Philosophy of Immunology

First published Thu Dec 22, 2016; substantive revision Thu Jan 22, 2026

Philosophy of immunology, a subdiscipline of philosophy of biology, explores ontological and epistemological issues related to the studies of the immune system regarded in its functional multiplicities. While speculative investigations and abstract analyses have always been part of immune theorizing, until recently philosophers have largely ignored immunology. Yet the implications for understanding the philosophical basis of organismal functions framed by immunity open up perspectives on fundamental questions about identity, individuality, cognition, scientific methodology and theory construction. This broad agenda derives from immunology’s multifaceted research program that has developed from its initial clinical challenges of host defense, transplantation, autoimmunity, tumor immunology, and allergy. However, those disciplinary boundaries have been expanded by recent work on immune processes mediating neuro-endocrine functions and the role of immunity in mediating ecological relationships, both with the external environment and the interior holobiont. This broader context highlights the need to comprehend immunity within the comprehensive biology of an integrated organ system and the microbiota that compose its complex ecology. The growing interest of philosophers, science studies scholars, and the general public has been catalyzed by both the COVID-19 pandemic as well as recent scientific advancements in immunology that include new vaccine technologies and immunotherapy breakthroughs. In addition to these well-established research areas, the immune system is increasingly recognized as playing a role in diverse physiological functions, development, ecology, and evolutionary mechanics. Holding together these diverse domains of inquiry lie philosophical commitments oriented by organismal identity. In this regard, several central philosophical questions include how to understand the immune system’s role in determining the organism’s

  1. cognition (organization of immune perception and information processing);
  2. individuality (framed by the ecological context of immune-mediated assimilation and rejection);
  3. and integration of complex systems (modeled by systems biology).

Indeed, immunology, in the context of cognitive science, evolutionary biology, environmental sciences, and development provides multiple entry points for philosophy of biology. Moreover, studies of immunity are uniquely positioned to address central problems in philosophy of biology and, more broadly, philosophy of science. These include the reductionism/holism debate, the characterization of the goals and methods of systems biology, the organization and character of cognition and information, and the challenge of integrating complexity theory with big data studies.

1. Introduction

The immune system is typically represented as a system of defense that protects the organism from pathogens. However, immunity is known to play other crucial functions that include:

  • wound healing and repairing damaged tissues (Forbes and Rosenthal 2014);
  • recognizing and destroying cancer cells (Swann and Smyth 2007);
  • guiding changes during growth and development (Ramos 2012);
  • helping control how the body uses food for energy (Zmora et al. 2017);
  • maintaining friendly relationships with bacteria that live in our gut and on our skin (Kurashima and Kiyono 2017);
  • playing a role in selecting compatible sexual partners and preventing incompatible cells from taking residence in the body (Davis 2014);
  • affecting brain functions including mood, memory, thinking, social behavior, and the ability to navigate spaces (Dantzer 2018); and
  • using chemical messages that help control growth and energy use (Burzyn, Benoist, and Mathis 2013; Davies et al. 2013).

Thus, by responding to the inner and outer environments of the organism, the immune system participates in multiple capacities to coordinate diverse physiological functions and to provide communication between them.

Despite the multifaceted role of the immune system and its importance in promoting survival and persistence of all forms of life (Pradeu 2012, 22–32), immunology has traditionally been of minor interest to philosophers of biology. However, increased attention has recently been directed to address a range of ontological and epistemological problems related to immune phenomena. These discussions began with examining immunology’s theoretical structure with studies focused on the “immune self” — a fundamental construct of biological identity (Tauber 1994; Pradeu 2012), which were then expanded to explore the nature of biological individuality, organism–environment boundaries and symbiotic relationships. That perspective requires examining the ways in which immune processes scale beyond individual organisms to encompass holobionts, multispecies assemblages, and collective-level processes in populations (herd immunity) (Zilber-Rosenberg and Rosenberg 2008; Gilbert, Sapp, and Tauber 2012; Chiu and Gilbert 2015; Douglas and Werren 2016; Pradeu and Vivier 2016; Gilbert and Tauber 2016; Schneider 2021; 2023). For example, such a widened vantage has provided new insight into reproductive tolerance, gestation, and maternal-fetal immunological interactions (Yoshizawa 2016; Nuño de la Rosa, Pavlicev, and Etxeberria 2021; Morgan 2022).

In addition, traditional questions pertaining to mind-body interactions (Boem, Ferretti, and Caiani 2021; Ciaunica, Shmeleva, and Levin 2023) have assumed new perspectives with advances in psychoneuroimmunology (Tresker 2022; Greslehner, et al. 2023) that have prompted philosophical discussions about cognition, perception, and the formation of psychological selfhood (Sánchez-Ramón and Faure 2020; Boem et al. 2023). Metaphorical and narrative frameworks underpinning immunological discourse have also been critically examined and deconstructed (Martin 1994; Ferri 2018; Zach and Greslehner 2023; Kamenshchikova et al. 2023; Swallow 2023). Thus, immunology raises fundamental questions in philosophy of biology and science studies concerning identity, cognition, individuality, organic organization, and ecological relationships. And with these contributions, immunology joins wider discussions of agency, a topic of growing interest to philosophers of biology (e.g., Skewes and Hooker 2009; Arnellos and Moreno 2015; Okasha 2024; Pickering 2024; Moss 2024; Rosslenbroich, Kummel, and Bembe 2024; see the entry on agency).

While philosophy of immunology has expanded its examination of the discipline in tandem with its scientific developments, an increasing diversity of methodological and conceptual approaches have also emerged in this field. Prominent among these are “philosophy in science” (PinS), a research program that integrates philosophical analysis with rigorous empirical engagement, which contributes not only to key philosophical debates but also addresses immune theory and research that bridges philosophical and scientific communities (Pradeu 2012; Pradeu et al. 2024). Other philosophers adopt a historical and epistemological orientation, tracing how immunological concepts evolve in tandem with experimental systems and sociocultural norms (Tauber 1994; 2017). Feminist, postcolonial, and STS-inspired thinkers examine the political and ethical dimensions of immunological metaphors and practices, such as vaccination and public health interventions (Martin 1990; Haraway 1991; Esposito 2004; Brown 2018). Phenomenologists and enactivist cognitivists approach the immune system as integral to embodied subjectivity and pre-reflective agency (Varela et al. 1988; Boem et al. 2023). Finally, relational, systemic, and ecological perspectives characterize immunity as a dynamic regulatory network embedded in broader developmental, metabolic, and environmental contexts (Pradeu 2019a; Tauber 2008; Daëron 2025).

