prime matter into three dimensions, resulting in a quantified body. A simple form without dimension could only achieve this effect if it instantaneously multiplied and diffused itself in all directions, thereby extending prime matter along with its diffusion. These characteristics align with those of light, which is inherently self-multiplicative and self-diffusive—where a sphere of light is instantaneously generated from a point of light. Hence, Grosseteste concludes that light is indeed the first form (see Panti 2012).

Based on this theory, Grosseteste developed a cosmogony and cosmology. According to him, God created the first form (i.e., light) in prime matter, both being indivisible and simple. Grosseteste argues that finite multiplication of a simple cannot result in an item with size (quantum). However, he posits that infinite multiplication of a simple can generate a finite quantum. Consequently, through the infinite multiplication of the first form in prime matter, the extended bodies of the physical universe were produced. To accommodate bodies of different sizes, Grosseteste suggests the existence of infinities of different sizes (see section 5 below) standing in various numerical and non-numerical ratios to each other. Therefore,

light, by the infinite multiplication of itself, extends matter into larger and smaller finite dimensions that stand to one another in all ratios, numerical and non-numerical. (Lewis 2013: 241–242)

Grosseteste utilizes the concept of light to explain the genesis of the Aristotelian cosmos—a system of nested celestial spheres surrounding the four sublunary or elemental spheres. The infinite self-multiplication of the initial point of light extended prime matter into a spherical form, as light inherently diffuses itself spherically. The outermost parts of the matter in the generated sphere are maximally extended and rarefied, forming the outermost sphere, known as the firmament.

Because light is essentially self-multiplicative, the light in this outermost sphere continued to multiply itself, now inwards toward the center from all parts of the outermost sphere, having diffused outward as far as possible. As light, being a substantial form, cannot exist apart from matter, this inwardly directed light brought with it what Grosseteste calls the spirituality of the matter of the outermost sphere, the lumen, a body comprising light and the spirituality of this matter, which proceeded inwards.

Moving inwards, lumen concentrated the matter below the outermost sphere, leaving a second sphere below it, comprised of a matter whose parts are as rarefied as possible. This sphere in turn generated lumen which, moving inwards, further concentrated the matter below it and rarefied the outermost parts of this matter to produce the third sphere. This process repeats, generating the nine celestial spheres. Each sphere is composed of the matter whose parts were incapable of further rarefaction.

The lowest celestial sphere, the lunar sphere, also generated lumen, which moved inwards and further concentrated the matter below this sphere. However, as this lumen lacked sufficient power to fully disperse the outermost parts of the matter below the lunar sphere, it resulted in a sphere comprised of incompletely dispersed matter—the sphere of fire. Following the same process, the production of the three subsequent mundane spheres (the spheres of air, water, and earth) ensued.

Due to the incomplete dispersion of matter in these four elemental spheres, they retained the capacity for concentration and dispersion. This characteristic distinguishes the elemental spheres from their celestial counterparts, making them susceptible to alteration, growth, and generation and corruption.

Grosseteste also incorporates this theory of light into his explanation of the nature of heavenly movements. He posits that heavenly bodies are perfect because the lumen within them is incapable of rarefaction or condensation and, accordingly, they can only move circularly. As a result, it cannot influence the parts of their matter to incline upward (for rarefaction) or downward (for condensation). In contrast, the elements can be rarefied and condensed, allowing them to incline the lumen within themselves away from the center of the universe for rarefaction or toward the center for condensation. This explains their natural capacity to move upward and downward.

Although the metaphysics of light deviates fundamentally from Aristotelian principles, Grosseteste evidently sought to employ it as an explanatory framework for various features of the Aristotelian cosmos—such as the nested spheres and the distinction between the movement of celestial and sublunary bodies. In his commentary on the Physics, Grosseteste interprets fundamental ideas in Aristotle’s natural philosophy through the lens of the metaphysics of light. He explains Aristotle’s theory of potency by emphasizing the replicability of form, claiming that every bodily species comes into existence through “the greater or lesser replication of the simple first bodily form”, which is light (Dales 1963a: 17).

Similarly, Grosseteste interprets the three Aristotelian principles of nature—matter, form, and privation—as prime matter, the first form/light, and the impurity of light in things, respectively. In On Bodily Movement and Light, he equates nature, conceived by Aristotle as an internal source of movement and rest, with the first form/light. This first form, acting as a “multiplicative force”, becomes the catalyst for various types of bodily changes (see Polloni 2021b).

5. Infinity, Continuity, and Measurement

Grosseteste, likely the first in the Latin West to propose a doctrine of unequal infinities, asserts in On Light that there are infinite numbers that differ in size (see Lewis 2013: 241). According to him, infinite numbers can stand to one another not only in every numerical ratio but also in every non-numerical ratio (Grosseteste has in mind the ratio of the infinite numbers of points contained in incommensurable lines). He believes that lines and other continua contain various-sized infinities of dimensionless, simple points or indivisibles and they are parts of lines: for him, continua are made of indivisibles. Grosseteste acknowledges that Aristotle seems to reject this view and hold that magnitudes only have magnitudes as their parts, but he claims in On Light that the term “part” has a range of meanings depending on which mathematical relationship of parts to wholes is in question. Aristotle, he asserts, means by “part” in connection with continua and aliquot part and is concerned only to deny that continua are composed of indivisibles as aliquot parts. But this denial does not entail that indivisibles are not parts standing in a different mathematical relationship to the wholes to which they belong. On Light maintains that a point is a part of a line in the sense that it is in a line “an infinite number of times, and does not diminish the line when subtracted from it a finite number of times” (Lewis 2013: 242; see Panti 2017b). Grosseteste says little about the ordering of indivisibles in continua but mentions without criticism Aristotle’s view that indivisibles in continua must be densely or “mediately” ordered, so that between any two is yet another, a view attributed to him by Albert the Great and Thomas Bradwardine (see Lewis 2005).

Grosseteste’s theory of unequal infinities served as the basis of a theory of how God measured the world he created. Grosseteste takes up measurement in his commentary on the Physics (Dales 1963a: 90–95). He points out that human measurement of time involves taking some recurring movement—say, the daily movement of the heaven—and stipulating its duration to be a unit of measurement. In the same way, the magnitude of a body is taken as a unit of the measurement of spatial magnitude. Measurement of this sort, Grosseteste holds, is inherently relative in nature. To say that an event lasts for a day, for example, is simply to relate its duration to the duration of the movement of the heavens. Yet God measures things differently. God’s creative activity requires him to create bodies with a definite magnitude and movements with a definite duration, and this requires that there be a non-relative measure intrinsic to magnitudes and durations. According to Grosseteste, this measure is provided by the different-sized infinities of indivisibles comprising spatial and temporal magnitudes. Grosseteste points out in his commentary on the Physics that were only a single line to exist, it would not be possible for us to measure its magnitude, and yet God could do so by counting the infinite number of points that comprise its magnitude. Only God can measure in this way, for only to him is the infinite finite.

6. Creation, Eternity, Time, and Being

Grosseteste staunchly embraced the Christian belief in the temporal creation of the world and asserted that the world’s beginning could be demonstrated, as suggested by certain arguments in Hexaæmeron 1.9.7 His most significant contribution to the medieval debate on the world’s origin was his interpretation and rebuttal of Aristotle’s arguments of the eternity of the world in Physics VIII (see Dales 1986). Grosseteste diverged on this matter from some of his early thirteenth-century contemporaries, like Alexander of Hales, who believed Aristotle did not intend to deny the world’s beginning but only that it had a natural beginning. In the Hexaæmeron, Grosseteste admonishes those who adopt such an interpretation, cautioning them “not deceive themselves and pointlessly try to make a Catholic of Aristotle” (Dales & Gieben 1982: 61).

In both his Hexaæmeron and the closely related treatise On the Finitude of Movement and Time, Grosseteste engages with Aristotle’s arguments for a beginningless world. He contends that Aristotle’s errors stem from a failure to fully comprehend simple eternity. While Grosseteste acknowledges that Aristotle and other philosophers successfully demonstrated the existence of an unchangeable, non-temporal God and possessed some understanding of simple eternity, their incomplete understanding of simple eternity meant that they did not really understand what they proved. According to Grosseteste, this deficiency in understanding can be attributed to a disordering of their affectus or will, rather than their aspectus or reason. This distinction, possibly derived from Augustine, is a distinctive feature of Grosseteste’s philosophy (see Smith 2018). In Grosseteste’s view, genuine understanding demands directing one’s will or desire away from the sensory world towards the unchanging eternal realm. Aristotle and his contemporaries, preoccupied with the sensory world, fell short of achieving true understanding.

