David Hume

First published Tue Jun 16, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Hsueh Qu and Elizabeth S. Radcliffe replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous authors.]

David Hume (1711–1776), a prominent intellectual of the Scottish Enlightenment, is renowned as the modern thinker who most rigorously applied the experimental method to traditional problems in philosophy. His impact, overall, is arguably even greater than Scottish luminaries such as Adam Smith and Thomas Reid, and Rousseau and Voltaire on the French side. His approach generated innovative theories of human understanding, knowledge, belief, emotion, moral and political practice, and other areas of human endeavor. Hume’s early philosophical writing earned him a reputation in the eighteenth century as a sceptical and atheistic thinker, although these were not necessarily accurate labels. Hume’s account of human nature is said to have subverted the authority of reason and made the case that even belief is a function of feeling, thus casting doubt “on the very possibility of enlightened reform and improvement” (Harris 2015, 21). Hume’s views were subtle, however, and often misunderstood by his contemporaries. He does offer norms for improving ourselves and society. How he does so, given his scientific, descriptive approach, is territory for debate.

Hume was more appreciated for his histories and essays than his philosophical works in his own time, but posterity has been somewhat kinder to Hume’s philosophical work: in terms of impact on contemporary philosophy, he remains one of the most influential figures in the history of philosophy. Today, Hume is famous for, among other themes, his scepticism; his philosophical naturalism; his anti-realism, particularly in ethics; his philosophical challenges to religion; and his theory of the mind, which can be seen as a nascent endeavour in cognitive science.

1. Life and Works

David Hume was born in Edinburgh to a comfortable though not wealthy upbringing. His mother was responsible for his education until he studied at the University of Edinburgh at the age of eleven, leaving at the age of fifteen. As a second son, Hume would have to make his own fortune in the world; his family encouraged him to pursue a legal career, but he had neither the interest nor inclination for this path, turning his mind instead to philosophical study. His studies would engender a nervous breakdown in 1729, and it would take him a few years to recover. In 1734, Hume moved to La Flѐche in France, where at the tender age of 23, he began writing A Treatise of Human Nature, to be among the most important philosophical works. Books 1 and 2 of the Treatise were published anonymously in 1739, with Book 3 (as well as a similarly anonymous “Abstract” of the first two books) following a year later in 1740.

While Hume’s declaration that the Treatise fell “deadborn from the press” (MOL 6) is an exaggeration, it certainly did far less spectacularly than he was hoping. It did provoke a hostile reaction from some thinkers who would paint Hume as an atheist and sceptic, a reputation that would dog him for the rest of his days, notably when he applied for the Chair of Ethics and Pneumatical Philosophy at Edinburgh in 1745. Hume’s application was publicly opposed due to his intellectual notoriety, provoking him to anonymously publish a “Letter from a Gentleman to his Friend in Edinburgh” rebutting the charges that had been made against the Treatise. Despite his efforts, Hume was ultimately unsuccessful in his application, and failed again in 1751 to secure the Chair of Logic at Glasgow; he would never find academic employment.

Hume’s essays and histories enjoyed somewhat more popular success than his philosophical works in his own time. Following the publication of the Treatise, Hume published a volume of Essays, Moral and Political in 1741, with a second volume appearing the following year; the essays were aimed at a more popular audience than the Treatise, and much better-received. In 1752, Hume published the Political Discourses, which was so successful that a second edition was published in the same year, with a third following in 1754. Meanwhile, also in 1752, Hume began employment as librarian of the Advocates Library in Edinburgh, which granted him tremendous intellectual access. Hume would take full advantage of this opportunity to initiate a literary career as a historian. From 1754 to 1762, A History of England was published in six volumes, and enjoyed a stunning reception.

Despite his disappointment with the Treatise’s reception, and the success of his essays, Hume would not be dissuaded from returning to philosophy. In 1748, he published An Enquiry concerning Human Understanding, although it initially appeared under the title Philosophical Essays concerning Human Understanding—it would be renamed in a later edition of 1758. This first Enquiry covers similar topics to Book 1 of the Treatise, although it is much shorter and written more accessibly. Hume would then publish the Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals in 1751, which he praised as “incomparably the best” of all his works (MOL 10). An analogue to the first Enquiry, the second Enquiry covers some of the material of Book 3 of the Treatise, although again it is more concise and approachable than the Treatise.

The Four Dissertations appeared in 1757 as part of the Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects, alongside the two Enquiries, the Political Discourses, and the Essays, Moral and Political. The Four Dissertations comprise the Dissertation on the Passions, the Natural History of Religion, Of Tragedy, and Of the Standard of Taste. While the two Enquiries covered similar material to Book 1 and 3 of the Treatise, the Dissertation on the Passions covers some of the material found in Book 2. The Dissertation is, however, much shorter than the two Enquiries, and much of the material found within is only lightly edited from the Treatise.

The relation between Hume’s earlier philosophical work (viz. the Treatise) and his later (mainly the two Enquiries) is an important and difficult interpretive issue. Hume was clearly dissatisfied with the Treatise from an early stage. Three years before the publication of the first Enquiry, Hume states that he regretted not delaying the publication of the Treatise, because he “might have rendered it much less imperfect by further Corrections and Revisals” (LG 41). In a 1751 letter to Gilbert Elliot of Minto, he notes that “so vast an Undertaking, plan’d before I was one and twenty, and compos’d before twenty five, must necessarily be very defective. I have repented my Haste a hundred, and a hundred times” (HL i.158). In a 1754 letter to John Stewart, he describes the publication of the Treatise as “a very great Mistake in conduct” (HL i.187).

Moreover, Hume clearly grew frustrated at critics such as Thomas Reid and James Beattie who directed critical arguments against the Treatise, which Hume had come to see as an immature work. In 1775, Hume would insist that his publisher insert an “Advertisement” into editions of his Essays and Treatises urging readers to direct their attention to his later work instead of the Treatise. It concludes: “the Author desires, that the following Pieces may alone be regarded as containing his philosophical sentiments and principles.” In a letter to his publisher, William Strahan, Hume describes this Advertisement as “a compleat Answer to Dr Reid and to that bigoted silly Fellow, Beattie” (HL ii.301).

Hume’s repeated and heartfelt repudiations of the Treatise point to the later work constituting a significant improvement on the earlier. But this picture is complicated by Hume’s frequent statements minimising the philosophical differences between the two. In the 1751 letter to Gilbert Elliot, he notes that “by shortening and simplifying the Questions, I really render them more complete,” adding that “the philosophical Principles are the same in both” (HL i.158). And in the short autobiographical “My Own Life,” written as his end approached, he states that the lack of success of the Treatise was more due to “the manner than the matter,” which led him to “cast… anew” Book 1 as the first Enquiry.

Does Hume’s later philosophy constitute a substantive improvement over the earlier? Or is it just a simplified version produced for a wider audience? The latter view has occasionally been explicitly endorsed since the dawn of Hume scholarship (e.g. Selby-Bigge 1894 [1975]), but perhaps its real legacy is more tacit: this interpretive viewpoint might be seen as implicitly motivating, at least to some degree, the scholarly focus on the Treatise at the expense of Hume’s later work that has pervaded over the years.

On the other hand, there is the view that Hume’s later work constitutes a marked improvement over the earlier (Millican 2002a), and this interpretive line has gained significant traction in recent years; for instance, commentators have argued that Hume’s epistemology undergoes a significant evolution in the first Enquiry (Qu 2020); or that the Four Dissertations constitutes Hume’s “Enquiry concerning the Passions” and embodies noteworthy changes in Hume’s system (Merivale 2019); or that Hume’s second Enquiry differs from Book 3 with respect to method, structure, and aims (Taylor 2020a). Even if one is not entirely persuaded by this line of interpretation, it is clear that at the very least, Hume’s later works merit serious scholarly consideration on their own terms.

Hume followed his stint as Librarian to the Edinburgh Faculty of Advocates with an undertaking as private secretary to the British Ambassador to France in 1763. Hume greatly enjoyed his time in Paris, receiving from the Parisian literati the adulation that he had craved all his life. Returning to Edinburgh in 1766, he then agreed to host Jean-Jacques Rousseau (1712–1778), who was in need of refuge. Rousseau’s paranoia would not spare his gracious host, and the relationship, which had started promisingly, turned remarkably sour.

Hume spent significant time and effort in his remaining years revising his Essays and Treatises on Several Subjects. He was diagnosed with terminal abdominal cancer in 1775, and took pains to ensure the posthumous publication of the Dialogues concerning Natural Religion, which he had initially worked on in the early 1750s—he had put off publishing the work on the advice of well-intentioned friends. Hume passed away from his illness peacefully in 1776, and the Dialogues appeared in 1779.

2. Philosophy of Mind, Metaphysics, and Epistemology

Hume writes about what we would now call “core” analytic philosophy in Book 1 of the Treatise and the Enquiry concerning Human Understanding: philosophy of mind, metaphysics, and epistemology. (Philosophy of language would only come to mainstream popularity long after Hume’s time.)

2.1 Philosophy of Mind

Hume’s commitment to empiricism, modelled after Locke’s, drives his philosophical methodology; in this, Hume’s project is suffused with a reverence for the authority of experience (Schliesser 2007; Boehm 2013). The Treatise carries the following subtitle: “An attempt to introduce the experimental Method of Reasoning into Moral Subjects.” By “moral subjects” Hume does not refer specifically to ethics, but rather any subjects that concern human nature (e.g., politics, psychology, economics). The experimental method that Hume employs is one borrowed from the sciences, and is founded on empirical observation; it embodies the concept of experimentum crucis—an experiment able to decide between competing hypotheses (Demeter 2012). The method also crucially involves a process of systematisation (Demeter 2012; Hazony 2014). This is explicit in Section 1 of the Enquiry concerning Human Understanding, which characterises Hume’s project as involving the discovery of “secret springs and principles” (EHU 1.15) underpinning the human mind. This experimental method drives Hume’s discoveries with regard to the workings of our minds.