Thus, while still nascent, philosophy of immunology is developing as a distinctive area of inquiry that integrates diverse theoretical approaches and methodological frameworks to examine the conceptual foundations and methodological implications of this science. That perspective provides new ways of approaching biological organization, organism-environment interactions, and systemic regulation. Importantly, such lines of inquiry have proven relevant not only to philosophy but also to the adjacent scientific domains of theoretical immunology (Pradeu 2019a; Pradeu 2019b), ecology (Tauber 2017), neuro- and cognitive sciences (Varela et al. 1988), developmental biology (Fagan 2007), microbiology (Méthot and Alizon 2014), and evolutionary biology (Hull, Langman, and Glenn 2001). And beyond contributing to discussions within major themes of contemporary biology, the immunological domain intersects with psychological (Sánchez-Ramón and Faure 2020), anthropological (Martin 1990), sociological (E. Cohen 2009), political (Esposito 2004; Mutsaers 2016; Brown 2018; Davis 2022) and socio-cultural fields of analysis (Wilce 2003). In sum, the wide spectrum of topics addressed, and the plurality of approaches employed by philosophers of immunology resonate with broader interests of their philosophy of science colleagues in which interdisciplinary integration and methodological pluralism are increasingly recognized as essential for addressing complex biological phenomena.

2. Organism-Level Functions of the Immune System

Insofar as maintaining biological integrity is essential for survival, virtually all organisms must rely on diverse protective immune functions. From single-cell organisms utilizing the CRISPR–Cas system to neutralize viral DNA, to antimicrobial compounds in plants and pattern recognition receptors in insects, to complex multicellular immune systems in invertebrates and vertebrates deploying layered cellular and molecular defenses, the ubiquity of immune strategies is evident across the tree of life (Pradeu 2019a). Furthermore, comparative studies suggest that some immune mechanisms are not merely analogous but derive from conserved molecular modules that have been retained and repurposed across species (Georjon and Bernheim 2023; Bonhomme et al. 2025). The diversity and ubiquity of these strategies suggest that natural selection has shaped immune mechanisms at different biological levels -- genes, cells, organisms, and populations – that must align the integration of diverse biological units (see the entry on units and levels of selection).

In vertebrates, immunity is organized through a complex network of specialized lymphoid organs that support the development and selection of immune cells to coordinate systemic surveillance and mediation of environmental encounters (rejection or assimilation). Various organs (bone marrow, thymus, spleen and lymph nodes) are interconnected by blood and lymphatic vessels, enabling immune cells and their mediators to operate as an integrated surveillance and response network. Vertebrate immunity operates through two evolutionary distinct systems — “innate” (or “natural”) and “adaptive” (or “acquired”). The evolutionarily primordial system is composed of a family of phagocytes—“eating cells”—possessing distinctive characteristics based on their tissue distribution. They ingest particulate microbes and destroy effete, cancerous, and damaged host cells. These cells constitute the first line of the immune encounter and perform surveillance and restoration functions, while their related antigen-presenting cells (APCs) are instrumental in processing ligands for immune processing.

The innate immune system is integrated with the second arm of lymphocyte-mediated immunity that is characterized by its highly specific recognition capabilities and potential to mount enhanced responses upon subsequent encounter with an antigen (a phenomenon known as “immune memory”). Such acquired immunity is mediated by B and T lymphocytes activated either by APC first-encounters or as primary responders under certain conditions. The B lymphocytes produce antibody that recognizes antigens by structural homology and, correspondingly, T cells have specific antigen-matching receptors on their cell surface. Both the innate and acquired immune cellular elements are regulated by a vast array of soluble molecular factors that serve to either activate or dampen immune responses. Although they have distinct functional characteristics and evolutionary history, these two arms of immunity engage in an extensive crosstalk and molecule exchange that integrates them into a unified complex system (Pradeu and Du Pasquier 2018).

Historically, two major theoretical frameworks have modeled immunity. Early bacteriologists pioneered a defensive perspective that was re-enforced by discoveries of rejection phenomena associated with blood transfusion and experimental transplantation in the mid-twentieth century (Medawar 1944; Burnet 1969). Although the protective stance has been best studied because of immunology’s early assignment to clinical disease, a complementary constructive and integrative orientation has gained prominence as attention turned to how immunity is instrumental in establishing 1) the microbiome, essential to animal physiology and development, and 2) tolerant assimilative nutritive processes. The foundation for this dual view began with Ilya Metchnikoff’s late 19th-century studies that presented inflammation as a mechanism to correct the “disharmony” induced by injury, senility and infection (Tauber and Chernyak 1991, Tauber 2003). He assigned the phagocytes the key roles of killing pathogens and clearing cellular debris, which extended his earlier embryological observations of these cells remodeling tissues (e.g., “eating” the tadpole’s tail) (see the entry on developmental biology). Thus, Metchnikoff’s theory of inflammation went well beyond infectious diseases. For him, immunity included maintaining organismal integrity in growth, repair, senility, and disease. This medley of processes comprises immune identity functions, and unlike the early immunochemists, who were concerned primarily in defining the molecular mechanisms of immunity, Metchnikoff asked how inflammation served to establish and then maintain the organism’s identity. His query became nothing less than “What is the organism?” or, more specifically developed as immunology matured, What is the self? That question emerged again after World War II, when immunology turned from its primary immunochemical concerns to also address biological issues revolving around tolerance and autoimmunity. With that inflection, immunology returned to the Metchnikovian problem of how organismal identity was defined, as opposed to being primarily concerned with identifying those mechanisms that defend an already well-demarcated host. With this theoretical agenda, immunology’s findings have carried philosophical implications that resonate with wider debates about identity and individuality that have since been taken up in philosophy of biology, cognitive science, and political theory (see the entry on biological individuals).

2.1 The Immune Self

The “immune self” has served as immunology’s foundational concept of ordering immune theorizing for the past 70 years (Tauber 1994; Silverstein 2009). It originated from the work of an Australian immunologist, Sir Macfarlane Burnet, who suggested that the immune system learns to tolerate a defined set of molecules during embryogenesis (Burnet and Fenner 1949). These molecules that establish the animal’s core identity, persist as a unique essence of a subject, forming the basis for self-reidentification and differentiation from others (Burnet 1959, 59). His theory proposed that autoreactive immune cells (lymphocytes) are purged during embryonic development to leave only those lymphocytes that ignore specific antigens encountered during this early stage and thus directed to “nonself” (Burnet 1957a). Defined negatively by a lacuna in the lymphocyte repertoire, immunological selfhood was assumed to persist in the adult as an invariant molecular ‘essence’ of the organism, an interpretation drawing from commonly held beliefs about Western identity and the psychological ego (autonomous most prominently) (Burnet 1959; Tauber 1994, 194).

Danish immunologist Niels Jerne challenged this model by proposing a self-referential network of antibodies that recognize each other, thereby establishing internal images of antigens (Jerne 1974). Influenced by existentialist philosopher Søren Kierkegaard’s conception of self-reflexivity (Soderqvist 2003), the immune system in Jerne’s model is not ‘blind’ to self as in Burnet’s model but actively recognizes itself (the antibodies), whose identity is disrupted by intrusion of a disrupting antigen. Otherness, “nonself” in Burnet’s parlance, is an intruder that alters the equilibrium of the self-referential network. In this network-centered view, the self is dynamic and relational, emerging from and maintained by ongoing interactions among antibodies rather than from a fixed molecular essence (Varela and Coutinho 1991). While the specific mechanisms Jerne proposed have generally not been retained as an explanatory basis for immune reactivity, the underlying idea of internal dynamics was developed further by the “tunable activation threshold” (TAT) framework proposed by Zvi Grossman and William E. Paul. They conceptualized lymphocyte responsiveness as dynamically adjusted by the recent history, strength, duration, and frequency of receptor engagement. On this view, activation thresholds of immune cells are continually tuned so that persistent, structured signals are accommodated (tolerated) while abrupt perturbations elicit responses (Grossman and Paul 1992; 2000; 2001).