Grosseteste, like Augustine, posits the concept of ‘simple eternity’ as the non-temporal mode of existence enjoyed by God. He argues that Aristotle’s claims about the eternity of the world falter due to a failure to grasp the non-temporal value of the notions of “before” and “after” when applied to eternity. Grosseteste contends that Aristotle, in two of his arguments, wrongly assumes that a first movement necessitates a preceding potency and, therefore, time: for this reason, the first movement would not be ‘first’ since time requires movement and potencies are actualized through movement. Grosseteste refutes this by asserting that, in the consideration of the first movement’s existence “after” not existing and its potency to exist “before” existing, the notions of “before” and “after” are to be taken in a non-temporal sense, within God’s eternity and considering that the actualization of this potency involves no movement or change in God. Addressing Aristotle’s third argument against a first instant and his claim that an instant is a link between past and future, Grosseteste argues that this view appeals only to those already committed to the eternity of time and change.

Grosseteste argues that comprehending eternity is crucial for understanding time. In his commentary on the Physics, he criticizes Aristotle’s view of time as a number of change, deeming it superficial and insufficient for capturing time’s true essence beyond the realm of natural philosophy. Yet Grosseteste also disagrees with Augustine’s subjectivist conception of time and aims for an objective understanding of the true essence of time.

For Grosseteste, time is defined as “the privation of the at-once of eternity from the totality of being” (Dales 1963a: 96). This implies that, for time to exist, there must exist entities whose existence is not instantaneously eternal (the at-once of eternity). Eternity is like a sort of fixed point subject to a continuous succession of the adherences of instantaneous bits of the totality of existence, one bit adhering to eternity only continuously to be replaced by another. This continuous replacement constitutes the flow of time. Grosseteste defines the instant (the “now”) as the adherence of being to the at-once of eternity and, accordingly, past and future are also defined in relation to this adherence. He acknowledges potential circularity in his tense usage but asks for understanding due to the challenge of making these concepts understandable (Dales 1963a: 98).

Grosseteste’s concept of time seems intricately connected to his understanding of existence, as elucidated in his commentaries on the Posterior Analytics and the Physics, as well as in On Truth (Rossi 1981: 290–291; Dales 1963a: 7; Baur 1912: 141; see also Lewis 2009). According to Grosseteste, the existence of a created thing is its dependence on God. Grosseteste appears to equate this relation of dependence with the relation of adherence to the at-once of eternity (see Dales 1963a: 96–97). However, it is noteworthy that he does not seem to recognize the distinction between the relata involved in the relation of adherence in his time theory and the relation of dependence in his account of existence. In the account of time, it is an instantaneous bit of a thing’s existence that adheres, while in his account of existence, it is the thing itself that is dependent, treating existence as a relation rather than the term of a relation.

7. Divine Foreknowledge and Human Freedom

Grosseteste’s On Free Decision stands as one of his most significant works, with its first half primarily addressing the challenge of reconciling God’s foreknowledge with human freedom. While the discussion delves into Grosseteste’s noteworthy theory of modality, its significance also lies in the argument he presents regarding the incompatibility of God’s knowledge of the future and future contingency. Noticeably, Grosseteste distinguishes his approach from the perspectives offered by Boethius and Anselm in their earlier discussions of the same issue.

Grosseteste presents the argument as follows:

Everything known by God is or was or will be; a is known by God (let a be a future contingent); so a is or was or will be. But a neither is nor was; so it will be. Each of the premises is clearly necessary, as is the inference. So the conclusion is not just true but also necessary, for only what is necessary follows from things that are necessary. (Lewis 2017: 111)

A sound argument without modal premises concludes that an event will occur. Since its premises are necessary, by the principle that entailment transmits necessity from premises to conclusion, its conclusion is necessary too. Grosseteste focuses on premises formulated in terms of God’s knowledge, but he clearly thinks that a range of arguments having the same form can be constructed, employing in their initial part also premises formulated in terms of prophecy or even past-tensed truths of the form “It was the case that A will exist”.

Grosseteste’s reliance on the principle that entailment transmits necessity from the premises to the conclusions of a valid inference is a noteworthy aspect of the argument he explores. Despite the challenges posed in terms of how contingency seems to follow from necessity, Grosseteste ultimately maintains the validity of the principle, affirming that syllogistic inference ensures the transmission of necessity from necessary antecedents to conclusions (see Lewis 2017: 139). Grosseteste acknowledges the soundness of arguments proving the necessity of true propositions about future acts but challenges the inference that such necessity implies a lack of freedom in those acts. He argues that the type of necessity involved in such arguments is compatible with freedom. According to Grosseteste, the incompatibility with freedom arises only with a different kind of necessity. Arguments relying on this alternative necessity fail as their premises and conclusions are contingent in the correlative sense of contingency.

Grosseteste’s solution to the conflict between divine foreknowledge and free decision includes two key points. First, he claims that there is a distinct family of modal notions in respect of which future events and true propositions about them may be contingent. Second, he argues that freedom necessitates only this particular type of contingency. While he provides limited support for the latter claim, his introduction of a distinct family of modal notions is noteworthy and marks a crucial stage in the development of modal theory.

8. Modality and God’s Power

When Grosseteste wrote On Free Decision, modal concepts were typically understood in terms of the notion of change and, consequently, time. Grosseteste speaks of a necessary proposition, in this context, as one that is invariably true and incapable of becoming false—its truth cannot cease to be. In turn, a contingent proposition can change its truth value. A possible proposition, if false, can become true, while an impossible proposition is inherently false and cannot become true. Conceptions of modality along these lines were sometimes described as per accidens conceptions since, in many cases, a proposition’s modal status could change with the passage of time. Its modal status happens to or is incidental to it (accidit). For instance, “Caesar crossed the Rubicon” was once false and not necessary but became true and necessary—incapable of becoming false—after Caesar crossed the Rubicon. True propositions about the past served as standard examples of propositions necessary in the sense that their truth cannot cease.

Grosseteste argues that true propositions about the present may well be contingent on this understanding of contingency, as they can become false. However, he holds that all true propositions about the future are necessary. One might question this stance, given instances where a true proposition about the future becomes false after the predicted event occurs. Yet, upon closer examination, Grosseteste contends that true propositions about the future are necessary because they cannot become false prior to the realization of the anticipated state of affairs. He has a limited unchangeability of truth in mind.

Grosseteste does not reject this conception of per accidens modalities. Instead, he introduces another family of modal notions unrelated to considerations of time or change—an array of non-temporal modal notions. He argues that many true propositions about the future, including those about future free acts, fall under the sense of contingency within this modal family. The latter also includes true propositions about God’s knowledge of those acts, past prophecies, or statements affirming that it was the case that the acts would occur. Traces of similar ideas can be found, although implicitly, in some of his predecessors, like Peter Lombard, whom Grosseteste cites. However, unlike Grosseteste, they had not delved into a detailed theory of modality severed from considerations of time and change (except for Peter Abelard, with some caveats). Later thinkers like Duns Scotus expanded on the concept of non-temporal modality with even more detail, sharing elements found in Grosseteste’s account and possibly influenced by it (see Lewis 1996).

The central idea guiding Grosseteste’s approach to a notion of non-temporal contingency is that even if a proposition, such as “Antichrist will exist” (his standard example of a true, future contingent proposition), is true now and cannot become false until Antichrist comes into existence, the world might nevertheless have been such that “Antichrist will exist” was never true. A present-day thinker might articulate this idea in terms of alternative possible worlds, but Grosseteste expresses it in terms of the notion of a proposition’s eternal power or capacity for truth or falsity without a beginning, grounding such powers ultimately in God’s eternal power to know or will propositions.

Grosseteste’s discussion of non-temporal modalities and their relation to God’s power is most fully set out in the earlier recension of On Free Decision. Focusing on necessity, he writes that

something is called necessary in that it has no capacity, either not to be, or not to have been, or not to be going to be. [The dictum] “that two and three are five” is necessary in this sense, because it has no capacity not to be true in the present, or in the future, or in the past, or ever, be it with or without a beginning. (Lewis 2017: 39,41)

Grosseteste goes on to describe the corresponding notion of contingency as a matter of a proposition’s having “a capacity for being true and being false without a beginning”. What is necessary in this sense utterly lacks a power to be false. What is contingent, in the corresponding sense, could have had from the beginning a different truth-value, though it may well lack a power to change its truth-value from that which it actually has. Grosseteste holds that this kind of contingency of propositions about future events or things implies that the things or events the proposition is about may themselves be called contingent, and that this kind of contingency is sufficient for the freedom of our future acts.