Hume’s ontology of the mind recognises only one broad category of mental object: what he calls perceptions. His taxonomy of perceptions is as follows. Perceptions can be divided into impressions and ideas, and Hume describes the difference between them as the difference between feeling and thinking respectively (T 1.1.1.1). Impressions comprise impressions of sensation (which we receive through external senses such as sight, touch, taste and so forth) and impressions of reflection (which are our immediate responses to ideas and sensations, such as desires, passions, and emotions). Ideas include memories, the products of the imagination, and beliefs.

Perceptions may be simple or complex. Hume endorses a compositional theory of the mind, whereby complex perceptions are constituted by simple perceptions; simple perceptions are those that cannot be divided into any other (T 1.1.1.2).

Hume observes that impressions are distinguished from ideas in virtue of their greater force or vivacity (T 1.1.1.3). One’s memory of a sharp pain is qualitatively different from one’s impression of the same pain: the latter strikes us with a certain force that the latter lacks. Importantly, the vivacity of a perception is to be distinguished from its content—in the above case, the content of our impression of pain is identical to that of our idea of pain (we are remembering the same event that we experienced), but their vivacity differs. Hume is rather vague when it comes to pinning down the notion of vivacity. He describes (or rather, fails to describe) it as a jene-scai-quoi—a quality I know not what—although he is confident that his readers will know what he is referring to (T 1.3.8.16). He also refers to it as a manner of conception. A dispositional reading of vivacity has been proposed: vivacious perceptions are those which tend to infix stably on the mind (Loeb 2002). However, a phenomenological notion of vivacity seems more accurate to the texts (Marušić 2010).

With this theoretical apparatus, Hume proposes the first major philosophical result of both Book 1 of the Treatise and the first Enquiry, known as the Copy Principle: all simple ideas are exactly resembling (albeit less vivacious) copies of simple impressions (T 1.1.2.1; EHU 2.5). The thesis has two components: one, that simple ideas are caused by simple impressions; second, that simple ideas are qualitatively identical to (albeit less vivacious than) simple impressions. The Copy Principle also raises a number of difficult questions about mental representation, since it seems that ideas represent the impressions they are copied from. One notable such issue is whether the copying relation is necessary or sufficient for mental representation (Landy 2012; Schafer 2015; Cottrell 2018).

Having just proposed the Copy Principle, Hume immediately recognises a counterexample to it, that is, ‘the missing shade of blue’:

Suppose, therefore, a person to have enjoyed his sight for thirty years, and to have become perfectly acquainted with colours of all kinds, except one particular shade of blue, for instance, which it never has been his fortune to meet with. Let all the different shades of that colour, except that single one, be placed before him, descending gradually from the deepest to the lightest; it is plain, that he will perceive a blank, where that shade is wanting, and will be sensible, that there is a greater distance in that place between the contiguous colours than in any other. (EHU 2.8)

Yet Hume seems unperturbed by this counterexample, and continues to build his philosophical system on the cornerstone of the Copy Principle. The reason for this lack of concern on Hume’s part is because the missing shade of blue is relatively unusual in involving gradation, and so does not generalise to the uses for which Hume intends to employ the Copy Principle (Fogelin 1984; Garrett 1985; Durland 1996).

Also fundamental to Hume’s account of the mind are the principles of association, which serve to tie different perceptions together. He identifies three such principles: resemblance, contiguity in time or place, and causation, with the last being the strongest (T 1.1.4.1). First, perceptions will bring to mind to qualitatively similar perceptions: seeing a Spitz might make you think of your childhood dog of the same breed. Second, perceptions will bring to mind perceptions that occurred close by in time or space: think of trying to find your keys by retracing your steps in temporal order. Finally, perceptions will bring to mind causally related perceptions: thinking of a footballer might make you think of a particularly memorable goal that they scored.

Hume employs the Copy Principle to great effect. One of his applications of this principle in the Treatise is to the topic of personal identity. Unable to find any impression of an enduring and substantive self underlying our perceptions, Hume concludes that we have no such idea; he thus argues that the self—at least “as it regards our thought or imagination” (T 1.4.6.5)—should be identified as a bundle (when considered synchronically) or succession (when considered diachronically) of associated perceptions. However, he voices doubt regarding this theory in the Appendix to the Treatise. Hume’s diagnosis of the exact problem he sees is notoriously unclear: he says he cannot render consistent the distinctness of our perceptions and the inability of the mind to perceive real connections between distinct existences, but these two principles are not inconsistent in themselves. Many commentators have offered a variety of accounts in order to square this circle, but it is fair to say that consensus has not been established on this point (Garrett 1981; Swain 1991; Baxter 1998; Ainslie 2008; McIntyre 2008; Cottrell 2015).

2.2 Metaphysics

One of Hume’s most fundamental contributions to metaphysics is what is now known as ‘Hume’s Fork,’ which divides knowledge into “relations of ideas” and “matters of fact” (EHU 4.1). The former are justified independently of experience. For instance, mathematical knowledge such as “2+2=4” holds true regardless of any contingent fact about the world. Meanwhile, matters of fact can only be justified by experience, and they can be conceived as true or false without contradiction. For instance, consider the statement that “sharks are carnivores”: we can conceive sharks to have been herbivores without any conceptual contradiction.

Hume’s Fork thus suggests a natural division of knowledge into two kinds. Relations of ideas are a priori (justified independently of experience), analytic (true in virtue of meaning, with conceptually contradictory negations), and necessary (could not have been false). Meanwhile, matters of fact are a posteriori (justified by experience), synthetic (true in virtue of some empirical fact, with negations that are not conceptually contradictory), and contingent (could have been false). This neat and plausible distinction would later be famously problematised along various dimensions by Immanuel Kant (1724–1804) who proposes the synthetic a priori, founding his system of transcendental idealism in the Critique of Pure Reason (1781/1787) on it, and eventually Saul Kripke’s (1940–2022) Naming and Necessity (1980), among others. Recent scholarship such as (Millican 2017) has continued to raise philosophical worries about this distinction.

Relatedly, Hume endorses the “Conceivability Principle”: the principle that whatever is conceivable is metaphysically possible (T 1.2.2.8). For instance, we can conceive of sharks being herbivores, and thus it is a metaphysical possibility. Hume never explicitly states why our imagination should be expected to correspond to anything like metaphysical possibility. One way to bridge this gap is to read the Conceivability Principle as founded on an expressivist theory of modality on Hume’s part (Holden 2014).

Another prominent, albeit less influential, metaphysical principle in Hume’s work is the “Separability Principle,” (T 1.1.7.3) which plays a major role in the Treatise, although it is not explicitly mentioned in the Enquiry concerning Human Understanding; that said, it has been suggested that this principle nevertheless plays a background role in the later work (Clay 2024). The Separability Principle states that any two things that are mentally separable are also distinguishable and metaphysically distinct; more specifically, the three (mental separability, distinguishability, and metaphysical distinctness) are equivalent in that they stand in biconditional relations to each other. This principle poses a number of problems for Hume. Most famously, Hume proposes the distinctions of reason in T 1.1.7.17, which are distinctions that seemingly do not imply genuine metaphysical separability, such as the distinction between figure and body; however, this worry seems resolvable (Garrett 1997; Baxter 2011). The Separability Principle is also problematic with regard to complex ideas: complexes do not have existence independent of their constituents, but are distinguishable from them (Hakkarainen 2012; Qu 2022).

Hume’s most famous contribution to metaphysics might well be his theory of causation. Hume takes there to be three components to our idea of causation: first, spatial contiguity, second, priority in time of cause before effect, and most importantly, the necessary connection between cause and effect. Hume applies his Copy Principle (assuming without argument that the idea of necessary connection is a simple one) and searches for the impression that gives rise to our idea of necessary connection.

Hume searches for this impression in a systematic fashion, considering four possibilities across two dichotomies: external and internal impressions, and single- and multiple-instanced cases. The single-instanced cases, both internal and external, are dead ends. Hume has a lengthy and nuanced discussion, but the bottom line is that such single-instanced cases never give us an experience of genuine connection between cause and effect; we can only learn their connection through experience. A multiple-instanced case offers no external impression of necessary connection, because repetition adds nothing new to the objects themselves. Repetition does add something to our internal perceptions though—it gives rise to an impression of reflection that accompanies observations of repeated events. This impression of reflection is something like an internal feeling of expectation of seeing one causal relata upon seeing the other. Hume takes us to project our causal tendencies into observed regularities due to the “great propensity” of the mind “to spread itself on external objects” (T 1.3.14.25).

There has been considerable scholarly debate about Hume’s attitude towards necessary connection. “Old Humeans” have argued that Hume denies the possibility of any objective necessary connection in the world or even the possibility of conceiving such (Winkler 1991; Millican 2009), while “New Humeans” argue that Hume acknowledges the conceivability and possibility of such objective necessary connections (Wright 1983; Strawson 1989; Kail 2007b).

Hume offers two definitions of a cause:

…an object, followed by another, and where all the objects, similar to the first, are followed by objects similar to the second. (EHU 7.29)
…an object followed by another, and whose appearance always conveys the thought to that other. (EHU 7.29)

The first definition identifies causation with constant conjunction between cause and effect, identifying the relevant external impressions; the second definition defines causation in terms of the expectation that one relatum carries to the other, thus identifying the relevant internal impressions. The two definitions are interpretively puzzling insofar as they are neither co-intensive (they do not carry the same meaning) nor co-extensive (they do not pick out exactly the same things as causally related). Commentators, particularly Old Humeans, have argued that the first definition is to be prioritised; others, particularly New Humeans, have argued that neither is meant as a strict definition; meanwhile, other commentators have argued that the two definitions are in fact co-extensive when construed correctly (e.g., Garrett 1997).