During the 1980s, developments in innate immunity research opened another line of argument against Burnet’s self/nonself model. Instead of the ligand carrying its status upon binding to T or B cells (i.e., whether to ignore or to reject), the reaction depended on interactions with auxiliary cells that served as collective gatekeepers of the reaction (Medzhitov and Janeway 1997). Charles Janeway argued that antigen alone does not trigger adaptive immune responses but requires second signals from APCs. These findings showed that immune recognition is directed not toward foreignness per se but toward signals indicating infection carried by evolutionarily conserved microbial patterns—a model he termed, “infectious nonself” (Janeway 1989; 1992). Subsequently, Polly Matzinger proposed a more general departure from the self/nonself model by arguing that immune responses are triggered by stress- or damage-associated “danger” signals rather than by foreignness per se (Matzinger 1994; 2002). Accordingly, immune activation depends on contextual information distributed across multiple sensing modes (pattern recognition, damage detection, altered and missing self, and stress surveillance), rather than fixed, categorical, pre-determined self/nonself discriminatory determinants (Carpenter and O’Neill 2024; Medzhitov and Iwasaki 2024; Pradeu et al. 2024).

Further dismantling the self/nonself model, Thomas Pradeu and Edgardo Carosella claimed that the immune system responds not to foreignness as such, but to the rate and pattern of change in antigenic stimulation that is then interpreted by the immune system as an activation or tolerant event (Pradeu and Carosella 2006a; 2006b; Pradeu 2012). This discontinuity hypothesis (also referred to as the “continuity thesis”) posits that ligands maintaining continuous interactions with immune cells, whether genetically “self” or “foreign”, are tolerated, while abrupt changes or disruptions in such interactions trigger immune rejection responses. The philosophical significance of this theory lies in its dissolution of the traditional self/nonself dichotomy, replacing it with a dynamic, relational understanding of immune identity. This framework provides a unified explanation for phenomena that challenge classical models: physiological autoimmunity (where the immune system responds to self tissues), tolerance to commensal bacteria and persistent viruses, the acceptance of some grafts, and the complex immunological negotiations required during pregnancy.

The notion of discontinuity aligns with broader philosophical position that have moved away from substantialist conceptions of identity toward dynamic and relational understandings. The classical self/nonself framework has been interpreted as embodying a substantialist view, where the immune system is regarded as protecting an unchanging metaphysical core (Pradeu and Carosella 2006a, 246). This perspective has been linked to classical philosophical conceptions of an individual possessing an intrinsic essence (Tauber 1994; Howes 1998), reminiscent of Descartes’ concept of a fundamental identity distinct from the physical body (Descartes 2008[1641]). Under this interpretation, the organism appears as a singular, permanent, and confined unit, with its immune responses specifically directed against external entities, thereby sharply defining the organism’s boundaries in relation to its environment (Tauber 2017). In contrast, the discontinuity thesis, reconceives the organism as an “immunological individual,” whose boundaries are dynamic and porous, produced and maintained by ongoing immune surveillance and regulation rather than a pregiven identity (Pradeu 2010; 2012). This framework addresses how the immune system can tolerate entities that are genetically foreign (like commensal bacteria) while sometimes responding to self tissues, depending on the temporal and physiological context of the encounter.

The non-substantialist reconceptualization has led to the view of immune identity as “liquid” (Grignolio et al 2014), where the immune system is portrayed as participating in mediating transformations in organismal identity by constantly redefining and modulating immune reactivity towards endogenous and exogenous molecules (Tauber 2017). Tolerance of newly encountered antigens demonstrates the “fluid” state of the reactive immune repertoire that undergoes alteration over the lifespan of the organism. And with a changing “immune biography,” biological identity no longer conforms to the simple binary division of “self” and “nonself” that has hitherto characterized immune theorizing. Accordingly, it has been argued that living beings have no immutable essence that would ensure persistence of identity, at least as determined by immune tolerance or rejection (León-Letelier, Bonifaz, and Fuentes-Pananá 2019).

Nevertheless, the self/nonself idiom continues to persist in contemporary immunological discourse as a powerful heuristic tool (cf. Geenen 2021; Koncz, Balogh, and Manczinger 2024). Defenders of the self/nonself framework argue that the notion of stabilized discrimination correctly depicts the immune system’s organizing functions that converge on defending a well-demarcated organism and efforts to eliminate or modify this construction are misguided (Hoffman 2012; Anderson 2014). Drawing from the philosophical canon, Howes referred to Hume to argue that realism about self (immune or otherwise) can be saved despite the dependency of context and the ever-changing character of the postulated ego (Howes 1998). She suggested that the efforts to deny the reality of the self are based on its non-substantial character and thus reflects entrenched substantialist assumptions. She proposed that a middle ground exists between substantial self and no-self by adopting a processual, understanding of selfhood (Howes 1999), a position that joins rank with processual philosophy of biology, more generally (Nicholson and Dupré 2018; see the entries on philosophy of cell biology; molecular biology).

2.2 Immune Individuality

Immunity has traditionally accounted for guarding deleterious mis-identification of the organism’s own tissues (Silverstein 2009), a view extended by early transplantation experiments demonstrating the immune basis of graft rejection (Loeb 1945; Medawar 1957). These studies suggested that individuals are segregated by a pattern of unique individuality markers and the history of immunological encounters that calibrate tolerance and responsiveness. Symbiosis poses a major challenge to this classical self/nonself formulation. Instead of such steadfast demarcations, consortia of organisms comprise symbiotic relationships that are indispensable to normal development and physiology of the host animal. The resulting holobiont is both established and maintained by immune processes (e.g., tolerance, checkpoints, and repair) that regulate and stabilize host–microbe integration (Eberl 2016).

This reconceptualization has challenged the classical anatomic, physiologic, developmental, and evolutionary criteria of individuality, inasmuch as “hosts” are dependent on such symbiotic “others” for normal functions (Gilbert, Sapp, and Tauber 2012). Recognizing that fundamental integration, reorients the immune schema from the limits of binary decisions to one that coordinates and synthesizes diverse molecular signals to ceaselessly monitor the organism’s internal state and the surroundings in which it lives (Cohen 2007a; 2007b). In the context of such dynamic interchanges, the immune system moves from a static defense force to a gatekeeper that regulates the terms of interaction between the organism and its environment (Tauber 2008, 231; Gilbert, Sapp, and Tauber 2012; Tauber 2017). With this orientation, the classical defense paradigm has been characterized as an “original teleological sin,” insofar as it presupposes that the function of the immune system is to protect a pre-given, bounded self by eliminating what is foreign (Daëron 2025). Rather than being framed exclusively in terms of the elimination of foreign entities, immunity has also been described as analogous to the nervous system (see section 5), in that it integrates biological signals to regulate interactions with heterogeneous biological partners. This adjudicating process demotes the singular function of maintaining atomistic insularity (and associated individuality) for a relational construct in which environmental challenges offer potential opportunistic adaptations.