Much of Grosseteste’s discussion of modality revolves around challenges posed by the concept of the eternal power of a proposition to be true or false without a beginning. He appears to hold such powers to be possessed not in time but in eternity. Grosseteste observes that God also possesses eternal powers—namely, the ability to know and will without a beginning. The difficulties associated with the eternal powers of propositions parallel those of God’s eternal powers. In fact, Grosseteste explains the eternal powers of propositions in terms of God’s eternal powers to know and will propositions and grounds non-temporal modality in God’s powers or lack thereof, particularly in the cases of necessity and impossibility. For instance, he explains that

the eternal capacity for [the dictum] “that Antichrist was going to exist” to have had truth and not to have had truth without a beginning is nothing but the capacity of God by which God was able from eternity and without a beginning to will or not to will that Antichrist will exist, or to know or not to know that Antichrist will exist. (Lewis 2017: 55)

The difficulties associated with the notion of eternal powers arise from the idea of unexercised yet genuine eternal powers, which seems to be a requirement in Grosseteste’s account of non-temporal contingency. When expressed in terms of God’s powers to know or will, a challenge emerges regarding the meaning behind statements that God could have not known or willed what he presently knows or wills, as implied by the doctrine that God possesses the power to not know or not will what he knows or wills. According to Grosseteste, the phrase “could have” implies a priority of power to act, signifying that before God’s willing of p, he had the power not to will that p. However, given that God exists outside of time, “could have” cannot express a temporal priority of God’s power over its act. Grosseteste addresses this issue by proposing that it denotes a causal priority, a concept he drew from Eriugena (see Lewis 1996).

The notion of unexercised eternal powers encounters the challenge that these powers, if genuine, seem to pertain to future acts and could be exercised in the future. For a timeless being like God, how could he exercise, at a future time, his power to know or will something he presently does not know or will? Indeed, these powers are described as powers to know or will without beginning. This attribution of power to God appears to be empty (frustra). Grosseteste grapples with a fundamental problem for those who, like him, posit that God is timeless yet possesses powers for actions he does not perform. His solution appeals to the idea that God’s powers to know or will are rational powers, capable of multiple expressions (drawing from Aristotle’s concept of rational power). Therefore, the power to know that p is identical to the power to not-know that p. With this understanding, if God knows that p, his power to not-know that p is ipso facto exercised, as it corresponds to the same power to know that p. Consequently, there are no unexercised powers in God. Thomas Bradwardine critiqued this account, asserting that a more plausible criterion for exercisability is that if an agent has the power to know that p and does not know that p, then he can exercise that power by knowing that p. Grosseteste does not provide a response to this objection. A possible answer would require a more thorough examination of the relationship between power, time, and change than Grosseteste undertakes (see Lewis 1996).

9. Free Decision and Freedom of the Will

Accounts of human action and the associated freedom in the early thirteenth century center around the concept of “free decision” (liberum arbitrium). The expression “free decision” was understood to encompass not only a specific type of act, as implied by its grammatical structure as a concrete term, but also the capacity or capacities engaged in the exercise of such an act. The term “decision” typically implicated reason, while “free” alluded to the will. Accordingly, inquiries often arose regarding whether “free decision” pertains to an act of reason or will, and whether the capacities involved in such an act are reason, will, a combination of both, or conceivably other capacities. Hence, medieval accounts of free decision offer valuable insights into the authors’ understanding of human action and freedom.

According to Grosseteste’s On Free Decision, “free decision” in its concrete usage refers to a decision, a specific type of rational act (on Grosseteste’s theory see Lewis 2013, 2017, and Pickavé 2017.) This act, like any other act of reason, is not itself free but is described as free in a derivative sense because it guides the will, whose acts are considered free. Reason’s role is to differentiate between good and bad, better and worse, and to suggest to the will what it should choose or reject. The will, by its nature, makes choices or rejections based on such guidance from reason but possesses the freedom to disregard reason’s decision and opt for an alternative choice. This freedom is the reason the decision is termed, in a derivative sense, a free decision. In presenting this view, Grosseteste implies that he takes the will’s choices as not being psychologically determined by reason: indeed, reason offers advice, not necessity.

Grosseteste posits reason and will as the underlying capacities for free decision, identifying them with aspectus and affectus respectively. Influenced, perhaps, by the Pseudo-Augustinian De spiritu et anima’s discussion of the soul’s simplicity, Grosseteste maintains that these capacities are fundamentally one. However, this unified capacity can be exercised through a decision in one way and through a choice in another.

Grosseteste maintains that the freedom of decision is essentially the freedom of the will. The nature of this freedom revolves around the will’s capacity to choose alternatives, a concept referred to as flexibilitas or vertibilitas. This view distinguishes Grosseteste from many of his contemporaries who reject the idea that freedom of the will entails the capacity to will alternatives. Many of his contemporaries understand the pertinent alternatives to be moral good and evil, and emphasize that some agents with freedom of the will (God and the angels) simply cannot will moral evil, whereas others (Satan and his cohorts) cannot will moral good. Hence, for them the freedom of the will cannot be defined as a capacity to turn between alternatives. Grosseteste challenges this assumption by claiming that the alternatives in question are not necessarily moral good and evil. He proposes that the freedom of the will involves the capacity to turn between what he calls “bare opposites considered in themselves”. Although he provides minimal details about the notion of “bare opposites”, it aligns with his belief, expressed in On Free Decision, that the moral goodness or evil of an act depends on its relation to God’s will, and acts are morally indifferent when considered independently of this relationship.

In Grosseteste’s framework, the freedom of the will is the will’s capacity to choose alternatives in the sense of morally indifferent alternatives. This does not imply that the chosen objects are considered neither good nor bad. Grosseteste believes that individuals can only choose what they perceive to be good. However, the goodness involved in choosing these bare opposites is distinct from moral goodness: it is natural goodness. Grosseteste provides limited details about this notion. Yet, given his stance on the non-determination of the will by reason, he likely believes that an agent, when choosing among natural goods, can go against reason’s guidance regarding the best or preferred option or abstain from making a choice aligned with reason’s dictate.

Grosseteste posits that our capacity for moral choice relies on the ability to choose morally indifferent alternatives. However, he provides little elaboration on this fundamental aspect. According to him, humans cannot choose moral good without divine assistance, although he does not clarify the mechanisms by which divine grace, combined with the freedom of will, enables moral choice. Perhaps, Grosseteste envisions God’s grace making it possible for something willed by God, and therefore morally good, to serve as a reason for human choice. Nevertheless, he emphasizes that the capacity to choose moral good is not inherent in possessing reason and will since, otherwise, divine grace would be unnecessary. Similarly, the capacity to choose moral evil stems from something extrinsic to reason and will since God, who possesses both, cannot choose moral evil. Following Augustine, Grosseteste attributes the human capacity for moral evil to its creation ex nihilo, an inherent and inevitable flaw in any created being. In individuals confirmed in good, this capacity remains unexercised by divine grace. As a result, they are incapable of making evil moral choices.

Accounts of free will are commonly distinguished between theories emphasizing the ability to do otherwise and theories centered on self-determination (see the entry, Free will). Grosseteste’s theory seems to better align with the former category. This alignment is supported by his arguments for the existence of free decision, which point to a wide range of phenomena suggesting that an agent could have chosen differently. However, there are hints of a more profound self-determination aspect in Grosseteste’s account. He maintains that the will’s capacity for opposites is inherently contained in its power to will and move itself (Lewis 2017: 255), portraying the will as a self-mover. Unfortunately, Grosseteste leaves this aspect largely unexplored.

10. Exemplarism, Truth, and Illumination

10.1 Exemplarism

Grosseteste’s exemplarism (see Lynch 1941), represents an adaptation of Plato’s theory of Ideas within a Christian framework. In line with medieval thinkers, Grosseteste grapples with the perceived inconsistency between the existence of an eternal, self-subsistent realm of Platonic Ideas and the dependence of all things on God. Despite this tension, he interprets the Platonic Ideas as eternal models (exempla) and reasons (rationes) of things in God’s mind. These reasons serve as paradigms or models that created things can either align with or deviate from. Therefore, the act of creation is akin to a craftsman relying on the idea in her mind while crafting.

Given the absolute simplicity of God, Grosseteste ultimately equates the reasons of things in God’s mind with God himself. Grosseteste moves between speaking of the reasons in God’s mind as exemplars and of God himself as such. In alignment with Augustine, Grosseteste describes God as the first form, explicitly clarifying that he employs the term “form” differently from Aristotelian hylomorphism (Luard 1861: 4; Mantello & Goering 2010: 38). In On the Halt of Causes, he identifies God with “the form that is both a model and that in virtue of which a thing is” and notes that this form “is not conjoined with a thing but exists on its own, simple and separate” (Baur 1912: 125).

10.2 Truth

Grosseteste, writing in a tradition that explored the concept of truth across various contexts. In his treatise On Truth, he delves into whether there is just one truth (veritas), which is God, or many truths (veritates). While discussing this, Grosseteste emphasizes a cohesive understanding of truth that encompasses propositions, entities (such as trees or humans), and the identification of God with truth. The doctrine of eternal exemplar forms plays an important role in this account.