Hume’s views on free will have also proved influential. His framings of the discussion in the Treatise (T 2.3.1–2) and in the Enquiry (in EHU 8) differ, with the former appearing more paradoxical in its denial of liberty, but he holds essentially the same compatibilist views in both. As a compatibilist, Hume believes that free will is compatible with determinism (or universal causation, as he conceives it). Hume establishes that universal causation holds true with regard to human behaviour by applying his two definitions of cause, finding both to apply to human behaviour. And yet he holds that human behaviour can be free, because he defines free actions as those that accord with what we will or desire:

By liberty, then, we can only mean a power of acting or not acting, according to the determinations of the will (EHU 8.23)

According to this definition, the question of whether our behaviour is causally determined is simply irrelevant to free will. So long as our actions accord with our will, we count as free, whether or not this willing is itself determined by prior causes. Moreover, he argues that morality is not only compatible with determinism, it requires it, since determinism ensures a causal connection between our character and our actions; it is character that Hume, as a virtue ethicist, thinks to be morally crucial.

2.3 Epistemology

Hume’s epistemology has long been regarded, with some justification, as a deeply sceptical one. His most renowned sceptical argument is undeniably his argument on induction (in T 1.3.6 and EHU 4), which is the inferring of unobserved events from observed ones. Hume asks for the foundation of our inductive inferences, and concludes that reason cannot serve as this foundation. The logic of the argument is interpretively contested ground; the following is but one take on the matter.

Hume argues that all our inductive inferences are founded on the Uniformity Principle: ‘all our experimental conclusions proceed upon the supposition, that the future will be conformable to the past’ (EHU 4.19). In the Enquiry concerning Human Understanding, we can see four possible foundations for the Uniformity Principle, corresponding to two dichotomies: Hume’s Fork, and immediate versus non-immediate foundations. This gives rise to the following:

Immediate Non-immediate
Relation of ideas Intuition Demonstrative arguments
Matters of fact Sensation Probable arguments

Sensation can be ruled out, since it does not reveal any secret powers of an object to bring about its effects; more to the point, sensation cannot tell us anything about the unobserved, but only the currently observed (EHU 4.16). Intuition can also be ruled out, since the Uniformity Principle is not intuitive (EHU 4.16). This leaves us with the non-immediate foundations—that is, inference. Demonstrative arguments cannot serve as the foundation for the Uniformity Principle, since the negation of the Uniformity Principle (that is, that the unobserved fails to resemble the past) can always be conceived—if the Uniformity Principle were founded on a relation of ideas (such as demonstrative arguments or intuition), then its negation would be inconceivable (EHU 4.18). This leaves probable argument. But Hume points out that any probable argument in support of the Uniformity Principle would itself have to presuppose the Uniformity Principle, rendering it circular (EHU 4.19). Thus, Hume concludes that the Uniformity Principle is not founded on reason. Hume goes on to argue that our inductive propensities are due to “custom or habit,” which is a propensity to renew the same act of operation without the intervention of any reasoning (EHU 5.5).

There is considerable debate regarding whether Hume’s argument that induction is not founded on reasoning establishes a psychological fact—that is, that reason does not cause the mind to take a crucial inductive step—or a sceptical one—that is, that reason cannot justify our inductive inferences. The “founded on” locution is indeed ambiguous between both readings. But the more interpretively significant ambiguity has to do with “reason.” Those in the former camp—call them “descriptivists”—read “reason” as referring to the faculty of reasoning, construed as a purely psychological process, while those in the latter camp—call them “normativists”—read “reason” as carrying inherently normative connotations. Influential descriptivist accounts are Garrett 1997 and Owen 1999. Meanwhile, normativists can be differentiated on the basis of the kind of normative endorsement they take reason to carry. For instance, “deductivists” take Hume’s use of “reason” to carry only deductive justification, and thus read Hume’s argument as ruling out only deductive justification for inductive inferences (Flew 1961; Stove 1973). Such accounts have been refuted (Garrett, 1997; Millican, 1995). Externalist interpretations see “reason” as only carrying internalist justification, leaving open the possibility of induction enjoying externalist justification (Loeb 2006; Cottrell 2024). Strongly sceptical readings see “reason” as implying any form of rational justification whatsoever (Winkler 1999; Millican 2002b). The scholarship on this issue is active and ongoing. Note that one may arrive at a different interpretive verdict for the Treatise and Enquiry versions of the argument: for instance, one may find the Treatise’s argument to be psychological and Enquiry’s to be sceptical (Qu 2020).

Hume is also sceptical—at least to some degree—regarding the external world (T 1.4.2). He argues against two conceptions of the external world: that of the vulgar, and that of the philosophical. The vulgar conception is essentially direct realism: sensory perceptions are themselves taken to be external objects. The philosophical conception is essentially a Lockean indirect realism: we directly perceive perceptions, which represent external objects. The vulgar conception is philosophically suspect on even a cursory inspection (T 1.4.2.14), and is refuted by everyday phenomena such as observing sticks appearing bent in water while knowing full well that the actual stick remains unbowed. However, the philosophical view is also problematic, being unsupported by reason. The existence of external objects, as a matter of fact, can only be established by causal reasoning; causal reasoning turns on experienced constant conjunction; but we have no experience of the conjunction between our perceptions and external objects, since we only have access to our own perceptions (T 1.4.2.47). Our belief in the external world—like inductive belief—is ultimately founded on the imagination rather than reason.

One of the most significant questions in Hume scholarship today is what is now known as the Kemp Smith problem. We have seen that Hume’s philosophy is deeply sceptical—about the external world, about induction, about necessary connection, and even about the self. And yet we have also seen that Hume has constructive aspirations for his philosophy, with its naturalistic ambitions of establishing a “science of man” (T Intro 4). The Kemp Smith problem is the problem of reconciling the sceptical aspects of Hume with the naturalistic ones: how can Hume’s scepticism leave room for the possibility of his naturalistic project?

It should be noted that there is considerable scholarly disagreement on how to interpret Hume’s response(s) to scepticism. I have tried to offer as neutral an account of Hume’s argument as possible before exploring the scholarly space, but this is only possible to a certain extent.

In the Treatise, Hume frames the problem around the “dangerous dilemma” (T 1.4.7.6): should we “assent to every trivial suggestion of the fancy” (T 1.4.7.6) or “reject all” of them and “adhere to the understanding” instead (T 1.4.7.7)? The former path leads to credulity, since we would be beholden to our non-rational imaginative propensities. However, the latter is problematic for Hume, given the result of his sceptical argument in “Of Scepticism with Regard to Reason” (T 1.4.1). In this section Hume argues that reason, when left to its own devices, produces higher-order judgments on the likelihood of our beliefs. Iterated indefinitely, this diminishes the vivacity of all our beliefs to nothingness. This process is only prevented by a trivial propensity of the imagination, that is, our inability to follow overly abstruse reasoning. Likewise, Hume states that only “carelessness and inattention” save us from scepticism about the external world (T 1.4.2.57).

Hume then offers a seemingly personal account of his descent into melancholy and delirium, followed by a transition to spleen and indolence. It is near the end of this period that he then formulates what has come to be known as the Title Principle: “where reason is lively, and mixes itself with some propensity, it ought to be assented to” (T 1.4.7.11). With the stirring of his curiosity and ambition, he then returns to philosophy.

In EHU 12, Hume opens with a dismissal of what he calls “antecedent” scepticism—that is, scepticism that dismisses our faculties and beliefs even prior to beginning our intellectual endeavours. He points out that this would render impossible any epistemic progress, since we need to minimally rely on our faculties in the first place if we are to make any epistemic advance whatsoever. Hume then considers what he calls “consequent” scepticism. He explores an extreme version of it that he refers to as “Pyrrhonian,” and explores a number of sceptical arguments, including those against the external world, abstract reasoning, and induction. Ultimately, he rejects Pyrrhonian scepticism because it is harmful and psychologically impossible to sustain. He ends by endorsing another form of consequent scepticism which he calls “mitigated” or “Academic” scepticism. This form of scepticism recommends a lowering of our degrees of confidence, as well as a limitation of the scope of our inquiries.

It is worth noting that most of the literature on the Kemp Smith problem has focused on the Treatise. The Enquiry’s treatment of scepticism differs from the Treatise’s in several important respects: for one, it omits the sceptical argument of T 1.4.1; relatedly, it leaves out the Dangerous Dilemma and the Title Principle. In light of these and other differences, a possibility is that Hume simply offers different responses to scepticism in the Treatise and in the Enquiry (Qu 2020).

On the one hand, many lines of interpretation stress the sceptical elements of the Kemp Smith problem. A historically influential account, going back to Hume’s earliest critics such as Reid and Beattie but still popular to this day, is the deeply sceptical one that reads his scepticism as pervasive and incurable (Winkler 1999; Baxter 2018; Dimech 2019). However, such readings find it hard to make sense of Hume’s naturalism (Cummins 1999; Collier 2008). A much-moderated version sees Hume as ultimately endorsing “true scepticism,” recognising the limitations of philosophy; importantly, this allows for Hume to continue a chastened and modest naturalistic project in the light of T 1.4.7 (Ainslie 2015).

Other lines of interpretation attempt to do justice to both the sceptical and naturalistic facets, for instance the “perspectivalist” reading that sees Hume as taking on different and incompatible perspectives (Fogelin 1998; De Pierris 2015); the Treatise’s presentation lends itself particularly well to this line. Dialectical readings likewise see Hume as adopting different perspectives; unlike perspectivalist readings, proponents of this view see Hume as using the sceptical viewpoint as a mere dialectical tool without genuinely endorsing it (Baier 1991; Morris 2000).

On the other hand, different lines of interpretation stress the naturalistic elements of the Kemp Smith problem, reading Hume as appealing to the naturalistic elements of his philosophical framework in order to triumph over excessive scepticism. Influential are readings that turn on the Title Principle as appealing to our natural propensities to overcome scepticism (Garrett 1997; Allison 2008; Meeker 2013). A possibility is that Hume adopts the Title Principle in the Treatise but abandons it in the Enquiry (Qu 2020). Besides readings founded on the Title Principle, there are a number of other naturalist lines. In recent times, externalist interpretations have seen increased popularity. These readings see Hume as appealing to externalist justification—that is, justification that need not be available to the agent—in order to defeat scepticism (Loeb 2002; Schmitt 2014; Cottrell 2024).