The role of immunity in defining biological individuality has been revivified, reframed, and extended by this new appreciation of the integration and continuity of host–tissue–microbe interactions within the discontinuity theory (Pradeu 2012; Pradeu 2016). As mentioned, on this account immunity detects and reacts to spatiotemporal discontinuities in the pattern of molecular and cellular interactions and thus can include or exclude entities based on these dynamics (Pradeu 2012; Pradeu, Jaeger, and Vivier 2013). This continuity-based criterion and its reliance on the history of inter-relationships allow symbionts, microchimeric cells, and even some grafts to count as constituents of physiological individuality (Pradeu 2012). In contrast, disruptions of stable states caused by infection, malignant transformation, or tissue damage elicit rejection or remodeling responses. Based on this view of immune-mediated individuality, animal boundaries are dynamic, porous, and contingent on the dynamics of host–tissue–microbe interactions. This model expands the standard criteria of biological individuality based on functional autonomy, mutually interdependent parts, genetic homogeneity, and spatial boundaries (Clarke 2010) (see the entry on biological individuals).

Insofar as the concept of “immune individuality” identifies the principle of cohesion offered by immune regulation that unifies its parts functionally, this emphasis on integration aligns with “physiological individuality,” understood as a continuous and functionally unified organization of parts (Pradeu 2016). Although complementary to the concept of “evolutionary individuality,” the idea of “physiological individuality” differs from the former in that it focuses on the mechanisms of how components maintain the functional unity of an organism rather than on reproductive success or evolutionary fitness, by asking which processes provide the “glue” that holds them together (Pradeu 2012; 2016).

The ambiguity of the boundaries of individuality is well exemplified in pregnancy, where the maternal immune system must tolerate “foreign” fetal cells. Pregnancy presents a paradox posing a metaphysical dilemma where the fetus is both physiologically distinct yet dependent on its mother (Medawar 1953). This duality has led to varied interpretations: some view the fetus as an integral part of the mother, akin to a limb (Rothman 1989; Kingma 2019), while others emphasize its physiological autonomy (Smith & Brogaard 2003; Howsepian 2008). Although embryonic antigens are recognized by the maternal immune system, they do not normally trigger rejection but rather lead to a variety of responses that help to restructure the architecture of the uterus and promote regulated fetal development. Delineation of the role of inflammation during blastocyst implantation further supports this interactive perspective, demonstrating that instead of acting as a rejection response, inflammation promotes a mutually tolerant fusion between the embryo and the mother (Griffith et al. 2017; Mor, Aldo, and Alvero 2017). Indeed, the transformation of an inflammation-induced reaction pathway into a cell differentiation pathway in decidual stromal cells exhibits the intimate connection of the immune and reproductive systems in eutherians (G. Wagner, Erkenbrack, and Love 2019; Nuño de la Rosa, Pavlicev, and Etxeberria 2021).

These findings further challenge traditional self-nonself discrimination schema by underscoring the ambiguous nature of fetal-maternal exchanges (Weasel 2001; Howes 2007; 2008; Yoshizawa 2016). Some authors interpret the immune evidence differently, maintaining that the fetus is recognized as foreign by the maternal immune system (Devanesan 2024). So, the case of gestation leaves unresolved questions about whether the mother and fetus constitute one or two individuals. The maternal immune system’s perception of the fetus is pivotal in this discussion: When the developing embryo is regarded as a “semi-allogeneic graft,” it is perceived in terms of a separate entity (Medawar 1953); conversely, tolerance of fetal antigens like self-tissues implies a unified whole. So, asking whether the mother’s immune system recognizes the fetus as self or foreign provides an empirical perspective on the philosophical definition of individuality, which as noted, leaves the issue unresolved and highlights the dilemmas of defining biological individuality.

Another example of this conceptual challenge arises in the doctrine of immunosurveillance of cancer. When the immune system’s role was primarily envisaged as shaped by evolutionary selection to recognize altered endogenous molecules (neoantigens), malignancy presented as transformed “self” equivalent to foreign molecules. Such antigens then were expected to activate immune responses as a consequence of the general surveillance function directed at eliminating intruders (Burnet 1957b; Thomas 1959). Michod argued in this context that multicellularity is stabilized by conflict-mediating “policing” mechanisms that mediate internal selection of cellular development. The immune system, together with programmed cell death and early germ–soma separation, serve as the major regulatory functions that preserve organismal integrity (Michod 1999; Michod 2003). Accordingly, when these mechanisms fail, internal selection reemerges as somatic “cheating,” prompting the view that cancer constitutes a “deunification of an individual” (Pradeu 2019a, 29–43). However, “policing” understood as immune-mediated elimination of cellular defectors is complicated by studies of cancer immunoediting, which involves the capacity of the immune system not only to attack a tumor but also to reshape its cancerous evolution and even promote its growth and escape (Dunn et al. 2002). In such scenarios, the role of the immune system in preserving an organism’s individuality becomes ambiguous due to the duality of both promoting and suppressing malignancy (Pradeu 2019a).

Again, rather than adhering to a binary concept of individuality, cancer (like pregnancy) has been considered to exhibit intermediate stages of discriminatory differences, so autonomy (or any criterion of individuality) has been viewed as a processual matter. Individuality in this framework falls on a spectrum that is more fluid and dynamic than the rigid dichotomy originally proposed in Burnet’s self/nonself model: the fetus is not strictly categorized as self or foreign by the immune system, and similarly, cancer is not merely an altered “self” recognized by immune surveillance. Moving away from binary distinctions and relinquishing firm epistemological criteria requires more flexible ways of explicating biological identity and more specifically, individuality. Given this ambiguity and the parochial assumptions about individuality prevalent in various fields of biology that have found no ready application in immunology, it seems fair to conclude that no single account suffices (Pradeu 2010; 2012; Guay & Pradeu 2016). Part of the conundrum may lie in the efforts to consider the issue at the metaphysical, rather than at the epistemological level (Love and Brigandt 2017; Love 2018). Indeed, the status of the “immune self” is a fecund case in point.

3. Eco-Immunology

While contemporary immunology is dominated by its traditional research concerns centered on clinical immunity, a discernible theoretical inflection has emerged in studying immune phenomena situated in the animal’s larger ecological context. This relational orientation examines how immunity mediates host-environmental (both inner and exterior) interactions rather than focusing solely on the autonomous organism. The organism-environment construct offers a more complex conception of the organism and the immune mechanisms that mediate these relationships (Tauber 2017). While the ecological view of immunity was initially developed in the context of disease ecology in an epidemiological context (Burnet and White 1972), the current emergence of eco-immunology studies symbiotic ecosystems, mutualistic host–microbe dynamics, and population-level interactions among somatic cells (as in cancer ecology and somatic evolution). By introducing notions of adaptation, competition, and cooperation into accounts of immunity, broader questions of natural selection and evolution beyond the biology of the individual organism point to the immune system’s more general roles.