According to Grosseteste, truth is the conformity or adequation of things and speech, specifically the thought expressed by speech. This conception was relatively new in the Latin West. Grosseteste interprets it in a peculiar way, identifying the speech in question with that of God, the eternal Word. In this framework, truth (veritas) represents the conformity between things and the eternal Word. Grosseteste posits that the eternal Word is its own conformity to itself, thus equating it with truth.

For created things, their truth is their conformity to their eternal model or reason in the eternal Word. Likewise, the truth of propositions—a subclass of things—is their conformity to their eternal model or reason in the eternal Word. This, on first appearance, would appear to clash with the idea that a proposition’s truth is not its conformity to anything in God, but rather to the state of affairs in the world whose obtaining it asserts. This appearance, however, is deceptive. A thing’s conformity to its eternal reason (its truth) is its possession of the being its exemplar specifies. Grosseteste holds that created items have two kinds of being or perfection. In his commentary on the Posterior Analytics, he holds that the second perfection of a thing is

the completion of the activity of the thing to which it has, as such, been established to be fitted and for the sake of which it has been established. (Rossi 1981: 240)

The first perfection of a thing is its simply being the kind of thing it is.

Consequently, there is a twofold conformity possible of things to their eternal reasons. On the one hand, the eternal reason of a thing specifies the very kind of thing that thing is, and simply in virtue of existing as an item of a determinate kind a thing will necessarily conform to its exemplar in this respect and be true. Hence, all human beings and all propositions are true, in this sense, in that they are the kinds of things they are, this being specified by their exemplar. A human being is a composite of body and soul, and a proposition is “the statement of one thing about another or one thing from another” (Baur 1912: 143). On the other hand, the eternal reason specifies the second perfection a thing ought to have but may nonetheless lack. In this sense a human being will be a false human being if, for example, she is vicious, falling short of the perfection of virtue specified in the eternal reason of a human being. Likewise, a proposition will be a false proposition if it fails to perform the function of a proposition, this being to state things as they in fact are in the world. Thus, the ordinary notion of propositional truth, described by Aristotle as “to so be in the thing signified as speech says”, is a matter of a proposition’s conformity, in respect of second being, to its eternal reason, and this is for it to perform the function perfective of propositions, namely, to be in conformity to the states of affairs it asserts.

Grosseteste’s account of truth aims to accommodate divergent conceptions prevalent in his day. Addressing whether there is one truth or many, Grosseteste differs from Anselm and asserts the existence of many truths (see Noone 2010). Despite this multiplicity, he contends that “there is a single truth that the name ‘truth’ everywhere signifies and predicates” (Baur 1912: 139). Hence, for Grosseteste any use of the term “truth” involves in some way a reference to the supreme truth, God.

10.3 Illumination

Influenced by Augustine, Grosseteste adopts an illuminationist perspective on human knowledge. According to this account, human knowledge is understood by analogy to bodily vision: as a body can only be seen if light is shed on it and the eyes, so something can only be known if a spiritual light is shed on it and the mind’s eye. Grosseteste articulates variations of this account in his works, particularly in On Truth and his Posterior Analytics commentary.

In On Truth, Grosseteste presents an illuminationist theory of knowledge closely following his theory of truth. Because created truth is a conformity between things and their eternal reasons, we can only know created truth if we know that a created thing conforms to its eternal reason in God. Drawing an analogy with a colored body, which is seen only when external light makes it visible, Grosseteste argues that to see a created thing as true, an external light—emanating from the Supreme Truth, God—must illuminate its truth, making it visible. This truth is the adequation of the thing and its eternal reason in God’s mind, which makes clear why the light of God needs to be shed on both the thing and its eternal reason if it is to be visible to the human mind. Grosseteste emphasizes that this process does not necessitate direct awareness or vision of God, as the pure of heart alone possess such a vision. Nevertheless, all who know truth must, in some way, have at least an unwitting cognition of the Supreme Truth and its light, and, in it, a vision of the eternal reasons.

On Truth does not explicitly refer to Aristotle’s views on knowledge but instead draws on the ideas of Augustine and Anselm. However, in his likely earlier Posterior Analytics commentary, Grosseteste connects an illuminationist conception of knowledge to Aristotle’s explanation of scientific knowledge. Nevertheless, scholars disagree concerning Grosseteste’s intentions in this regard. Some scholars (Gilson 1926–7; Lynch 1941; McEvoy 1982) argue that Grosseteste does not incorporate Aristotle’s notion of abstraction, instead favoring an Augustinian conception of divine illumination. Others (Marrone 1983), taking On Truth as an earlier work, suggest that Grosseteste’s commentary rejects his previous claims on divine illumination for human knowledge and associates Grosseteste’s references to illumination with an Aristotelian process of abstraction as the light that the human soul itself sheds on intelligible things. However, as Van Dyke (2009) argues, Grosseteste seems to aim at integrating Aristotle’s account of scientific knowledge into a broader cognitive framework where divine illumination plays a significant role in all cognition. At the same time, Grosseteste endorses the account of scientific knowledge and abstraction found in the Posterior Analytics. (For a more in-depth discussion and technical aspects of Grosseteste’s account of demonstrative science, see the entry on Medieval Theories of Demonstration, as well as Crombie 1953; Evans 1983; W. R. Laird 1987; Longeway 2007; McEvoy 1982; Marrone 1983 & 1986; Rossi 1995; Serene 1979; Van Dyke 2009 & 2010; and Wallace 1972.)

The Posterior Analytics provides an account of scientific knowledge (scientia). In this context, scientific knowledge refers not to modern scientific theories based on experimental testing. Instead, it corresponds to an understanding of why a given fact obtains (knowledge propter quid), as opposed to knowledge simply that the fact does obtain (knowledge quia). Aristotelian science involves systematizing such knowledge adopting the structure of Euclid’s axiomatic geometry and Aristotle’s syllogistic logic.

Scientia is attained by deriving a fact as the conclusion of a syllogism with premises meeting strict conditions: they must be true, immediate, prior, better known than the conclusion, state causes, be necessary, involve essential connections, be universal, everlasting, and incorruptible. Such a syllogism is termed a demonstrative syllogism or demonstration, and it provides explanatory knowledge of its conclusion. Grosseteste even suggests that only mathematics strictly comprises demonstrations, but he also hints that theology might fulfill these criteria more fully, distinguishing the demonstrative knowledge we can achieve in this life (mathematics) from that which is possible in the afterlife (theology). The sciences of natural phenomena, Grosseteste contends, fall short of fully meeting these criteria. Yet, if we soften the criteria mentioned above, a demonstrative science for natural phenomena is indeed possible (see the entry on Medieval Theories of Demonstration for details).

In Grosseteste’s view, the Posterior Analytics does not aim to provide a method for arriving at demonstrations, but rather to establish criteria for determining whether a given syllogism qualifies as a demonstration. While Aristotle discusses the origin of the principles and definitions employed in demonstrations, it is in examining these aspects that Grosseteste introduces the concepts of mental vision and the illumination of the mind.

According to Aristotle, universal concepts and principles of a science are derived from sense experience. Consequently, if an individual lacks a particular sense, their scientific knowledge of the concepts related to the exercise of that sense will also be lacking. However, Grosseteste holds that God and intelligences (i.e., the angels) possess knowledge independent of sensory experiences. Similarly, the highest part of the human soul, the intellective power, does not rely on bodily senses in its proper operation. Instead, the latter involves a mental vision, acquiring knowledge of things by seeing the exemplar forms or reasons through an irradiation received from God or an intelligence.

Grosseteste harmonizes this perspective with Aristotle’s positions by holding that, with rare exceptions, most individuals in their present life lack this form of knowledge. Their intellective power is “sick”, unable to perform its proper operation. In present life, Aristotelian demonstrative science represents the highest form of knowledge accessible to most individuals, and it requires sensory experience.

The human intellective power is sick due to the darkening and burden imposed by the corrupt body—likely a consequence of the Fall. The operation of the cognitive powers is darkened by bodily appearances (phantasmata), which obscure mental vision and prevent the clear perception of intelligible entities. This darkening of the mind is the origin of all errors. However, in the process of grasping the principles of demonstration, reason is prompted to overcome this darkness. Sensory experience, in some way, engages reason. From birth, repeated sensory experiences stimulate reason, allowing it to distinguish and discern the features initially blurred in sensory experiences and formulate universal concepts. The repeated experience of correlated perceptible phenomena leads the senses to infer imperceptible relationships among them. This awakening of reason leads to a questioning of whether these inferred connections are indeed accurate. Grosseteste illustrates this with an example borrowed from Avicenna, discussing the assertion that scammony, by itself, causes the discharge of red bile. Questioning the validity of this claim, we set up what we may call a “controlled experiment” by eliminating other known causes of red bile discharge and administering scammony to observe the outcomes. Grosseteste maintains that this process allows us to arrive “from sense at an observational (experimentale) universal principle” (Rossi 1981: 215). Hence, the mind moves out of the darkness to find a trace of its light. As Grosseteste puts it in discussing certainty,

there is a spiritual light shed on intelligible things and the mind’s eye, and this light is related to the inner eye and intelligible things in the way the bodily sun is related to bodily eyes and visible bodily things. (Rossi 1981: 240–241)

These remarks suggest that Grosseteste sees a role for spiritual light and vision in scientific knowledge. However, they also indicate his adherence to an Aristotelian framework where the human mind abstracts intelligible elements from sensory data. These intelligible items seem to align with the genera and species of created things, viewed as immanent universals.