Yet other interpretations instead look elsewhere entirely, drawing inspiration from Hume’s ethics. For instance, just as Hume sees usefulness and agreeableness as key to moral justification, these qualities might also be key to epistemic justification that resists Hume’s scepticism (Owen 1999; Ridge 2003; McCormick 2005; Sasser 2021). However, such views collapse the distinction between moral and epistemic justification (Qu 2014). Another recent line of interpretation sees Hume as endorsing a virtue-theoretic epistemology parallel to his virtue ethics (Vitz 2009; Baceski 2013; Schafer 2014). According to this line, Hume can be justified in his pursuit of his naturalistic project as long as he embodies suitable doxastic virtues. Another reading sees both Hume’s epistemology and his ethics as sense-based; the former is responsive to truth and probable truth, while the latter is responsive to pleasure and pain. This responsiveness to truth and probability is key to overcoming scepticism via the Title Principle (Garrett 2015).

One feature of Hume’s discussion of scepticism peculiar to the Enquiry is the rejection of antecedent scepticism. This move can be seen as according our faculties a certain default justification that proves key to avoiding excessive scepticism (Garrett 2007b; Millican 2012; Qu 2020).

3. The Passions

In Book 2 of the Treatise, Hume applies his experimental method to a study of the emotions and passions. He situates them within his philosophy of mind and explains their origins, their connections, and their effects on us. It is important to read Hume’s presentation of the passions in the Treatise in light of Book 1, since he says that the “[t]he subjects of the Understanding and Passions make a compleat chain of reasoning by themselves” (Advertisement to Treatise Book 1, 1739). Scholars widely agree that Hume’s view has antecedents in Malebranche, but Hume is also critical of crucial elements in Malebranche’s system (Jones 1982; Kail 2007a and 2008; Le Jallé 2012). Sensations, including pleasure and pain, are primary impressions in Hume’s scheme, while passions are among secondary ones. Passions generally arise from impressions of pleasure or pain, or from the ideas of pleasurable or painful objects. Hume also classifies passions as “impressions of reflection,” since they come upon us reflexively when the perceptions (sensations or ideas) of pleasure and pain occur. If I think of the distressing idea of a long fall from a steep cliff, I may be overtaken by fear; the immediate pleasure of eating a confection can bring on a desire for more of the same.

3.1 Taxonomy

Hume divides passions into the calm and the violent, following a characterization found in some of his predecessors, such as Mandeville, Malebranche, and Hutcheson. Violent passions are felt with internal upheaval, while calm passions are felt with less turmoil and are sometimes mistaken for reason. Among calm passions are the feelings of the sense of beauty and morality, while the violent include passions like love and hatred, grief and joy, pride and humility (T 2.1.1.3). This division is not exact since typically calm passions can be felt violently, and the typically violent calmly: “The raptures of poetry and music frequently rise to the greatest height; while those other impressions, properly call’d passions, may decay into so soft an emotion, as to become, in a manner, imperceptible” (T 2.1.1.3). Hume’s theory also introduces an original distinction, not found in previous discussions, to his theory of the passions (McIntyre 2006): directness versus indirectness. Direct passions arise immediately from perceptions of pleasure and pain, with no intermediary perceptions. Among these are desire, aversion, grief, joy, hope and fear. Indirect passions require the involvement of other perceptions and are produced by an association between two impressions and two ideas. Among indirect passions are pride and humility, love and hatred, ambition, vanity, envy, pity, malice, generosity, and passions dependent on them (T 2.1.1.4). (More on indirect passions follows shortly.)

Commentators have disagreed on how to understand Hume’s taxonomy, and indeed Hume’s texts lend themselves to various readings. On one reading, the most basic distinction into which all passions fall is primary (instincts, such as benevolence) versus secondary (the direct and indirect passions derived from pleasure and pain), with only direct passions dividing into calm and violent (Kemp Smith 1941, 164–168). However, Hume designates the indirect passions of pride, humility, love, and hatred as (generally) violent, which undermines Kemp Smith’s scheme (Árdal 1966). Hume starts the discussion of impressions of reflection by describing the division between calm and violent passions. Given this, Hume says, “Of the first kind is the sense of beauty and deformity in action, composition, and external objects. Of the second are the passions of love and hatred, grief and joy, pride and humility. This division is far from being exact” (T 2.1.1.3). Consequently, on another understanding, Hume divides all passions into the “generally calm” and the “generally violent,” with the former constituted by the moral sentiments, and the latter constituted by the other passions, which are either direct or indirect (Loeb 1977).

This last scheme appears to ignore the distinction between the instincts and derived, or reflective, passions and perhaps forgets that all reflective pleasures are calm, while instincts are violent (Fieser 1992). However, Hume appears to say that there are also some calm instincts, when he writes: “Now ’tis certain, there are certain calm desires and tendencies, which, tho’ they be real passions, produce little emotion in the mind…. These desires are of two kinds; either certain instincts originally implanted in our natures … or the general appetite to good, and aversion to evil, consider’d merely as such” (T 2.3.3.8). A little later, Hume adds to the list of instincts: desire of punishment for our enemies and of happiness for our friends, hunger, lust, and a few other bodily appetites (T 2.3.9.8), a list that includes generally violent passions. Consequently, it is difficult to classify the primary passions, or instincts, as either generally calm or generally violent. One suggestion is that the instincts are not themselves direct passions but are existing states from which direct passions like joy, grief, hope, fear, desire, and aversion sometimes arise (Cohon 2008a). Hume writes, “beside good and evil, or in other words, pain and pleasure, the direct passions frequently arise from a natural impulse or instinct, which is perfectly unaccountable” (T 2.3.9.8). However, there is also evidence to the contrary: at T 2.3.3.8 (quoted above), when Hume insists that the calm passions are “real passions,” he names some of the instincts as examples.

Don Garrett (2026) has offered a new interpretation of Hume’s “mental geography.” He notes first that not all secondary impressions for Hume are passions. He says Hume identifies virtually all secondary impressions with emotion as a mental feeling (emotionmf), only some of which are passions (although Hume does not explicitly label as emotions some secondary impressions—volitions and feelings from mental operations). Passions are the typically violent emotionsmf, and they divide into direct and indirect. The rest of the emotionsmf divide into the sentiments of taste (morality and beauty), sensible agitations, feelings from mental operations (for instance, the impression of necessary connection), and volitions. The sensible agitations are caused by emotions regarded as physical movement, “a sense of emotion,” Garrett notes, that has passed out of usage since the 1820s. Garrett’s treatment adds categories to Hume’s taxonomy that have not before been discussed.

3.2 Psychological Principles

Hume’s Treatise treatment of the emotions and passions includes an application of the principles of association that he describes in Book 1: “All resembling impressions are connected together, and no sooner one arises than the rest immediately follow. Grief and disappointment give rise to anger, anger to envy, envy to malice, and malice to grief again, till the whole circle be completed” (T 2.1.4.3). Hume’s associative principles are key to his analysis of the indirect passions, which are produced by what he calls a double relation of impressions and ideas. For example, the cause of pride—a subject with a positive quality, such as a lovely painting of mine—is associated with an idea of the self and causes an impression of pleasure. The effect, namely pride, is also associated with an idea of the self and is a separate impression of pleasure. Since the mind is disposed to move from one perception to another that resembles it, such relationships facilitate the formation of the passion. The cause is doubly related to the effect, and the associations of ideas and of impressions “assist and forward each other,” so that the intensity of a passion is increased when that passion involves associations of both ideas and impressions. All indirect passions follow this pattern.

Two notable psychological principles in Hume’s theory that involve others’ feelings are sympathy and comparison. Hume observes that we feel hatred, resentment, esteem, love, courage, mirth, and melancholy more from communication from others than from our own natural temperaments (T 2.1.11.2). A person’s feelings are conveyed in that person’s visage and conversation, by which another forms an idea of what the first is experiencing. By sympathy, “[t]his idea is presently converted into an impression, and acquires such a degree of force and vivacity, as to become the very passion itself, and produce an equal emotion, as any original affection” (T 2.1.11.3). Most commentators agree that Hume does not regard sympathy as a passion, but as a psychological principle (e.g., Mercer 1971; Árdal 1966; Postema 2005; Taylor 2015b). Furthermore, Hume’s version of sympathy does not involve imagining ourselves in the place of another (see Taylor contrary to Mercer). For instance, I notice someone crying, which imparts an idea of that person’s pain or sadness, and is converted into my own state of uneasiness.

Hume finds a connection between sympathy and some of the passions that involve concern for the welfare of others: compassion, pity, and benevolence. He writes, “We have a lively idea of everything related to us. All human creatures are related to us by resemblance.” So, others’ interests, passions, pleasures, and pains “strike us in a lively manner,” especially in cases of affliction and sorrow. Thus, we can feel pity (or compassion) for others because of our sympathy with their distress (T 2.2.7.2). One critic asks, however, “Why would we not hate the person who makes us feel uncomfortable or just turn away?” (Árdal 1966). In T 2.2.9, Hume’s explanation of how other-concerned passions are generated from sympathy is more complicated, perhaps because his goal there is to explain under what circumstances feeling pain from another’s situation produces contempt or hatred toward that person and under what circumstances it produces pity or benevolence. Hume’s narrative depends upon a distinction between strong and weak sympathy. Strong sympathy occurs when the situation of another person—say, one’s suffering—is “painted in very lively colours” and “we sympathize with him in his afflictions, and feel in our heart evident touches of pity and benevolence” (T 2.2.9.16). However, sometimes the sympathy with another’s uneasiness is weak, and it produces hatred or contempt (T 2.2.9.12). “The same object causes contrary passions according to its different degrees” (T 2.2.9.16). This explains how people can sometimes be contemptuous of the poor, rather than showing concern for their welfare. Hume, moreover, tries to explain the relation between sympathy and benevolence by citing the “bent or tendency” of these passions: “their impulses or directions are similar and correspondent” (T 2.2.9.2). Given that he considers benevolence as a spontaneous concern (an instinct) for the well-being of another, it seems to be instead pity, an indirect passion, that Hume wants to explain as a frequent product of sympathy (Postema 2005). Pity arises from sympathy and combines pain at the misery of another with a desire to alleviate it; thus, as Hume says, it “imitates the effects … of love” or benevolence (T 2.2.8.1, T 2.2.9.3–4) in terms of its motivational direction.