This expanded formulation aligns with integrative ecological approaches in developmental biology, physiology, cancer biology, and molecular ecosystems, which analyze somatic phenomena in terms of population-level dynamics and interdependencies (Karasov, Martínez del Rio, and Caviedes-Vidal 2011; van Baalen and Huneman 2014; Nathan 2014; Gilbert and Epel 2015; Maley et al. 2017). Those recent developments build on nineteenth-century ideas in which somatic cells were depicted as social organisms forming stable associations (Reynolds 2018, 12–58). Assuming such interactions serve the welfare of the organism, Virchow described a “cell state” (or “cell republic”), a metaphor that informed sociological models of cellular communication (Virchow 1858 [1863]; R. Wagner 1999; Reynolds 2018, 86–113). Pathologically, this consortium was likened to a “civil war” of competing cell lines, a Darwinian model depicting an internal struggle for existence throughout an individual’s life (Roux 1881 [2024]; Queller and Strassmann 2009; Godfrey-Smith 2009). Metchnikoff’s harmonious/disharmonious schema treated cells as operating under Darwinian principles similar to those guiding organismal adaptation to changing environments (Buss 1987; Swiatczak 2023), thereby offering a common framework for understanding dynamic biological communities—whether internal cell lines or organisms —adjusting to their milieu (Metchnikoff 1901 [1905]; Tauber and Chernyak 1991). This dynamic orientation appears in various theoretical guises but collectively underlie the challenges posed to static notions of individuality and the promotion of dialectical constructs instead (Levins and Lewontin 1985).

Since Koch, struggle and cooperation in immune contexts were often attributed to intrinsic characteristics of invading microbes that, due to virulence factors and other gene-encoded traits, act as either pathogens, commensals, or mutualists (Méthot and Alizon 2014). More recent accounts reconsider microbial virulence as an emergent property dependent on host and microbial factors whose interactions are not derivable from first principles (Casadevall, Fang, and Pirofski 2011). Disease causation is thus presented as a multifaceted interaction within a dynamic ecological system, where health versus pathology results from complex interplays among species and environmental conditions that defy simple self/nonself distinctions (Schneider 2023). Within such frameworks, immunity and individuality are described in terms that emphasize interdependent relationships between hosts and their microbial communities (Schneider 2021). This shift in focus from intrinsic pathogenicity to ecological accounts reflects changed epistemic assumptions about what observations matter and how causal adequacy is judged in host–microbe research (Schneider 2020). Within feminist philosophy of science, this shift reflects epistemic values that prioritize interactions and context over pathogen-centered causation (Schneider 2025).

Ecological approaches to immunity analyze parasitism, commensalism, and mutualism as bidirectional exchanges through which microbes and hosts construct ecological niches. These perspectives draw attention to tolerogenic mechanisms that permit assimilation of commensal microbes and inform models of coordinated interaction among somatic cell populations, offering a counterpoint to views of the immune system as primarily pathogen-eliminating. The concept of disease tolerance, derived from plant ecology and applied to animal immunity, exemplifies this reorientation. Tolerance describes a host defense strategy that reduces the negative impact of infection on host fitness without affecting pathogen burden, operating instead through tissue protection, stress responses, and repair mechanisms (Medzhitov, Schneider, and Soares 2012). Within this framework, concepts of pathogenicity and individuality are reconsidered to accommodate stabilized host–microbe relations and somatic ecosystems. The individual animal is described as a complex ecological community—engaging in cooperation and competition—rather than as a singular, autonomous entity conceived as under assault. Accordingly, organismal boundaries and identities emerge through ongoing relational processes—both adversarial and opportunistic— whose outcomes are determined by contextual factors, not by fixed, essentialist properties.

From this perspective, shifting the focus of inquiry from individuals to ecosystems complicates core distinctions such as self/nonself, pathogen/commensal, immune/non-immune, and organism/environment. The interface between the genetic body and resident microbes is framed less as a defensive frontline and more as an ecological ecotone—an interactive zone where cellular communities negotiate adaptive possibilities (Tauber 2008). The importance of such interfaces is illustrated by mutual scaffolding and niche-construction strategies used by microbial symbionts and hosts to guide the development of larger ecological units (holobionts) (Chiu and Gilbert 2015). Recent evidence portrays boundaries among parasitism, commensalism, and mutualism as flexible and contingent on host factors, microbiota dynamics, and environmental conditions (e.g., temperature, nutrients) (Méthot and Alizon 2014). Some authors relate contemporary views of plasticity, pathogenicity, and virulence to nineteenth-century concepts of microbial–host equilibrium (Méthot 2012). In disease ecology, long-lasting host–parasite associations have been modeled as climax states with stable population levels (Burnet and White 1972; Anderson 2004). Immune equilibrium models describe persistent viral colonization as a “dynamic but metastable equilibrium between the virome and the host” (Virgin, Wherry, and Ahmed 2009; Eberl 2010). Eco-immunology’s emphasis on balance highlights states in which offensive and defensive forces neutralize one another to form stable associations with minimal impairment to either party (Swiatczak 2014). On this basis, eco-immunology is often presented as complementary to older clinical orientations and as a source of additional medical strategies.

4. Immunity and Evolution

The environmental perspective not only refers to the application of ecological and evolutionary perspectives to immune modeling, but also includes lessons learned from studies of immunity that reciprocally inform current understanding of evolution. How these findings shed light on the character of evolutionary change is well-illustrated by the research of heritable immune variation. The origin of variation has been subject to much debate in philosophy of biology. Advocates of the view that non-random, environmentally induced factors are involved in the generation of heritable variation cite evidence of stress-induced mutagenesis, horizontal gene transfer, and non-genetic systems of inheritance (Koonin 2012, 257–291; Veigl 2022). Such discoveries have been interpreted as suggesting that organisms may enhance their own adaptation to altered environmental conditions epigenetically (J. Shapiro 2011; Jablonka and Lamb 2014). These mechanisms raise philosophical questions about whether the response to specific environmental cues that leads to alterations of phenotypic features, when transmitted to succeeding generations, should be considered Lamarckian (Sarkar 1991; Depew and Weber 1996). Notwithstanding evidence for such mechanisms, postulated non-random mechanisms of evolution have been disputed by those who claim that appeals to Lamarckism are misguided and stem from mis-interpreting the Neo-Darwinian synthesis (Merlin 2010; Weiss 2015).

The CRISPR-Cas system in prokaryotes provides a compelling case study for these philosophical debates about evolutionary mechanisms. Many bacteria and most Archaea possess this adaptive immune system that allows them to incorporate foreign DNA fragments and use them as templates for defense against future invasions (Horvath and Barrangou 2010; Koonin 2019). In simple terms, CRISPR works by capturing short pieces of invader DNA, storing them as a record, and later using that record to recognize and disable matching sequences. One might regard this as the inheritance of environmentally acquired information—without implying foresight or purpose—where exposure to a phage leaves a heritable molecular “memory” that shapes later responses. Because such changes arise through interaction with the environment and can be transmitted to descendants, some authors have described CRISPR–Cas as a Lamarckian mechanism (Koonin 2012, 265; Koonin 2019). This interpretation remains controversial. Critics argue that although failing to conform to the neo-Darwinian paradigm, this system seems to lack the teleological character originally postulated by Lamarck and thus better regarded as a model of directed mutagenesis (Weiss 2015; Wideman et al. 2019; Woolley et al. 2019). Others counter that a continuum of Lamarckian-Darwinian mechanisms exists in nature, and that CRISPR-Cas represents an instance of a directional evolutionary process complementing a variety of random, selective mechanisms (Koonin and Wolf 2016; Jablonka 2019). Advocates of this more inclusive interpretation place CRISPR-Cas systems among other non-Darwinian mechanisms like those mediating epigenetic inheritance and thus advocate for a more dynamic and complex framework for understanding evolution than previously acknowledged (Gissis and Jablonka 2011). These debates illustrate ongoing tensions in evolutionary theory about the role of directed versus random change.