The kind of vision and illumination that Grosseteste discusses in relation to scientific knowledge, and particularly in his account of demonstrative science, is still unclear. Is he employing a notion of divine illumination in this context, too, as he does in On Truth? Marrone (1983) suggests that he is not: the light he mentions is one that the mind itself generates to make objects intelligible and this theory does not impact Grosseteste’s account of Aristotelian science. Accordingly, the Posterior Analytics commentary would display a turn away from the conception of knowledge in On Truth in terms of divine illumination towards a purely naturalistic conception of knowledge. This interpretation, however, leans on the assumption that On Truth was written before the commentary. Moreover, as van Dyke (2009) emphasizes, this view seems inconsistent with Grosseteste’s analogy between the light in scientific knowledge and in bodily vision, suggesting that the light in scientific knowledge is external, emanating from a source beyond the mind, such as God or an intelligence, to render objects intelligible.

11. Scientific Method

Grosseteste’s keen interest in natural philosophy and science stands as a defining aspect of his intellectual pursuits. He authored numerous short scientific treatises, delving into specific issues and problems directly related to the natural world. This interest in the natural realm also permeates, in various ways, his philosophical and theological works. Over the past century, scholars have argued that Grosseteste played a pivotal role in shaping the scientific method. In particular, Crombie (1955, summarizing his work from 1953), claimed

1. that Grosseteste was the first in the Latin West to articulate an experimental method in science (1955: 98);
2. that he “seems to have been the first writer to make systematic use of a method of experimental verification and falsification” (1955: 107);
3. that he attributed “special importance to mathematics in attempting to provide scientific explanations of the physical world” (1955: 111).

These claims, however, have sparked considerable debate.

At first sight, the claim that Grosseteste developed an account of experimental method in science may be inferred from the passages describing a controlled experiment to test the effects of scammony on the discharge of red bile mentioned above (§10.3) While it is evident that Grosseteste contemplates the idea of a controlled experiment, the question arises as to whether he integrates this notion into a broader framework for scientific method in acquiring the principles of demonstrative science. The evidence supporting this claim is not robust. The discussion of scammony remains the sole reference to controlled experiments in his writings. When Grosseteste revisits this discussion later in the commentary to explain how we come to acquire experiential principles, the applicability of the notion of controlled experiment becomes questionable, for example, in the case of our understanding of the cause of an eclipse. Additionally, Grosseteste acknowledges that, in certain instances, knowledge of causal connections can be gained after a single perception (see Marrone 1986). In summary, while Grosseteste did utilize the concept of controlled experiments and connected it to demonstrative science, he did not elevate it to the status of the method for acquiring such knowledge. Controlled experiments are viewed as one among various approaches.

Concerning Grosseteste’s actual practice in his scientific writings, if an experimental method is understood as a controlled experiment, then it must be noted that Grosseteste does not employ it. His conclusions are usually drawn from a combination of factors. He relies on authority and everyday observation (experimentum), engages in thought experiments, and incorporates certain metaphysical assumptions, such as the principle that “every operation of nature occurs in the most finite, ordered, shortest and best way possible for it” (Baur 1912: 75). Nowhere does Grosseteste explicitly outline a controlled experiment as the foundation for his conclusions (see Eastwood 1968, regarding Grosseteste’s works in optics). It can be acknowledged that Grosseteste refers to empirical observation as one element among many when assessing the adequacy of certain accounts of natural phenomena. However, this is far from employing a method of experimental verification and falsification in the specific sense of a controlled experiment.

The assertion that Grosseteste assigned “special importance to mathematics in attempting to provide scientific explanations of the physical world” stands on firmer ground. In the opening of On Lines, Angles and Figures, Grosseteste underscores the significance of geometry for our understanding of natural philosophy (see Baur 1912: 59–60). Moreover, On the Nature of Places (a continuation of On Lines, Angles and Figures) concludes by stating that the natural philosopher can explain natural causation by the “power of geometry” (Baur 1912: 65). Therefore, it is evident that Grosseteste attributed a crucial role to geometry in explaining natural phenomena.

This perspective was grounded in Grosseteste’s belief that natural agents exert their influence through the multiplication of their power or species, a concept that Roger Bacon later developed in detail. Grosseteste was, of course, thinking of the action of light. He argues that knowledge propter quid must be through angles, lines, and figures because a “natural agent multiplies its power from itself to what it acts upon, whether it act upon the senses or upon matter” (Baur 1912: 60). Grosseteste maintains that the intensity of a natural agent’s operation depends on factors such as its distance from the target, the angle of impact, and the figure through which it multiplies its operation (either a sphere or a cone). He establishes rudimentary rules, including the notion that a shorter distance results in a stronger operation.

These aspects highlight Grosseteste’s profound interest in the thorough examination of natural phenomena. His mindset, together with his emphasis on the significance of mathematics, may be considered his primary contribution to the development of an incipient mathematical physics in fourteenth-century Oxford.

12. Influence

Grosseteste’s influence extended to numerous thinkers, particularly those active in Oxford. Their number includes Adam of Wodeham, John Wyclif, Robert Kilwardby, Thomas Bradwardine, Thomas Buckingham, Thomas of York, Walter Burley, William of Alnwick, William of Ockham, and others. Leaving aside his commentary on the Posterior Analytics, Grosseteste’s greatest impact as a philosopher was as a source of new ideas for thinkers flourishing in the first half of the thirteenth century. Richard Rufus of Cornwall makes extensive use of Grosseteste’s writings in his large Scriptum on Aristotle’s Metaphysics and his Oxford commentary on the Sentences of Peter Lombard, as does his Oxford contemporary Richard Fishacre in his commentary on the Sentences. These thinkers drew inspiration from Grosseteste’s On Free Decision and his writings on the eternity of the world. Rufus also praises Grosseteste’s scientific and mathematical expertise, as does Roger Bacon, a man by temperament more given to scorn than praise.

In the fourteenth century, Grosseteste held an uncommon position as an authoritative figure for Oxford philosophers. Thinkers such as Thomas Bradwardine and Thomas Buckingham appealed to Grosseteste in support of their conflicting views on future contingency. John Wyclif likewise invoked Grosseteste’s writings to bolster his views on the continuum, among other issues. These examples illustrate the high regard and reverence in which Grosseteste was held in Oxford during this period.

In the Continent, Grosseteste’s philosophical impact primarily centered around his expertise as a scholar of Aristotle. His Posterior Analytics commentary gained recognition and was widely used throughout the Middle Ages, showcasing his influence in medieval thought (for its influence in Britain, see Rossi 2012.) Grosseteste’s translation of Aristotle’s Ethics also had a meaningful impact. Beside these two crucial works, it is noteworthy that the fourteenth-century French thinker Nicole Oresme makes use of various philosophical and scientific treatises authored by Grosseteste, most notably in his Questiones super Physicam.

Bibliography

A. Bibliographies

• Gieben, Servus, 1962, “Bibliographia universa Roberti Grosseteste ab anno 1473 ad annum 1960”, Collectanea Franciscana, 39: 362–418.
• –––, 1995, “Robertus Grosseteste: Bibliographia 1970–1991”, in McEvoy 1995: 415–431.
• Thomson, S. Harrison, 1940, The Writings of Robert Grosseteste, Bishop of Lincoln, 1235–1253, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

B. Biographical Studies

Important biographical material may also be found in a number of the more general studies listed below, especially Southern 1986, McEvoy 1982, and McEvoy 2000. Grosseteste’s early career remains a matter of controversy. The literature is filled with unjustified assertions of fact and outright errors regarding this part of his life and readers must be on their guard.

• Callus, Daniel A., 1945, “The Oxford Career of Robert Grosseteste”, Oxoniensia, 10: 42–72. [Callus 1945 available online]
• Ginther, James R., 2000, “Natural Philosophy and Theology at Oxford in the Early Thirteenth Century”, Medieval Sermon Studies, 44: 108–134.
• Goering, Joseph, 1995, “Where and When did Grosseteste Study Theology”, in McEvoy 1995: 17–51.