Comparison is the complement to the principle of sympathy, whereby we experience certain passions, notably respect (or esteem), contempt, malice, and envy, upon comparison of our situations with others’ situations. Comparison is a common explanation of our “dark passions.” “The sorts of ‘contrariety,’ opposition, and hostile coexistence that human passions exhibit is one of Book Two’s recurrent themes” (Baier 1991). There are three varieties of comparison in Hume’s Treatise discussion (Postema 2005). In “contextual referencing,” our responses to the world are informed by comparison with others’ views and their emotional responses to objects and persons around us. We mutually reinforce each other’s sentiments. In “contrast comparison,” our reactions to others are augmented or diminished when contrasted with their feelings, as for example when we feel increased fear for someone who, unaware and oblivious, is about to be assaulted. In “reversal-comparison,” we experience the contrary of the sentiment with which we are sympathizing. Hume writes, “The misery of another gives us a more lively idea of our happiness, and his happiness of our misery. The former, therefore, produces delight; and the latter uneasiness” (T 2.2.8.8). This process is responsible for the production of malice and envy.

In addition to association, sympathy, and comparison, other psychological principles regarding the passions emerge in Hume’s discussion. (See Paxman 2026, Radcliffe 2017.) For Hume, the presence of differing passions increases the violence of the “dominant” passion when they first collide. However, he also observes that both passions can exist successively by short intervals if they arise from different objects: “If the objects of the contrary passions be totally different, the passions are like two opposite liquors in different bottles, which have no influence on each other” (T 2.3.9.17). However, if they arise from the same or closely connected objects, they can destroy each other. If a play is both funny and sad, the spectator leaves in a state of equanimity. “If the objects be intimately connected, the passions are like an alcali and an acid, which, being mingled, destroy each other” (ibid.). Sometimes the two will unite in the mind and produce a new affection, as when an object, either good or evil, is uncertain, and contrary passions occur together, but neither destroys nor neutralizes the other. Instead, the two blend and produce a new affection. Finally, if the relation between the passions consists “in the contradictory views of the same object, the passions are like oil and vinegar, which, however mingled, never perfectly unite and incorporate” (ibid.). This last situation is illustrated by the examples of grief and joy and hope and fear. When the existence of good and evil is uncertain, there is at the same time grief and joy, with hope for good and fear of evil.

3.3 Motivation

When Hume discusses the direct passions, he focuses on their effects, rather than their causes, given that their causal story is uncomplicated: they follow directly from experiences of pleasures and pains or ideas of these perceptions. Many of the direct passions are motives to action (e.g., desire and anger), but so are some of the indirect passions (e.g., malice and pity) and some of the instincts (e.g., benevolence and kindness toward children). In the context of this discussion, Hume offers arguments, against rationalist philosophers, for two significant theses: (1) that reason on its own cannot produce motives to action (i.e., reason is motivationally inert) and (2) that reason cannot oppose passion in directing our actions (T 2.3.3.1).

Hume’s argument that reason is motivationally inert starts with his characterization of reason as manifesting in two functions: (1) demonstration, which concerns relations of ideas, and (2) causal reasoning, which concerns objects of experience and the comparison of ideas representing those objects. Since the former deals with intuitive connections between ideas, like those in mathematics, its conclusions do not directly affect action, even though they have application in the world. Hume writes, “Mathematics, indeed, are useful in all mechanical operations, and arithmetic in almost every art and profession: But ‘tis not of themselves they have any influence” (T 2.3.3.2). Causal reasoning is also insufficient to produce a motive to action: “It can never in the least concern us to know, that such objects are causes, and such others effects, if both the causes and effects be indifferent to us” (T 2.3.3.3). He goes on to argue later, in Book 3 of the Treatise, that our passions express preferences and aversions that make both demonstration and reasoning about causes relevant to action.

On the basis of the thesis that reason alone cannot produce motives, Hume concludes that it cannot be in conflict with passion over the direction of action. A motive, for Hume, is an impetus to act but “Nothing can oppose or retard the impulse of passion, but a contrary impulse; and if this contrary impulse ever arises from reason, that latter faculty must have an original influence on the will, and must be able to cause, as well as hinder any act of volition” (T 2.3.3.4). Since reason has no such “original” influence, it cannot be opposed to the force of passion. Furthermore, Hume characterizes passions as “original existences,” which make no reference to anything beyond themselves: “When I am angry, I am actually possest with the passion, and in that emotion have no more a reference to any other object, than when I am thirsty, or sick, or more than five foot high” (T 2.3.3.5). This means that they have no content, and thus cannot be opposed to reason in the respect that they express an idea or thought that is contrary to reason. Consequently, ordinary talk of reason versus feeling is, in Hume’s view, an opposition between two kinds of feelings, one of which is calm (such as concern for long-term good) and often mistaken for reason.

Commentators have disagreed over the implications of Hume’s argument that reason by itself is not the source of motivation. The traditional reading has been that since beliefs are produced by reasoning, the import of the argument is that beliefs by themselves cannot motivate; this understanding is the source of the Humean theory of motivation on which both desire (a Humean passion) and belief are needed to constitute a motive (Sinhababu 2017; Blackburn 1998; Radcliffe 2018). This reading has been challenged by several scholars for various reasons (Kail 2007b; Cohon 2008b; Pigden 2009; Sandis 2012; Owen 2016). Prominent among their considerations is Hume’s reference to the prospect of pain or pleasure as the source of our passions, which they take to refer to beliefs. The thesis that beliefs produce motives (passions) and actions also seems to be supported by Hume’s discussion of the influence of belief on behavior in Book 1 of the Treatise, in a section called “Of the influence of belief” (T 1.3.10). On the other hand, one can argue that the formation of motives by prospective pleasure does not attribute the force to belief and that the influence of belief on behavior is always for Hume in the presence of passions or desires (Radcliffe 2018). The thesis concerning the impotence of reason serves as a crucial premise in Hume’s argument that moral distinctions are not founded on reason, so how to understand it in that context is important, which we shall see below.

3.4 Treatise Book 2 versus A Dissertation on the Passions

Scholars generally consider Hume’s 1757 essay-length Dissertation on the Passions as his later reworking of the Treatise Book 2 discussion. The Dissertation repeats key points from Book 2, sometimes verbatim, while eliminating over eighty-five percent of the material in Book 2 (Beauchamp 2007, xv). Among the topics excised are the long analyses of the direct and the indirect passions; the characterization of passions as “distinct existences”; the argument that reason alone does not motivate; and the argument that reason and passion cannot be opposed over direction of action. For this reason, some scholars think the Dissertation is of little value (Annette Baier (2008) calls it a “mutilation” of Treatise Book 2). However, others argue that the topics Hume retained provide clues to what he later thought important in his theory of the passions (Paxman 2026) or that Hume’s thinking on the passions developed over time and is expressed in his Four Dissertations (1757) taken as a whole, which includes “The Natural History of Religion,” “Of Tragedy,” and “Of the Standard of Taste,” in addition to “Of the Passions” (Merivale 2019).

4. Ethics

Hume’s ethical theory builds upon his epistemology and his theory of the passions. Hume addresses questions in both metaethics (about the nature of morality and its origin) and in normative ethics (about what is good and bad or right and wrong). In metaethics, his view is clearly sentimentalist, with his argument that our moral distinctions cannot be derived from reason but rely upon sentiments or feelings. In normative ethics, he regards character traits as the objects of moral evaluation, but scholars disagree about whether he offers a normative (or prescriptive) theory, or whether his approach is purely descriptive of our moral practices and terminology.

Hume develops his moral theory in Treatise Book 3 and in the Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals. Although purported to be a rewriting of Book 3 for more public consumption, this second Enquiry does contain differences from the Treatise, which some commentators have argued signal a change or maturing in Hume’s ethical views (Abramson 2001; Kopajtic 2024; Taylor 2020a; Millican 2020). Several of Hume’s essays, which appeared at various times between 1741 and 1757 and are collected as Essays: Moral, Political, and Literary (1777), are also relevant to his moral theory—especially so, given the moral theory’s relation to Hume’s political views and to his views on how we judge matters of taste, subjects of some of these essays.

4.1 Hume’s Defense of Sentimentalism in the Treatise

4.1.1 Hume’s Argument from Motivation

Some moral rationalists writing in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries, such as Ralph Cudworth (1731) and Samuel Clarke (1705), argued that the content of morality could be grasped by reason in its demonstrative function (that is, by deduction from necessary truths), since, they contended, it consisted in immutable truths applicable to all rational beings. In reply, Hume writes, “In order … to judge of these systems, we need only consider, whether it be possible, from reason alone, to distinguish betwixt moral good and evil” (T 3.1.1.4). Then Hume’s “Motivation Argument” says (repeated in this passage twice),

Since morals, therefore, have an influence on the actions and affections, it follows, that they cannot be deriv’d from reason; and that because reason alone, as we have already prov’d, can never have any such influence. Morals excite passions, and produce or prevent actions. Reason of itself is utterly impotent in this particular. The rules of morality, therefore, are not conclusions of our reason. (T 3.1.1.6–7)

The argument is simply two premises and a conclusion:

  • (1) Morals influence or excite passions and produce or prevent actions.
  • (2) Reason (by itself) does not have any such influence.
  • (Conclusion) Morals cannot be derived from reason or are not conclusions of reason.