Similar philosophical questions arise from vertebrate adaptive immunity. The genetic mechanisms of immune specificity involve processes that challenge traditional evolutionary frameworks. When exposed to antigens, lymphocytes undergo selection based on receptor binding fitness, followed by hypermutation processes that further refine specificity (Tonegawa, et al. 1974; Podolsky and Tauber 1997; Swiatczak 2020). The philosophical significance is that this process exemplifies non-random selection and adaptation (Simon, Hollander, and McMichael 2015). As the process of hypermutation acts on pre-selected cells to improve adaptive fit of their receptors to ligands, the outcomes appear biased in ways that some argue fail exact criteria of Neo-Darwinism (cf. Dobzhansky 1970).

The elucidation of the genetic mechanisms of immune specificity has broader implications for understanding selection as a general principle (Darden and Cain 1989; Podolsky and Tauber 1997; Hull, Langman, and Glenn 2001). The clonal selection theory (CST), the foundational framework of modern immunology, states that the immune system relies on a Darwinian-like process of selection to permit differential expansion of lymphocytes, whose receptors are fitted to bind an antigen (Burnet 1959). This has philosophical significance as CST has been compared to other selective theories as an example of a more general principle applicable to modeling cycles of replication, variation, and environmental interaction (Darden and Cain 1989; Hull, Langman, and Glenn 2001) and as a guide for future selective theories, e.g., neural group selection (cf. Edelman 1974; 1987). Differences between selection theories have also been recognized and suggest that unlike evolution of species, selection in somatic systems (e.g., the neural system) does not fully account for the adaptation of the developing populations (Dumouchel 1996).

The phenomenon of vertical immune transfer raises additional philosophical questions about inheritance. Maternal antibodies may be passed on to descendants, allowing progeny to inherit some of the acquired immune characteristics of their parents. For example, the composition of the microbiota mothers pass on to the infant through vaginal and breastfeeding routes not only constructs a microbial model for offspring but also programs the newborn’s immune system and metabolism (Chiu and Gilbert 2015; Mueller et al. 2015; Gomez de Agüero et al. 2016). When viewed through an evolutionary lens, the acquisition of an infant’s immune characteristics exemplifies how the environment may influence inheritance, where transmission of selective pressures from one generation to another pre-sets the progeny’s adaptation to the environment (Odling-Smee, Laland, and Feldman 2003; Odling-Smee et al. 2013). These findings have been interpreted as challenging traditional Darwinian and Lamarckian categories with wide-ranging ramifications in biology. Indeed, such a general scheme may be relevant in cognitive science and linguistics, as well as in other disciplinary domains outside of the life sciences (Piattelli-Palmarini 1986).

5. Immune Cognition and Language

The immune system has long been characterized with cognitive terminology — “recognition,” “learning,” “memory,” and “decision making” — though such linguistic choices have generated considerable debate within the field (cf. Rosengarten 2023; Colaço 2025). Beyond mere metaphorical convenience of telescoping complicated phenomena, the functional parallels exhibited by the immune and nervous systems suggest that they may share a common information-processing architecture, forms of computation, and signal integration and thus offer complementary insights (Cohen 1992a; 1992b). However, related analyses have emphasized that such parallels between immune and neural functions are best understood at the level of relational physiology without implying that the immune system is cognitive in a representational or mental sense (Vaz 2011; Tauber 2017, 157–158; Daëron 2025). Distinct from these conceptual debates, empirical research has demonstrated extensive bidirectional interaction between immune and nervous systems, including molecular signaling pathways, which coordinate functions that cannot be attributed exclusively to any of these systems in isolation (Pradeu 2019a; Kamimura et al. 2020; Gough 2024). These findings do not by themselves settle questions about immune mediated cognition, but they nevertheless have informed philosophical discussions about the embodiment of cognition and the possible extension of cognitive processes beyond strictly neural substrates (cf. Ciaunica, Shmeleva, and Levin 2023).

5.1 Extended Cognition

Philosophical implications of immune-neural integration challenge traditional views of cognition confined to the brain. Although the brain was historically conceived as immunologically privileged (isolated by the blood-brain barrier), contemporary research has revealed extensive bidirectional communication between neural and immune systems (Villabona-Rueda et al. 2019). Immune cells engage in reciprocal molecular crosstalk with neurons through diverse shared molecular mediators, coordinating neurodevelopmental, inflammatory, and repair processes that raise fundamental philosophical questions about cognition (Raanes and Stiles 2021; Rengasamy et al. 2021).

The potential of immune cells to process information and coordinate responses has been used to support the view that cognition is not confined to neural processing alone but relies on computational processes distributed across all cellular systems in the body (Ciaunica, Shmeleva, and Levin 2023). The advocates of this perspective challenge the neuro-centric view of cognition by demonstrating how cellular and molecular immune networks integrate cellular decision-making and thereby coordinate local responses of individual cells to collectively determine systems-level behavior (Ciaunica, Shmeleva, and Levin 2023). On this view, we literally “think with all the cells of our bodies,” which positions the immune system not merely as a supportive network but as an integral component of a multiscale cognitive architecture that spans from cellular to organismal levels of biological organization (Ciaunica, Shmeleva, and Levin 2023). Accordingly, cognition extends as a function of the entire organism, an interpretation which accepts that cognition is mediated by systems that can be described partly in physical terms, but the molecules and cells making up the immune system obtain their global functionality only when the organism is considered in its totality. Simply, the organism confers the cognitive properties upon the immune system, not vice versa and to confuse these different kinds of description could be considered as the “mereological fallacy” (Bennett and Hacker 2003).

The role of the microbiota adds another layer of complexity. The extension of immune system processing beyond somatic components to incorporate microbial factors establishes the foundation for the concept of “co-immunity,” an extended form of immunity encompassing the host and its symbiotic microbiota (Bazin, Chiu and Pradeu 2022). This perspective depicts the microbiota not as passive residents of the host systems but as active participants in immune regulation that constitutes a complex web of responses that profoundly impact host health and wellbeing (Chiu et al. 2017; Pull and McMahon 2020; Bazin, Chiu and Pradeu 2022). This enactivist perspective represents more than just another characterization of cognition. The evidence for integrated nervous, immune, and endocrine systems challenges the reductionist “building block model” that has long dominated biological theorizing (Ader 2006; Greslehner et al. 2023). Dispensing with discrete, modular functions with predetermined roles represents a significant shift from mechanistic frameworks, in which organisms conceptualized as assemblages of independent parts are reconceived with a more holistic, relational ontology. In this reconceptualization, biological functions emerge from dynamic interactions between co-evolved systems rather than existing as intrinsic properties of isolated components (Greslehner et al. 2023). A parallel philosophical problem arises in conceptualizing immunity itself. By expanding the functional immune repertoire beyond defence to encompass development, repair, metabolism, and homeostasis, the immune system loses precise ontological boundaries (Zach and Greslehner 2022). Within these formulations immunity emerges as a property arising from the interactions of multiple physiological networks. Such complexity demands new conceptual models capable of capturing such complex phenomena.