• Schulman, N. M., 1997, “Husband, Father, Bishop? Grosseteste in Paris”, Speculum, 72(2): 330–346. doi:10.2307/3040973

  [This article argues on the basis of documentary sources that Grosseteste lived in Paris as a married (and ultimately widowed) father prior to teaching at Oxford and his episcopacy. This view is criticized by McEvoy 2003: 19–20, who notes Grosseteste’s remark in one of his prayers that he had never polluted his body with the stain of the flesh.]

C. Primary Texts in Latin

It is important to note that some of the texts quoted above from Baur 1912 and Dales 1963a rely on tacit alterations that Neil Lewis has made to the Latin text on the basis of his consultation of the manuscripts. The editions have been arranged chronologically and categorized based on the types of writings authored by Grosseteste (see section 2).

C.1 Scientific treatises

• Baur, Ludwig (ed.), 1912, Die Philosophischen Werke des Robert Grosseteste, Bischofs von Lincoln (Beiträge zur geschichte der philosophie des mittelalters 9), Münster: Aschendorff Verlag.

  [This text includes the standard edition of Grosseteste’s scientific treatises. However, this edition is unreliable and a number of works in it have been reedited (see below.)]

• Panti, Cecilia (ed.), 2001, Moti, virtù e motori celesti nella cosmologia di Roberto Grossatesta: studio ed edizione dei trattati De sphera, De cometis, De motu supercelestium (Testi e studi per il “Corpus philosophorum Medii Aevi” 16), Firenze: SISMEL: Edizioni del Galluzzo.

  [Critical editions of De sphaera, De cometis, De motu supercaelestium that supersede the editions of these works in Baur. The same text critically edited by Panti is presented in Gasper, McLeish, Smithson, and Sønnesyn 2023: 96–130.]

• Dinkova-Bruun, Greti, Tom McLeish, Giles E. M. Gasper, M. Huxtable, Cecilia Panti, and Hannah Smithson (eds/trans), 2013, The Dimensions of Colour: Robert Grosseteste’s “De colore” (Durham Medieval and Renaissance Texts 4), Durham, UK/Toronto: Institute of Mediaeval and Renaissance Studies, Durham University/Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies.
• Gasper, Giles E. M., Cecilia Panti, Tom McLeish, and Hannah E. Smithson (eds.), 2019, The Scientific Works of Robert Grosseteste. Vol. 1: Knowing and Speaking, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/actrade/9780198805519.book.1
• Gasper, Giles E. M., Tom C. B. McLeish, Hannah E. Smithson, and Sigbjørn Olsen Sønnesyn (eds.), 2023, The Scientific Works of Grosseteste (Volume II: Mapping the Universe), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Sønnesyn, Sigbjørn O. (ed.), 2019, “De artibus liberalibus” (On the Liberal Arts), in Gasper, Panti, McLeish, and Smithson 2019: 74–94.
• ––– (ed.), 2019, “De generatione sonorum” (On the Generation of Sounds), in Gasper, Panti, McLeish, and Smithson 2019: 244–254.

C.2 Philosophical treatises

• Baur, Ludwig (ed.), 1912, Die Philosophischen Werke des Robert Grosseteste, Bischofs von Lincoln (Beiträge zur geschichte der philosophie des mittelalters 9), Münster: Aschendorff Verlag.

  [This text includes the standard edition of Grosseteste’s philosophical treatises, too. As noted above, Baur’s edition is unreliable and new editions of Grosseteste’s works supersede it (see below.)]

• Dales, Richard C. (ed.), 1963b, “Robert Grosseteste’s Treatise ‘De finitate motus et temporis’”, Traditio, 19: 245–266. doi:10.1017/S0362152900010400

  [This edition supersedes the edition in Baur 1912.]

• Lewry, P. Osmund (ed.), 1983, “Robert Grosseteste’s Question on Subsistence: An Echo of the Adamites”, Mediaeval Studies, 45: 1–21. doi:10.1484/J.MS.2.306298

  [The article contains an edition of De subsistentia rei.]

• Panti, Cecilia (ed.), 2011, Roberto Grossatesta, La luce, Pisa: PLUS-Pisa University Press.

  [Text of the critical edition in Panti 2013a, but without the critical apparatus. The Latin text is accompanied by an Italian translation and commentary.]

• –––, 2013a, “Robert Grosseteste’s De luce: A Critical Edition”, in Flood, Ginther, and Goering 2013: 193–238.

  [A critical edition of De luce that supersedes the edition in Baur 1912.]

C.3 Commentaries on Aristotle

• Dales, Richard C. (ed.), 1963a, Roberti Grosseteste episcopi Lincolniensis commentarius in viii libros Physicorum Aristotelis, Boulder, CO: University of Colorado Press.

  [Unfortunately, a flawed edition of this important work that must be used with great caution. A new edition is in preparation by N. Lewis and P. King.]

• Rossi, Pietro (ed.), 1981, Commentarius in Posteriorum Analyticorum Libros, Florence: Leo S. Olschki.

C.4 Philosophical-theological works

• Luard, Henry Richards (ed.), 1861, Roberti Grosseteste Episcopi quondam Lincolniensis Epistolæ (Rerum Britannicarum Medii Ævi Scriptores 25), London: Longman, Green, Longman, and Roberts.

  [Luard’s edition of Grosseteste’s first letter, though older, is better than that found in Baur 1912, where Baur prints it, following many manuscripts, as the two works De unica forma omnium and De intelligentiis.]

• McEvoy, James (ed.), 1974, “The Sun as res and signum: Grosseteste’s commentary on Ecclesiasticus, ch. 43, vv. 1–5”, Recherches de théologie ancienne et médiévale, 41: 38–91; reprinted in McEvoy 1994.

  [This commentary is also known as De operationibus solis.]

• Lewis, Neil Timothy (ed.), 2017, Robert Grossteste “On Free Decision” (Auctores Britannici Medii Aevi 29), Oxford/New York: Published for the British Academy by Oxford University Press.

  [Editions and English translation of the two recensions of Grosseteste’s De libero arbitrio. It supersede the editions in Baur 1912.]

C.5 Theological Works

• McEvoy, James (ed.), 1980, “Robert Grosseteste’s Theory of Human Nature With the Text of His Conference ‘Ecclesia Sancta Celebrat’”, Recherches de théologie ancienne et médiévale, 47: 131–187. Reprinted in McEvoy 1994.
• Dales, Richard C. and Servus Gieben (eds.), 1982, Robert Grosseteste: Hexaëmeron (Auctores Britannici Medii Aevi 6), London/New York: Published for the British Academy by the Oxford University.
• Dales, Richard C. and Edward B. King (eds.), 1986, Robert Grosseteste: De cessatione legalium (Auctores Britannici Medii Aevi 7), London/New York: published for the British Academy by the Oxford University Press.
• ––– (eds.), 1987, Robert Grossetese: De Decem Mandatis (Auctores Britannici Medii Aevi 10), Oxford: published for the British Academy by Oxford University Press.

C.6 Other writings

• Rosemann, Philipp W. (ed.), 1995, “Tabula”, in Opera Roberti Grosseteste Lincolniensis 1 (Corpus Christianorum 130), Turnhout: Brepols.

D. Primary Texts in English Translation

D.1 Scientific treatises

• Crombie, A. C., 1955, “Grosseteste’s Position in the History of Science”, in Robert Grosseteste: Scholar and Bishop, Daniel A. Callus (ed.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 98–120.

  [Contains a translation of De calore solis (116–120). The authenticity of this work is challenged in Panti 2013b.]

• Dales, Richard C., 1966, “The Text of Robert Grosseteste’s Questio de fluxu et refluxu maris with an English Translation”, Isis, 57(4): 455–474. Reprinted in A Source Book in Medieval Science, Edward Grant (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 640–644; and in Dales 1973. doi:10.1086/350162

  [The authenticity of this work is challenged in Dales 1977, Southern 1986, and Panti 2013b.]

• –––, 1973, The Scientific Achievement of the Middle Ages, Philadelphia, PA: University of Pennsylvania Press.

  [Contains translations of De impressionibus elementorum, De calore solis and De fluxu et refluxu maris. The authenticity of the last work is challenged in Dales 1977, Southern 1986, and Panti 2013b. Panti 2013b also challenges the authenticity of De calore solis]

• Lindberg, David C. (trans.), 1974, “Robert Grosseteste and the Revival of Optics in the West”, in A Source Book in Medieval Science, Edward Grant (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 384–391.

  [Translations of De lineis, angulis et figuris (Concerning Lines, Angles, and Figures) and De iride (On the Rainbow).]

• Sønnesyn, Sigbjørn Olsen, 2019a, “On the Liberal Arts”, in Gasper, Panti, McLeish, and Smithson 2019: 75–95.
• –––, 2019b, “On the Generation of Sound”, in Gasper, Panti, McLeish, and Smithson 2019: 245–255.