Premise (1) is commonly taken to mean that our recognition of the content of morality (for instance, of an action as our duty) affects our motivating passions and our behavior—a point that Hume thinks is apparent from experience (T 3.1.1.5). He does not imply that people always do what they perceive to be right, but that typically, they feel a psychological effect, even if not strong enough to move them, when they acknowledge that a behavior is the right or wrong thing to do. Premise (2) is defended in his treatment of the passions and motivation, discussed above. After presenting this argument, Hume adds that “an active principle cannot be founded on an inactive” one, which makes the Motivation Argument valid, since perception of morality is active and reason is not. It is important also to note that, even though it is not explicit in the above passage, premise (2) means, not that reason has no effect on passions and action, but that by itself it does not. Hume makes this clear in many places (e.g., T 2.3.3.1, 2.3.3.4, 3.1.1.4, 3.1.1.6). Sophie Botros (2006) has argued that Hume was inconsistent—in fact, contradictory—on this point, but her view is an outlier.

4.1.2 Hume’s Argument from the Capacities of Reason

Hume defends the view that our moral distinctions cannot be derived from reason alone with another line of argument in the Treatise, one in which he examines reason in its two natural capacities: demonstration (reasoning from necessary truths to other necessary truths) and causal reasoning (reasoning about matters of fact) (T 3.1.1.21–27).

First, consider demonstration. Morality that is discovered by demonstration would consist in necessary relations, apprehended without experience indicating morality or immorality wherever found. Hume says that two conditions must be met for there to be such moral relations. For one,“As moral good and evil belong only to the actions of the mind, and are deriv’d from our situation with regard to external objects, the relations, from which these moral distinctions arise, must lie only betwixt internal actions, and external objects” (T. 3.1.1.21)—that is, between desires, passions, volitions, etc., and a goal or object in the world. But necessary relations of that nature, he maintains, simply do not exist. His argument considers the case of the relation involved in patricide: if an offspring’s killing its parent is wrong, it is wrong wherever the relation “x begets y, and y causes the death of x” is found. This relation also exists when a sapling grows tall enough to shade and kill its parent tree from lack of sunlight, but it would be absurd to say the young tree is guilty of an immorality. Hume explains its absurdity by reference to its involving a causal relation between two external objects (T 3.1.1.24). He rebukes the suggestion that one example is not causal, and so the two are not illustrative of the same relation. Both are indeed causal: “’Tis a will or choice, that determines a man to kill his parent; and they are the laws of matter and motion, that determine a sapling to destroy the oak, from which it sprung. Here then the same relations have different causes; but still the relations are the same: And as their discovery is not in both cases attended with a notion of immorality, it follows, that that notion does not arise from such a discovery” (T 3.1.1.24). The second condition for the existence of moral relations is that apprehension of them affects motivation. However, Hume has already argued that understanding rational relations does not by itself motivate, and moreover, that any impact on human motivation is causal or contingent and not necessary (T 3.1.1.26).

Second, now consider reason in its function of discovering facts, Hume asks in what fact morality would lie, and writes:

Take any action allow’d to be vicious: Wilful murder, for instance. Examine it in all lights, and see if you can find that matter of fact, or real existence, which you call vice. In which-ever way you take it, you find only certain passions, motives, volitions and thoughts. There is no other matter of fact in the case. The vice entirely escapes you, as long as you consider the object. (T 3.1.1.26)

Investigation yields information about the motives and thoughts of the murderer, but does not reveal that person’s vice. Here Hume first tenders his sentimentalism, writing that one finds the vice only when “you turn your reflection into your own breast, and find a sentiment of disapprobation, which arises in you, towards this action. Here is a matter of fact, but ’tis an object of feeling, not of reason” (T 3.1.1.26). Some critics of Hume argue that he has an overly restrictive view of reason, which might also function in ways that Hume does not countenance—for instance, to provide intuitive recognition of facts that are necessarily true and intrinsically motivating (Nagel 1970; Korsgaard 1996).

4.1.3 Morality Discovered by Sentiment

After eliminating reason, which deals with ideas, as the origin of moral distinctions, Hume concludes that our moral judgments must depend on impressions (impressions of reflection, since they are responses to our ideas of actions or traits). Experience confirms that we “pronounce the impression arising from virtue, to be agreeable, and that proceding from vice to be uneasy” (T 3.1.2.2.). This is not to say that we think of action as a manifestation of vice and feel uneasy about it because it is vicious. Rather, “An action, or sentiment, or character is virtuous or vicious; why? because its view causes a pleasure or uneasiness of a particular kind.…To have the sense of virtue, is nothing but to feel a satisfaction of a particular kind from the contemplation of a character” (T 3.1.2.3).

So commentators have generally attributed to Hume a theory of the moral sense (Driver 2013) or moral sensing (Cohon 2008b) or moral sensibility (Radcliffe 2022). Our attitudes towards virtues and vices are cases of approbation and disapprobation, respectively, which are distinctive pleasures and pains. Hume amplifies their distinctiveness with two points. First, the pleasures we derive from (the idea of) a character trait feel differently from the pleasures inanimate objects cause, just as the pleasure of wine differs from the pleasure of a symphony. Second, the pleasure that indicates virtue, and the pain that indicates vice, are part of or intimately connected with the association of impressions and ideas that give rise to pride, humility, love, and hatred. Virtue gives rise to pride in its possessor and to love when displayed by another, while vice gives rise to humility in the self and hatred toward another. Some readers argue that Hume identifies these moral sentiments toward others with love and hatred, respectively (Korsgaard 1999; Brown 2001). Others scholars say the moral sentiments are indirect secondary impressions, but not necessarily indirect passions (Cohon 2008a); distinctively moral impressions, “often delicate,”in Hume’s words (Garrett 1997 and 2015); or distinct impressions, calm in nature, which can be regarded as fainter forms of love and hatred (Carlson 2014).

Hume reduces moral sensibility to two more basic human principles: our capacity for sympathy plus the ability to take up a “general” or “common” point of view on human action. Sympathy is engaged when we observe the behavior of another and form an idea of what that person is feeling, which is then converted into an analogous feeling in us: “When I see the effects of passion in the voice and gesture of any person, my mind immediately passes from these effects to their causes, and forms such a lively idea of the passion, as is presently converted into the passion itself” (T 3.3.1.7). Sympathy is essential to moral judgment, Hume observes, because when we react with approval or disapproval toward an agent’s character, our reaction is not just a response to that person alone; it is a result of our sympathizing with people who are impacted by the actions of that agent. However, we don’t sympathize to the same extent with all human beings, because the principles of mental association Hume describes also influence sympathy. I sympathize to a greater degree with those who are related to me by contiguity, resemblance, or causality. I feel worse about the diagnosis of my mother’s illness than I do about the stranger I read about in the paper with the same disease; this is because I am in close physical and psychological contiguity with my mother. Moreover, we are more affected by the feelings of those with whom we find something in common than by the feelings of those with whom we share little, because the resemblances between us make it easier to imagine the others’ feelings.

Thus, our practice is to “correct” our sympathy-based judgments analogously to the way we correct our physical sense-perceptual judgments for distance, lighting, and perspective (T 3.3.1.16). Hume writes,

’tis impossible we cou’d ever converse together on any reasonable terms, were each of us to consider characters and persons, only as they appear from his peculiar point of view. In order, therefore, to prevent those continual contradictions, and arrive at a more stable judgment of things, we fix on some steady and general points of view; and always, in our thoughts, place ourselves in them, whatever may be our present situation. (T 3.3.1.15)

To consider a character from a steady and general (or “common,” T 3.3.1.30) point of view is to sympathize with those directly affected by that character: we “confine our view to that narrow circle, in which any person moves, in order to form a judgment of his moral character. When the natural tendency of his passions leads him to be serviceable and useful within his sphere, we approve of his character, and love his person, by a sympathy with the sentiments of those, who have a more particular connexion with him” (T 3.3.3.2).

Scholars have interpreted Hume’s general point of view in various ways. Most agree that it is a human viewpoint (Sayre-McCord 1994) and not that of an ideal spectator with complete objectivity and perfect knowledge, contrary to the interpretations of Rawls (1971) and Harrison (1976). Some readers understand it as the “moral” point of view, that is, as the perspective that turns personal judgments into judgments about morality (Brown 2001; Radcliffe 2018), but a critic of this understanding has it that this reading defines “the category of moral sentiments in causal rather than phenomenal terms” and leaves “the proper classification of the initial uncorrected sentiments obscure” (Garrett 2026).

4.2 Justice in the Treatise

Hume argues that some traits are virtues due to our natural sentiment of approval, while others are virtues because a human construction or artifice serving the interests of persons as a community leads us to approve of those traits. The former are natural virtues, and the latter are artificial. Some traits, like gratitude and kindness, are ones we approve naturally because they are sources of pleasure to those immediately affected by their possessor. Acts of justice are different. For instance, if a person of little means borrows a bit of money from an uncharitable and wealthy miser, but cannot repay the loan as agreed, the former is better off and the miser hardly worse. A person of natural moral sensibility would likely not disapprove of the borrower in this situation. Yet, justice requires that all loans be repaid, no matter who the debtor and who the lender. Hume’s theory of artificial virtue, developed throughout Book 3 Part 2 of the Treatise, is designed to explain how the rules of justice evolve and how sentiment can be the source of our judgments about justice, even if natural feelings are sometimes contrary to obligation.