5.2 Information Processing and Communication

The conceptualization of immunity as information processing has deep historical roots that originated in Burnet’s suggestion that immune recognition involves information-like processes, where he interpreted molecular interactions in terms of signalling and communication (Burnet 1956; Tauber 1994). These ideas emerged within mid-twentieth-century theoretical biology, influenced by cybernetics and systems theory, including interdisciplinary exchanges such as the 1952 “Information Theory in Biology” symposium organized by Henry Quastler (Burnet 1956, 164–165).

The broader adoption of the term “immune system” in the 1960s coincided with an increasing interest in the organism as governed by an integrated regulatory system. This development was part of a more general movement in biology toward systemic and computational modes of explanation, drawing analogies with control theory, neural networks, and models of distributed computation (Wiener 1961; Moulin 1989). Insofar as immune receptors were originally conceived as sensors capable of decoding environmental signals, this conceptual alignment reinforced the idea of immunity as an information-processing network analogous to the nervous system (Tauber 1994, 161–163; Cohen 2000). Computational models of immunity, including agent-based simulations and artificial immune system algorithms, have further developed this analogy -- treating immune functions as responses to a form of distributed information processing. Unlike the brain, no centralized controller directs the immune response that emerges from local interactions among numerous immune components (Forrest and Hofmeyr 2001). This distributed processing challenges traditional notions of control and agency in biological systems. While such models have proven useful for simulating immune behaviour, they have also raised questions about the nature of biological information, the scope of representational frameworks in the life sciences, and the relevance of computational metaphors in immunology (Cohen and Efroni 2019). These debates reflect broader philosophical questions about how information, meaning, and identity are generated and regulated in biological systems. The convergence of cognitive science and immunology thus offers a productive arena for exploring fundamental questions about the nature of cognition, information, and biological organization.

6. Reductionist versus Holistic Models of Immunity

Immunology provides rich case studies for examining debates about reductionism versus holism and the role of theory in the biomedical sciences (see the entry on models in science). For example, Schaffner, in his criticism of the classical view of scientific theories, provided a detailed analysis of the clonal selection theory and the two-step model of immune activation to illustrate what he called, middle-range theories that consist of interrelated theoretical models (Schaffner 1980). While early commentators posited theory as the essential platform for conducting meaningful scientific exchanges, more complex sociological factors have suggested nuanced interplay between theory and practice (Fagan 2023). For instance, interdisciplinary partnerships between clinicians and immunologists demonstrate that healthcare solutions can be fostered without a unifying framework, thereby transcending conceptual boundaries and encouraging the exploration of innovative strategies. A taxonomy of immune models (both conceptual and experimental) further highlights how a medley of diverse approaches is required for investigative advances (Baetu 2014).

While theory holds a prominent place in modeling immune phenomena, integrative hypotheses are still required to make sense of complex biological phenomena and to facilitate the translation of research findings into clinical applications. Immunology exemplifies how theoretical unification can guide research while avoiding oversimplification: Immune responses must be understood not as isolated cellular events, but as phenomena shaped by the context determined by multiple biological systems. Such integrative approaches serve important heuristic functions in synthesizing findings into actionable medical strategies. Beyond serving as an exemplar for theoretical integration, immunology has also been employed to develop cognitivist models, elucidate conceptual and theoretical change in biology, and elaborate on contentious issues about reductionism and anti-reductionism.

Apart from elucidating issues pertaining to identity and individuality in the animal’s broader ecological and evolutionary history, philosophy of immunology also contributes to discussions about the origin, organization, and methods of biological knowledge. Reflecting on explanatory practices of immunology, epistemic analysis has an important practical dimension that contributes to developing methodological strategies and conceptual tools to handle the complexity of the immune response. As immunologists grapple with increasing data complexity, genomic, proteomic and transcriptomic studies are producing vast amounts of data with only a modest understanding of the basic organization and regulation that must integrate systems-level and molecular-level approaches (Ohno 1990; Schatz and Langmead 2013; see the entry on genomics and postgenomics). This challenge has intensified historical debates about the most appropriate methodological approach to understanding immunity, which have echoed long-standing tensions between reductionist and holistic approaches in the life sciences more generally (see the entry on reductionism in biology). While reductionism aims to explain immune phenomena by reference to molecular or genetic mechanisms, holistic perspectives emphasize system-level interactions, such as network dynamics and environmental context. This tension plays out in discussions of immune system modularity versus integration and then defining the modalities in which cells, inter-active signals, and systemic properties might best be modeled.

Both reductive and holistic immunological research agendas have vied for dominance throughout the history of the discipline (Silverstein 2009, 25–42). The immune-chemical program, championed by Ehrlich and other immunochemists during the first half of the twentieth century, examined immune reactions in terms of chemical and physical characteristics governing binding of ligands to their immune receptors (Silverstein 2009, 456). These immunochemists were adopting a “unifactorialism” strategy that endeavors to explain complex biological processes in terms of single factors. That program was modified and renewed by the elucidation of the genetics of antibody diversification, a series of discoveries that placed immunology well within the molecular biology revolution (Podolsky and Tauber 1997).

Alternative approaches emerged from those who argued that purely reductionist methods could not capture immune complexity. Early advocates of such approaches, like Metchnikoff, described immunity in terms of cells and cellular interactions, a “biological” perspective extended by Burnet, who attempted to integrate molecular processes with organismal-level phenomena (Crist and Tauber 2000; Baxter 2006, 38). He presented immunity in terms of adaptation, selection, and population-level cell behavior, rather than solely in terms of chemical and physical molecular reactions. As already discussed, this broadened biological perspective introduced the ‘self’ into the immune lexicon and brought new figurative language associated with agency and a host of metaphors borrowed from other human experience. Yet crucially, Burnet also postulated the existence of molecular signatures of self and considered lymphocyte receptors as independent decision-makers mediating immune reactions based on their binding of cognate antigens (Burnet 1969). Burnet’s approach thus demonstrated that holistic and reductionist approaches need not be mutually exclusive. By representing cases of theoretical integration and explanatory heterogeneity, epistemic strategies adopted by Burnet and other organism-oriented immunologists fit into the inclusion of plurality and unification increasingly regarded as necessary to capture the complexity of immunity.

Contemporary systems biology approaches attempt to transcend the reductionism-holism divide (Mazzocchi 2012; Green et al. 2018). After all, attempts to explain complex immunological phenomena in terms of isolated parts and interactions without taking into consideration the global structural and functional complexity that these phenomena exhibit have been ineffective. For example, vaccine development studies, when limited to investigation of the structural correlates of antigen-antibody interaction without deeper understanding of the dynamic features of a host-pathogen encounter, often proved unsuccessful (Van Regenmortel 2002). So, instead of assuming that non-reductionist explanations must ignore lower-level molecular details, system-oriented immunologists attempt to model the multilevel complexity of the immune reactions they study (Rivas et al. 2017).