• –––, 2023, “On the Sphere”, in Gasper, McLeish, Smithson, and Sønnesyn 2023, 97–131. doi:10.1093/actrade/9780198805526.book.1

  [Translation based on the critical edition in Panti 2001.]

D.2 Philosophical treatises

• McKeon, Richard (trans.), 1929, Selections from Medieval Philosophers, Volume 1. New York: Charles Scribner’s Sons, 263–287.

  [Translations of De veritate, De veritate propositionis, and De scientia Dei based on the text in Baur 1912.]

• Lewis, Neil, 2013, “Robert Grosseteste’s On Light: An English Translation”, in Robert Grosseteste and His Intellectual Milieu, John Flood, James R. Ginther, and Joseph W. Goering (eds.), Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies, 239–247. doi:10.1515/9781771103534-015

  [A translation of De luce based on the critical edition in Panti 2013a.]

D.3 Theological-philosophical works

• Lewis, Neil Timothy (trans.), 2017, The Two Recensions of “On Free Decision” (Auctores Britannici Medii Aevi 29), Oxford/New York: Published for the British Academy by Oxford University Press.

  [Editions and English translation of the two recensions of Grosseteste’s De libero arbitrio.]

• Mantello, Frank Anthony Carl and Joseph Goering (trans), 2010, The Letters of Robert Grosseteste, Bishop of Lincoln, Toronto: University of Toronto Press.

  [An annotated translation of Grosseteste’s letters, including the first letter, which circulated in the middle ages as two works, De unica forma omnium and De intelligentiis.]

D.4 Theological works

• Martin, C. F. J. (trans.), 1996, Robert Grosseteste on the Six Days of Creation: A Translation of the Hexaëmeron (Auctores Britannici Medii Aevi, 6 (2)), Oxford/New York: Published for the British Academy by Oxford University Press.

• Hildebrand, Stephen M. (trans.), 2012, On the Cessation of the Laws (The Fathers of the Church, Mediaeval Continuation 13), Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press.

  [A translation of De cessatione legalium]

E. Secondary Literature

• Baur, Ludwig, 1917, Die Philosophie des Robert Grosseteste, bischofs von Lincoln (Beiträge zur Geschichte der Philosophie des Mittelalters, bd. XVIII, hft. 4–6), Münster: Aschendorff Verlag.
• Beullens, Pieter, 2023a, “Robert Grosseteste’s Translation of Simplicius’s Commentary on Aristotle’s De Caelo: Tracking down a Second Manuscript and the Greek Model”, Mediterranea. International Journal on the Transfer of Knowledge, 8: 565–594. doi:10.21071/mijtk.v8i.15273
• –––, 2023b, “Robert Grosseteste and the Fluid History of the Latin ‘Nicomachean Ethics’”, Revista Española de Filosofía Medieval, 30(1): 177–198. doi:10.21071/refime.v30i1.15609
• Callus, Daniel Angelo Philip, 1955, “Robert Grosseteste as Scholar”, in Robert Grosseteste: Scholar and Bishop. Essays in Commemoration of the Seventh Centenary of His Death, Daniel Angelo Philip Callus (ed.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1–69.

• Crombie, A. C., 1953, Robert Grosseteste and the Origins of Experimental Science, 1100–1700, Oxford: Clarendon Press.

  [An important but controversial book.]

• Cunningham, Jack P. (ed.), 2012, Robert Grosseteste: His Thought and Its Impact (Papers in Mediaeval Studies 21), Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies.

• Cunningham, Jack P. and Mark Hocknull (eds.), 2016, Robert Grosseteste and the Pursuit of Religious and Scientific Learning in the Middle Ages (Studies in the History of Philosophy of Mind 18), Cham: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-319-33468-4

  [The volume offers many important contributions to the study of Robert Grosseteste’s thought.]

• Dales, Richard C., 1961, “Robert Grosseteste’s Scientific Works”, Isis, 52(3): 381–402. doi:10.1086/349477
• –––, 1977, “Adam Marsh, Robert Grosseteste, and the Treatise on the Tides”, Speculum, 52(4): 900–901. doi:10.2307/2855379
• –––, 1986, “Robert Grosseteste’s Place in Medieval Discussions of the Eternity of the World”, Speculum, 61(3): 544–563. doi:10.2307/2851595
• Devriese, Lisa, 2023, “The History of Robert Grosseteste’s Translations within the Context of ‘Aristoteles Latinus’”, Revista Española de Filosofía Medieval, 30(1): 199–222. doi:10.21071/refime.v30i1.16127
• Dionisotti, A. C., 1988, “On the Greek Studies of Robert Grosseteste”, in The Uses of Greek and Latin: Historical Essays (Warburg Institute Surveys and Texts 16), A. C. Dionisotti, Anthony Grafton, and Jill Kraye (eds.), London: The Warburg Institute, University of London, 19–39.
• Eastwood, Bruce S., 1968, “Mediaeval Empiricism: The Case of Grosseteste’s Optics”, Speculum, 43(2): 306–321. doi:10.2307/2855937
• Evans, Gillian Rosemary, 1983, “The Conclusiones of Robert Grosseteste’s Commentary on the Posterior Analytics”, Studi Medievali, series 3, 24: 729–734.

• Flood, John, James R. Ginther, and Joseph Goering (eds.), 2013, Robert Grosseteste and His Intellectual Milieu: New Editions and Studies (Papers in Mediaeval Studies 24), Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies.

  [This volume offers new editions and translations of Grosseteste’s works as well as important studies.]

• Gauthier, R. A., 1982, “Notes sur les débuts (1225–1240) du premier ‘Averroïsme’”, Revue des Sciences philosophiques et théologiques, 66(3): 321–374.
• Gieben, Servus, 2003, “Grosseteste and Universal Science”, in Robert Grosseteste and the Beginnings of a British Theological Tradition: Papers Delivered at the Grosseteste Colloquium Held at the Greyfriars, Oxford on 3rd July 2002 (Bibliotheca Seraphico-Capuccina 69), Maura O’Carroll (ed.), Roma: Istituto storico dei Cappuccini, 219–238.
• Gilson, Étienne, 1926–7, “Pourquoi Saint Thomas a Critiqué Saint Augustin”, Archives d’histoire doctrinale et littéraire du Moyen Âge, 1: 5–127.
• Laird, W. R., 1987, “Robert Grosseteste on the Subalternate Sciences”, Traditio, 43: 147–169. doi:10.1017/S0362152900012514
• Laird, Edgar, 2013, “Robert Grosseteste, Ptolemy, and Christian Knowledge”, in Flood, Ginther, and Goering 2013: 131–152. doi:10.1515/9781771103534-011
• Lewis, Neil, 1996, “Power and Contingency in Robert Grosseteste and Duns Scotus”, in John Duns Scotus: Metaphysics and Ethics (Studien und texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters 53), Ludger Honnefelder, Rega Wood, and Mechthild Dreyer (eds.), Leiden: Brill, 205–225.
• –––, 1998, “The Problem of a Plurality of Eternal Beings in Robert Grosseteste”, Medieval Philosophy & Theology, 7(1): 17–38. doi:10.5840/medievalpt1998712
• –––, 2003, “Robert Grosseteste’s Notes on the Physics”, in Mackie and Goering 2003: 103–134 (ch. 5). doi:10.3138/9781442674271-008
• –––, 2005, “Robert Grosseteste and the Continuum”, in Albertus Magnus and the beginnings of the medieval reception of Aristotle in the Latin West: from Richardus Rufus to Franciscus de Mayronis (Subsidia Albertina 1), Ludger Honnefelder, Rega Wood, Mechthild Dreyer, and Marc-Aeilko Aris (eds.), Münster: Aschendorff Verlag, 159–187.
• –––, 2009, “Grosseteste on Being”, The Modern Schoolman, 86(1): 25–46. doi:10.5840/schoolman2008/2009861/22
• –––, 2012, “Robert Grosseteste and Richard Rufus of Cornwall on Unequal Infinites”, in Cunningham 2012: 227–256.
• –––, 2013, “Libertas arbitrii in Robert Grosseteste’s De libero arbitrio”, in Flood, Ginther, and Goering 2013: 11–33. doi:10.1515/9781771103534-006
• –––, 2023, “Corporeity, Corpus-Substantia, and Corpus-Quantum in Grosseteste’s Commentaries on the Physics and Posterior Analytics”, Revista Española de Filosofía Medieval, 30(1): 149–175. doi:10.21071/refime.v30i1.16366

• Longeway, John, 2007, Demonstration and Scientific Knowledge in William of Ockham: A Translation of Summa logicae III-II: De syllogismo demonstrativo, and Selections from the Prologue to the Ordinatio, Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.

  [See pp. 13–46 for an account of Grosseteste’s views on demonstrative science.]