Hume’s argument concerning the status of justice as an artificial virtue begins with the question what makes a just action virtuous. Some philosophers have argued that regard to the rightness of the action (doing it because it is the just or right thing) makes the action right and the agent virtuous. Hume, however, shows this view involves circularity:

To suppose, that the mere regard to the virtue of the action, may be the first motive, which produc’d the action, and render’d it virtuous, is to reason in a circle. Before we can have such a regard, the action must be really virtuous; and this virtue must be deriv’d from some virtuous motive: And consequently the virtuous motive must be different from the regard to the virtue of the action. (T 3.2.1.4)

If virtue lies in caring about doing the virtuous (or moral) thing, then we have no account of what virtue is. Hume concludes, “it may be establish’d as an undoubted maxim, that no action can be virtuous, or morally good, unless there be in human nature some motive to produce it, distinct from the sense of its morality” (T 3.2.1.7). In the case of someone’s assisting another in need, the person’s virtue lies in acting from benevolence, a motive of which we generally approve. However, in the cases that fall under justice—respecting property, keeping promises, truth-telling—it is difficult to find the approved motive from which the agent acts and that constitutes the virtue.

First, Hume eliminates concern for public interest for various reasons, one of which is that experience shows that people who pay their debts, keep their promises, or respect others’ property are not moved by a sentiment as remote as regard for public interest, especially when the required actions are contrary to self-interest. Second, Hume eliminates private benevolence as the motive to acts of justice since we have obligations of justice toward people for whom we feel no concern. Third, Hume later argues that self-interest is not a motive to just actions generally, since not every act of justice is in the agent’s interest: “’tis easily conceiv’d how a man may impoverish himself by a single instance of integrity, and have reason to wish, that with regard to that single act the laws of justice were for a moment suspended in the universe” (T 3.2.2.22). Hume infers that we have no natural motive for observing rules of justice, but regard for their rightness, so “there is here an evident sophistry and reasoning in a circle.” Unless we allow that nature is sophistical, we should conclude that justice and injustice arise not from nature, but from human convention and education (T 3.2.1.17).

Given his own reasoning and his “undoubted maxim,” Hume still needs to identify a motive to just action, if justice is to be a virtue. Hume agrees with Hobbes that life in a state of nature would be very difficult. Each person on their own would find it challenging to provide food, shelter, clothing, and the amenities that make life worthwhile. If resources to fulfill desires are scarce, property and possessions are at risk. The remedy to this situation, Hume suggests, comes from an artifice, a convention or an agreement by persons to establish a set of rules to regulate their actions. This agreement is not a promise, since promise-making itself is only intelligible after the conventions which are being set forth with this act are established. Rather, the agreement that establishes the rules of justice is analogous to the situation of two men rowing a boat: "Two men, who pull the oars of a boat, do it by an agreement or convention, tho’ they have never given promises to each other" (T 3.2.2.10). These conventions, however, are not established suddenly, but develop gradually through trial and error.

When Hume discusses the system of justice, he writes, “’tis certain, that the whole plan or scheme is highly conducive, or indeed absolutely requisite, both to the support of society, and the well-being of every individual…. Every member of society is sensible of this interest. … No more is requisite to induce any one of them to perform an act of justice, who has the first opportunity” (T 3.2.2.22). While Hume has put natural self-interest aside as the motive to justice, he seemingly reintroduces it in some form as the incentive to participate in the system. However, as society becomes larger, and the self-interest served by our following the rules is harder to discern, we are more likely to act for a nearer self-interest, rather than following the rules of justice (T 3.2.2.24).

So has Hume identified a motive to just actions? Some scholars have suggested that Hume’s point is to conclude that nature has established a “sophistry”—that his system of justice involves an “error” theory, since with every judgment of obligation that we make, we presuppose there is a consistent motive to justice, and therefore a duty, when there is not (Gauthier 1992). Since occasional free riding does not create chaos and will not demolish the system, perhaps Hume concludes that there is no natural obligation to justice. However, the system works because we feign such a motive and feel badly when we have not done what we envisage justice requires.

On another interpretation, we presuppose that there is a nonmoral motive to justice (that is, one that is not regard for duty), when we really have none. While honesty, for instance, is a virtue of people who regularly do honest actions, it is not motivated by a natural, nonmoral motive in the way natural virtues are (Cohon 1997). Thus, honesty is an artificial virtue in the way that an artificial leg is a leg, namely that it functions as one. The circular reasoning surrounding artificial virtue arises when we regard virtues of justice in the ordinary (natural) way, when they are not that kind of trait (Cohon 1997).

Yet another proposal is that Hume has not created a difficulty for his own account or for the way people ordinarily think about the virtues. Rather, the motive that Hume identifies as the original motive to acts of justice is enlightened (long-term, well-informed) self-interest, which moves us to construct the system of rules to moderate behavior. From this cultivated self-interest comes a new, artificial motive: a disposition grounded in a desire to regulate one’s actions by the rules of justice. Because it involves conventional rules, it is a “new motive” not original in human nature; it is instead produced by self-interest, which is the original motive in human nature that satisfies Hume’s undoubted maxim. In creating this new motive, self-interest authoritatively restrains itself (Garrett 2007a).

4.3 Hume’s Ethics in the Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals

Although Hume says that his object in the second Enquiry is to find the foundation of morality, the “universal principles, from which all censure or approbation is ultimately derived” (EPM 1.10), his focus there is on analyzing our notions of virtue and vice. He offers discussions of the classes of virtue and places an emphasis on their utility. He includes a repudiation of the egoist thesis that all people are motivated by self-love. He maintains his sentimentalism, but his arguments differ from the Treatise, which has led scholars to speculate about the evolution of Hume’s ethical thought (see Taylor 2020a). The Motivation Argument is present, in a slightly different form, at EPM 1.7. (When Hume first presents it, he does not commit to this view, but it later becomes apparent that it is his.) After eliminating reason as the source of our distinctions of virtue and vice, he argues that they derive from the “sentiment of humanity,” which he also identifies at times with benevolence. His argument is that we approve of certain qualities and call them virtues because we possess humanity—that is, because we care in a general way about the welfare of others and about the long-term interest of persons (including ourselves). This sentiment is the only one, Hume says, that recommends the same objects to everyone’s approbation and is so comprehensive as to extend to all of mankind; thus, it fulfills the requisites for making moral distinctions, when other, more self-interested sentiments cannot (EPM 9.5).

Moral sensibility in the Treatise is analyzed in terms of sympathy, but the role of sympathy is less apparent in the second Enquiry. Some scholars (Taylor 2015a; Kopajtic 2024) argue that Hume has made substantial changes to his view of moral sentiment in EPM, with Taylor noting that his development of the principle of humanity makes his moral theory a major contribution to Enlightenment thought and contemporary thought. An alternative reading is that the sentiment of humanity depends upon sympathy in EPM (Debes 2007a and 2007b) and that there is no real inconsistency between Hume’s position in the two works regarding humanity, sympathy, and the source of our moral sentiments (Abramson 2001; Vitz 2004; Pitson 2020). There are also differences between Hume’s discussion of justice in the Treatise and EPM, with the EPM account eliminating the extended discussion of the search for the motive to justice and the treatment of its artificiality. Perhaps this is not evidence of a change of mind, but signals that what matters most for Hume, as he says at EPM 3.1 and discusses in detail, is that utility is the foundation of justice (Harris 2020). Hume also turns to a more contextual presentation of justice, with a focus on how it can be realized in actual political situations (Hanley 2021). He eliminates the Treatise’s conjectural history of justice in favor of the idea that different contexts and politics call for different kinds of rule, which demand our careful study (Hanvelt 2021).

4.4 Virtue Ethics

Some of Hume’s contemporaries (Lord Kames 1751; Adam Smith 1759) took the system he describes in both the Treatise and the Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals to be a form of utilitarianism, which has it that we should pursue happiness or utility for the greatest number of people. The traits that we admire, in Hume’s view, are those useful and agreeable to the self and to others, and section 5 of the Enquiry is entitled, “Why Utility Pleases.” In the 19th century, Jeremy Bentham (1776), the “father” of contemporary utilitarianism, found inspiration in Hume as well. Political philosopher John Rawls (1971) in the 20th century regarded Hume as a utilitarian.

However, the prevailing interpretation of Hume’s theory is one that has virtue and character rather than consequences as the object of evaluation (see Swanton 2015; Taylor 2015a; Radcliffe 2022; Greco 2025). While we have a tendency to approve of qualities that are useful to society, persons possess other qualities that we admire but that have no effect on the public welfare. For instance, we enter into sympathy with persons who enjoy themselves, whose traits are conducive to their own happiness or amusement. So, Hume observes that virtues fall into four categories: those useful to others; those immediately agreeable to others; those useful to the self; and those immediately agreeable to the self. This classification of virtues is readily apparent in the second Enquiry, since Hume devotes a chapter to each kind. Some virtues fall into more than one category; for instance, courage is a virtue both agreeable to the possessor and useful to those affected by the courageous person’s actions. Some readers see Hume as a normative theorist, advocating for developing a certain character, and others see him as a descriptive theorist, portraying what we take to be normative for us. Either way, Hume maintains that possession of virtue is connected to happiness and the ability to live with ourselves (Russell 2013; Watkins 2018).

5. Religion

Hume’s reputation as a critic of religion is well-earnt. He questions religious dogma with varying degrees of directness throughout many of his works, and many of his interventions (particularly on miracles and on the teleological argument) are classic contributions to the philosophy of religion.

Hume’s earliest contribution to the philosophy of religion is likely the “Fragment on Evil,” which has only recently been found in 1993 and published in 1995. The Fragment was framed at about the same time that Hume wrote the Treatise, and has a modest scope, aiming only to establish the impossibility of discerning the moral attributes of God from God’s natural attributes. The Fragment has important implications for Hume’s philosophy of religion (Ooi 2022).

5.1 Miracles

Hume initially intended to include a discussion of miracles in the Treatise, but ultimately removed it for fear of offending his readers. He includes a pithy intervention on this topic in the Enquiry concerning Human Understanding, however. The majority of believers in miracles do not claim to have witnessed them; rather, they take the occurrence of miracles to be fact based on the testimony of other people. Accordingly, Hume’s discussion of the legitimacy of belief in miracles in the Enquiry focuses on the value of human testimony as sound evidence, but first he writes about epistemic assurance.

Our beliefs in matters of fact, for Hume, are based upon experiences of constant conjunctions of events, but some conjunctions are more constant than others. Thus, “in our reasonings concerning matter of fact, there are all imaginable degrees of assurance, from the highest certainty to the lowest species of moral [practical] evidence” (EHU 10.3). It would be unwarranted to assert with certainty that the third week of July in London will be warmer than the first week of October, since temperatures vary within months, and our generalizations about temperatures are not guaranteed in every instance. The occurrence of particular future events is more or less probable and “a wise man, therefore, proportions his belief to the evidence. In such conclusions as are founded on an infallible experience, he … regards his past experience as a full proof of the future existence of that event” (EHU 10.4). So, we justifiably take as proven in Hume’s sense that a suspended stone falls to earth or that wood burns (although a contrary event is always possible).

Then Hume defines a miracle this way:

A miracle is a violation of the laws of nature; … It is no miracle that a man, seemingly in good health, should die on a sudden; because such a kind of death, though more unusual than any other, has yet been frequently observed to happen. But it is a miracle that a dead man should come to life; because that has never before been observed in any age or country. There must, therefore, be a uniform experience against every miraculous event, otherwise the event would not merit that appellation. (EHU 10.4)

When it comes to testimony, before we consider "proven" or even probable an event to which someone attests, we are rationally required to investigate possible counterevidence. Accordingly, we explore whether the witnesses are credible, whether there are witnesses with contradictory testimony, whether we know of conjunctions of events that lead to beliefs contrary to this testimonial, and so forth. Hume argues that “no testimony is sufficient to establish a miracle, unless the testimony be of such a kind, that its falsehood would be more miraculous, than the fact, which it endeavours to establish …” (EHU 10.13). Call this “Hume’s Maxim.” However, Hume asks: was there ever a case of the miraculous that answers to this criterion, or was there ever a testimony that amounted to proof? The credibility of the witnesses is crucial here, and Hume argues that observation supports a negative answer.

Some critics have thought this to be Hume’s a priori proof of the conclusion that no testimony is sufficient to establish a miracle or that miracles are not possible—and have criticized the argument on grounds that is question-begging, given Hume’s definition of a miracle (Johnson 1999). However, Hume’s analysis of belief in miracles also includes a second part, meant to show readers what would be required to establish the credibility of the report of a miracle. Hume’s example supposing that “all authors, in all languages, agree, that, from the first of January 1600, there was a total darkness over the whole earth for eight days” (EHU 10.36) seems to imply that it is not inherently impossible that testimony could establish the occurrence of this sort of event (Fogelin 2003). Hume says that the decay of nature is not impossible or improbable, given our experience, and such a case “comes within the reach of human testimony, if that testimony be very extensive and uniform” (EHU 10.36).

Critical analyses of Hume’s argument often interpret it in terms of Bayes’ Theorem, which represents in mathematical terms how to update the probability of an event in light of new information, given its prior probability. In this connection, one debate is especially noteworthy. John Earman (2000) appraises Hume’s argument as “a shambles” and “an abject failure.” Earman attributes to Hume a “straight rule of induction,” from which it follows that “If n As have been examined, all of which were found to be Bs, then if n is sufficiently large, the probability that all As are Bs is 1,” where “sufficiently large” is to be settled by psychological investigation (23). It would follow that all presumed laws of nature have a probability of 1 and miracles have a probability of 0, and no future evidence can change the probabilitities. This is a bad argument, whether or not it is Hume’s. Earman’s evidence for attributing this view to Hume comes in part from a letter Hume wrote to Hugh Blair in 1761: “The proof against a miracle, as it is founded on invariable experience, is a species or kind which is full and certain when taken alone, because it implies no doubt, as is the case with all probabilities” (HL i 350).

Peter Millican (2013) argues that this reading is contrary to much of what Hume says, including the final clause of the sentence left out in Hume’s letter quoted just above: “… but there are degrees of this species, and when a weaker proof is opposed to a stronger, it is overcome.” According to Millican, Earman misunderstands Hume’s maxim from EHU 10.13. While Earman reads it in terms of comparing the probability of a miracle (conditional on the testimony and our past experience) against the probablity of no miracle (conditional on the same), Millican argues that it “involves a comparison between two quite different ‘proofs,’ one concerning the relevant kind of testimony ‘considered apart and in itself’ (in terms of the character, number, and manner of the witnesses etc., but not the specific event reported), and the other concerning the event reported (in terms of its lack of conformity to our experience)” (276). Hume seems committed here to an “Independence Assumption”: “that different ‘kinds’ of testimony (specified in terms of the character and number of the witnesses, the manner of delivery etc.) carry a different typical probability of truth and falsehood independently of the event reported” (Millican 2013, 277). Still, the Independence Assumption, although not trivial, does not fare well, given that one implication of Hume’s argument is that the same kind of testimony can yield very different probabilities, depending on the prior probability of what it reports (281). However, perhaps a Bayesian reading of Hume is altogether misguided and Hume subscribes to an empirical, rather than a mathematical, notion of probability found in the Baconian approach (Vanderburgh 2019). This would make Hume’s argument more plausible.

5.2 Hume’s Anthropology of Religion: The Natural History of Religion

In his Natural History of Religion, Hume traces what he regards as the natural and psychological causes of religious belief as distinguished from its foundation in reason. Our uncertainties about good and evil and their causes give rise to hope and fear, which, along with our tendency to anthropomophize, produce ideas of invisible, but multiple intelligent causes. On Hume’s speculative account, polytheism evolved into monotheism, in part because of people’s desires to please a particular god, whom they eventually declare to be the one, true God.

Some commentators (Norton 1986; Gaskin 1988) have thought Hume’s aim in NHR to be support of his philosophical arguments concerning the non-rationality of religious belief and the false association of religion and morality. On the other hand, it might be that Hume’s purposes in this work were not critical, given that Hume both ignores revelation and recognizes reasons for what he calls “genuine theism.” Perhaps Hume’s goal was chiefly to explain why “false” forms of religious belief are so widespread and so influential (Falkenstein 2003). On another view, Hume’s aim in NHR is to “destabilize” the central religious belief in a deity, that is, to force suspension of such belief until further examination of other justifications for it can be undertaken (Kail 2007c). And yet another possibility is that Hume intends to show, first, that almost all popular religions, including popular monotheism, are deeply superstitious; and second, that superstitious monotheism is incompatible with the variety of theism supported by the argument from design, which Hume recognizes as reasonable (Marušić 2012).

5.3 The Nature of God: Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion

The Dialogues is unusual among Hume’s work insofar as it is one of his few works not to be written in his own voice (alongside the four essays on happiness). There are four characters in the Dialogues. The three main characters are as follows. Cleanthes is a religious empiricist who defends probable arguments regarding God’s nature; he endorses what we now call teleological or design arguments for God on the basis of the order and purposeful design we find in the world, suggesting the existence of an intelligent creator. Demea is a religious rationalist who opposes Cleanthes, taking God’s nature to be inscrutable. According to Demea, the teleological argument is problematic insofar as it infers properties of God from the world, but such properties are unknowable to human minds. Then there is Philo, who is a sceptic, notably offering philosophical criticism of Cleanthes’s core argument (unlike Demea who mainly offers religious or dogmatic criticisms of it). The fourth character, Pamphilus, is Cleanthes’ student, and takes on the role of narrator.

Philo’s criticisms of design arguments remain influential to this day. First, he undermines the analogy between human creations and a human creator on the one hand, and the world and a divine creator on the other. Notably, the world has only a vague analogy to human creations, and there are significant disparities between them; this makes it difficult to straightforwardly infer the existence of a divine creator God from the observable world. Next, paralleling Hume’s sceptical argument about the external world, Philo argues that we cannot establish a causal connection between God and the world, since we have only observed one conjunct, and only once (i.e., the world—or more specifically, a small part of the world). Since causation is constant conjunction, and probable reasoning requires repeated experience of both conjuncts, we are not entitled to make any probable inference as to the existence of God. Moreover, Philo points out that Cleanthes’ analogy falls far short of establishing an omnipotent, omniscient, omni-benevolent creator; given the imperfections in the world, it can only establish an imperfect creator, or indeed creators.

The Dialogues raises several major interpretive issues. The first is perhaps the most obvious: which character, if any, speaks for Hume? The most popular option is Philo (Penelhum 1979; Holden 2010). All three main characters echo Hume’s philosophy at some point, but Philo does so the most; moreover, his brand of scepticism is quite clearly Hume’s own mitigated scepticism in the Enquiry. And yet Hume claims in a letter to Gilbert Elliot of Minto that he makes Cleanthes the hero of the Dialogue, and Pamphillus declares Cleanthes the victor of the debate at the close of this work. The second most popular option is that no single character speaks for Hume, but rather each of them does at different points (Willis 2015; Black & Gressis 2017). Views seeing Pamphilus or Cleanthes as speaking for Hume are somewhat dated now, and no one seriously considers the possibility that Demea does so. This interpretive topic is, as one would expect, highly relevant to the question of the degree of Hume’s own religious commitments, although the line between, say, Philo and atheism is not an entirely direct one, for reasons we will shortly see.

The second major interpretive issue is Philo’s dramatic reversal and apparent profession of piety at the close of the Dialogues. Towards the end of the work, Philo, having seemingly had Cleanthes on the ropes for most of the discussion, suddenly concedes that “the cause or causes of order in the universe probably bear some remote analogy to human intelligence” (DNR 12.33); he also professes that “no one has a deeper sense of religion” or “pays more profound adoration to the divine Being” than himself. This is puzzling. One possibility is that Philo offers no real concession to religion in the apparent reversal (Bailey & O’Brien 2014; Lemmens 2012). Another possibility is that Philo’s reversal constitutes, or is at least be consistent with, a religious commitment on his part (Willis 2015; Black & Gressis 2017). More modestly, the apparent reversal might indicate only a weak or attenuated commmitment to the existence of God (Holden 2010; Garrett 2012). Alternatively, perhaps Hume intended for Philo’s reversal to present a deliberate ambiguity for the readers (Holden 2023).

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