• Lynch, Lawrence E., 1941, “The Doctrine of Divine Ideas and Illumination in Robert Grosseteste, Bishop of Lincoln”, Mediaeval Studies, 3: 161–173. doi:10.1484/J.MS.2.305864
• Mackie, Evelyn A. and Joseph Goering (eds.), 2003, Editing Robert Grosseteste: Papers given at the Thirty-Sixth Annual Conference on Editorial Problems, University of Toronto, 3–4 November 2000 (Previous Conference Publications 2000), Toronto: University of Toronto Press. doi:10.3138/9781442674271

• Marrone, Steven P., 1983, William of Auvergne and Robert Grosseteste: New Ideas of Truth in the Early Thirteenth Century, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.

  [An important study of Grosseteste’s epistemology, though Marrone’s view that Grosseteste was distancing himself from an illuminationist epistemology in the commentary on the Posterior Analytics is generally rejected by scholars.]

• –––, 1986, “Robert Grosseteste on the Certitude of Induction”, in L’homme et son univers au moyen âge: actes du septième Congrès international de philosophie médiévale (30 août – 4 septembre 1982), Volume 2 (Philosophes médiévaux 27), Christian Wenin (ed.), Louvain-la-Neuve: Editions de l’Institut supérieur de philosophie, 481–488.

• McEvoy, James J., 1982, The Philosophy of Robert Grosseteste, Oxford: Clarendon Press. Corrected reprint, 1986.

  [A magisterial study of Grosseteste’s thought. This work includes significant material on Grosseteste’s theological views in his commentaries on the pseudo-Dionysius.]

• –––, 1983, “The Chronology of Robert Grosseteste’s Writings on Nature and Natural Philosophy”, Speculum, 58(3): 614–655.

• –––, 1994, Robert Grosseteste, Exegete and Philosopher (Variorum Collected Studies Series CS446), Aldershot/Brookfield, VT: Variorum.

  [A collection of articles written by this pre-eminent student of Grosseteste.]

• ––– (ed.), 1995, Robert Grosseteste: New Perspectives on His Thought and Scholarship (Instrumenta Patristica 27), Turnhout: Brepols Publishers. doi:10.1484/M.IPM-EB.5.112138

• –––, 2000, Robert Grosseteste (Great Medieval Thinkers), New York: Oxford University Press.

  [An excellent overview of Grosseteste’s life and thought; essential first reading for the prospective student of Grosseteste.]

• –––, 2003, “Robert Grosseteste: The Man and His Legacy”, in Mackie and Goering 2003: 1–30 (ch. 1). doi:10.3138/9781442674271-004
• Noone, Timothy, 2010, “Truth, Creation, and Intelligibility in Anselm, Grosseteste, and Bonaventure”, in Truth: Studies of a Robust Presence (Studies in Philosophy and the History of Philosophy 51), Kurt Pritzl (ed.), Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press, 102–126 (ch. 3).
• Oliver, Simon, 2004, “Robert Grosseteste on Light, Truth and Experimentum”, Vivarium, 42(2): 151–180. doi:10.1163/1568534043084739
• Palma, Robert J., 1975, “Robert Grosseteste’s Understanding of Truth”, Irish Theological Quarterly, 42(4): 300–306. doi:10.1177/002114007504200406
• –––, 1976, “Grosseteste’s Ordering of Scientia”, New Scholasticism, 50(4): 447–463. doi:10.5840/newscholas19765043
• Panti, Cecilia, 1999, “L’incorporazione della luce secondo Roberto Grossatesta”, Medioevo e rinascimento, new series, 13(10): 45–102.
• –––, 2003, “Robert Grosseteste’s Early Cosmology”, in Mackie and Goering 2003: 135–166 (ch. 6). doi:10.3138/9781442674271-009
• –––, 2012, “The Evolution of the Idea of Corporeity in Robert Grosseteste’s Writings”, in Cunningham 2012: 111–139.
• –––, 2013b, “Robert Grosseteste and Adam of Exeter’s Physics of Light Remarks on the Transmission, Authenticity, and Chronology of Grosseteste’s Scientific Opuscula”, in Flood, Ginther, and Goering 2013: 165–190. doi:10.1515/9781771103534-013
• –––, 2017a, “The Scientific Basis of Robert Grosseteste’s Teaching at the Oxford Franciscan School”, in The English Province of the Franciscans (1224–c.1350), Michael J. P. Robson (ed.), Leiden/Boston: Brill, 247–272.
• –––, 2017b, “Matter and Infinity in Robert Grosseteste’s De luce and Notes on the Physics”, in Materia: nouvelles perspectives de recherche dans la pensée et la culture médiévales (XIIe-XVIe siècles), Tiziana Suarez-Nani and Agostino Paravicini Bagliani (eds.), Firenze: SISMEL – Edizioni del Galluzzo, 27–55.
• –––, 2018, “The Theological Use of Science at the Oxford Franciscan School: Thomas Docking, Roger Bacon, and Robert Grosseteste’s Works”, in The Franciscan Order in the Medieval English Province and Beyond (Church, Faith and Culture in the Medieval West), Michael J. P. Robson and Patrick Zutshi (eds.), Amsterdam: Amsterdam University Press, 181–210.
• –––, 2021a, “The Oxford-Paris Connection of Optics and the Theory of Rainbow: Grosseteste’s De iride, pseudo-Oresme’s Inter omnes impressiones and Bacon’s Perspectiva in Paris, BnF, lat. 7434”, in Les Sciences au Moyen Âge (XIIIe-XVe siècle). Autour de Micrologus, Danielle Jacquart and Agostino Paravicini Bagliani (eds.), Florence: SISMEL–Edizioni del Galluzzo, 251–280.
• –––, 2021b, “Adam Rufus of Exeter, Master and Minor (d. 1234): A State of the Art”, in Early Thirteenth-Century English Franciscan Thought, Lydia Schumacher (ed.), Berlin: De Gruyter, 93–126. doi:10.1515/9783110684834-005
• –––, 2023, “In the Margins of the ‘Posterior Analytics’: Robert Grosseteste and the ‘Latin Philoponus’”, Revista Española de Filosofía Medieval, 30(1): 15–52. doi:10.21071/refime.v30i1.16356
• Pickavé, Martin, 2017, “Robert Grosseteste on Free Choice”, in From Learning to Love: Schools, Law, and Pastoral Care in the Middle Ages: Essays in Honour of Joseph W. Goering (Papers in Mediaeval Studies 29), Tristan Sharp (ed.), Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies, 70–89.
• Polloni, Nicola, 2021a, “Early Robert Grosseteste on Matter”, Notes and Records: The Royal Society Journal of the History of Science, 75(3): 397–414. doi:10.1098/rsnr.2020.0017
• –––, 2021b, “Robert Grosseteste on Motion, Bodies, and Light”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 29(6): 1034–1053. doi:10.1080/09608788.2021.1939651
• Rossi, Pietro, 1995, “Robert Grosseteste and the Object of Scientific Knowledge”, in McEvoy 1995: 53–76.
• –––, 2012, “Grosseteste’s Influence on Thirteenth- and Fourteenth-Century British Commentaries on Posterior Analytics”, in Cunningham 2012: 140–166.

• Serene, Eileen F., 1979, “Robert Grosseteste on Induction and Demonstrative Science”, Synthese, 40(1): 97–115. doi:10.1007/BF00413947

  [A response to Crombie 1953.]

• Smith, Brett W., 2018, “‘A Theme Song of His Life’: Aspectus and Affectus in the Writings of Robert Grosseteste”, Franciscan Studies, 76(1): 1–22. doi:10.1353/frc.2018.0000
• –––, 2022, “Scotus and Grosseteste on Phantasms and Illumination”, American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly, 96(4): 597–617. doi:10.5840/acpq2022822258
• –––, 2023, ‘Aspectus’ and ‘Affectus’ in the Thought of Robert Grosseteste, Rome: IF Press.

• Southern, R. W., 1986, Robert Grosseteste: The Growth of an English Mind in Medieval Europe, Oxford: Clarendon Press. Second edition, 1992.

  [One of the most important works on Grosseteste in recent years. The second edition contains a long reply to some criticisms of the first edition.]

• Van Dyke, Christina, 2009, “An Aristotelian Theory of Divine Illumination: Robert Grosseteste’s Commentary on the Posterior Analytics”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 17(4): 685–704. doi:10.1080/09608780902986581
• –––, 2010, “The Truth, the Whole Truth, and Nothing but the Truth: Robert Grosseteste on Universals (and the Posterior Analytics )”, Journal of the History of Philosophy, 48(2): 153–170. doi:10.1353/hph.0.0207

• Wallace, William A., 1972, Causality and Scientific Explanation, Volume 1: Medieval and Early Classical Science, Ann Arbor, MI: University of Michigan Press.

  [Chapter 2 discusses Grosseteste’s account of demonstrative science.]

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