Dynamical systems theory and a variety of network-based approaches are used in systems biology to integrate distinct levels of analysis and elucidate the complexity of the biological phenomena in question (Green et al. 2018). Within this framework, computer simulations have treated the immune system as a non-equilibrium dynamical system, whose endogenous fluctuations generate shifting patterns of activity much like a weather system rather than a stable baseline merely perturbed by antigenic input (Perelson 1988). Such complex dynamics suggest that even complete mechanistic understanding may not be sufficient to explain immune behavior without situating those mechanisms within their broader dynamical and contextual settings. In fact, systems-oriented approaches increasingly emphasize the necessity of integrating both molecular and higher orders of analysis, reflecting a broader epistemic shift away from single-level explanations toward integrative methodologies (cf. Löwy 2008, 172; see the entry on philosophy of systems and synthetic biology).

However, the program of melding the reductionist and holistic methods as complementary to each other has been slowed by both technical and conceptual hurdles (Fang and Casadevall 2011). How to model the system as a system requires the collection of information about the totality of interactions to explain causal interactions with multiple inputs and stochastic outcomes. No approach has achieved dominance and, consequently, the question of how massive data might be incorporated into a systems-wide comprehensive model comprises a key challenge of contemporary immunology (Das and Jayaprakash 2019).

7. Immunology’s Social Dimensions

From its inception, the self’s appearance in immunology served as a readily understood shorthand reference to personal identity, and the efforts to substantiate that extrapolation on its own terms guided the discipline for the latter half of the twentieth century (for historical case studies see Löwy 1991). Commentators have observed how immunology’s conceptual framework extends beyond the experimental science by drawing from wider social meanings of individuality and insularity (Tauber 2016). The autonomous construction of identity resonates with Western civic ideals and in turn supports them by melding laboratory findings with various extrapolated or borrowed philosophical, political, and psychological formulations of human agency (E. Cohen 2009). And conversely, immunology has been studied as a source of important metaphors and other tropes feeding back on the science’s supporting culture to transform understanding of agency and communal relationships.

The imagery of the foreign, whether absorbed or rejected, underlies popular understandings of immunity and provides a vivid case study of bidirectional links between science and society. The self–nonself discrimination model portrays immunity as policing a bounded self, a picture that some philosophers of immunology have argued is theoretically and empirically limited (Fleck 1935 [1979]; Tauber 1994; 2016; Howes 1999). As discussed earlier, phenomena such as tolerance, symbiosis, and developmental chimerism have been interpreted as motivating a relational understanding of immune-mediated identity and challenging the autonomy of the organism as a basic organizational unit.

Feminist philosophy of science and eco-feminist commentaries have described how militarized metaphors (e.g., “attack,” “defense,” “invader”) instantiate the boundary-making that organizes immune discourse. These critics counter that such biological extrapolations to characterize Western societies ignore the interdependence, situated embodiment, and practices of care that are required for social organization (Haraway 1989; Sontag 1990; Martin 1994). A complementary critique within historiography of immunology suggests that militaristic metaphors have functioned not merely as pedagogical devices but have served to construct immunity as a unified “defense system” (Daëron 2025). This framing was reinforced by early twentieth-century European nationalism and a misreading of the Darwinian concept of “struggle”. Countering the autonomous model of immunity, the authors cite symbiotic exchanges and the tolerance of myriad assimilated foreign materials to challenge the origin and cultural resonance of the atomistic framework. Recent philosophical comment extends this integrative orientation by examining how immunity functions as an organizing concept for thinking about identity, boundaries, and protection across multiple social scales — from individual bodies to political communities — revealing the inherent tensions between autonomy and relationality in both biological and social systems (Tauber 2016).

Scholars argue that the autonomy models in immunology mirror broader preoccupations with selfhood, autonomy, and exclusion in modern societies, suggesting connections between immunological discourse and contemporary political debates about borders, national identity, and citizenship may follow ideological positions (Tauber 1995). In this view, the language of immunity privileges individuality over community and presents foreignness through conflict, while alternative accounts highlight permeability, exchange, and accommodation (Napier 2003). This interdisciplinary scholarship explores the circulation of biological concepts in non-biological contexts and their potential effects on policy and public understanding. Through this lens, “immunity” becomes a central concept for organizing thinking about protective barriers across various levels of social systems, from individual identity formation to large-scale political agendas and ideological programs (Sloterdijk 2011; Esposito 2011).

During the COVID-19 pandemic, the conceptual framework of immunological discourse gained renewed relevance and came under intense scrutiny as this crisis brought immunology’s language into public consciousness. Despite evidence favoring balanced and tailored approaches in clinical contexts, public discourse often emphasized defensive warfare metaphors, e.g., strength and resilience, potentially overshadowing more nuanced strategies (Zach and Greslehner 2023). Furthermore, the prevalent use of military jargon in public dialogue not only influenced societal perceptions but may have also guided health decision-making (Chatti 2021). While the impact of a military orientation remains in debate, equating a pandemic with warfare through such metaphors risks oversimplifying the complexities of public health challenges and thereby unintentionally driving fear-based responses and aggressive tactics over subtler and potentially more effective measures (Chatti 2021; Benzi and Novarese 2022). These concerns highlight the pitfalls of using metaphorical language in the life sciences and caution against the casual employment of such figurative jargon (Reynolds 2022). When interpretations oversimplify complex scientific realities, they may not align with the best scientific evidence or public health practices. Some argue that the defensive framework of immunology should be reconsidered and adjusted for more accurate and holistic representations, to better guide scientific research and fostering public trust, rather than inciting fear or resistance (Ajana 2021; 2022).

The divergent applications of social descriptions to immunology reveal how the science may be employed for culture criticism and, by extension, influence public policy and perceptions of disease. The imagery borrowed from culture becomes transformed through scientific discourse and returns to impact portrayals of persons and their relationships (Martin 1994). This illustrates how immunology provides metaphors for characterizing human societies, while the science draws from its supporting culture to model its biology, demonstrating the bi-directionality of social and scientific discourses (Gieryn 1995). This resonance between science and culture is perhaps nowhere more evident than in debates about vaccination, where individual freedoms and collective health intersect (Brown 2018; Lau 2023). The dual notions of immunity and security offer a framework to explore this co-production of knowledge and social order, as the language of biosecurity extends beyond scientific contexts to shape political visions of threat, governance, and belonging (Napier 2003; Neocleous 2022). Scientific and cultural notions of immunity are thus deeply intertwined, shaping policies and perceptions that impact both individual freedoms and collective wellbeing.

8. Conclusion

Contemporary immunology encompasses diverse theoretical frameworks that draw from multiple life sciences and thus offers a rich source of inquiry for philosophers of biology. The field has been shaped by several major theoretical contributions, including self/nonself model, network theories, and more recently, discontinuity theory, each offering different perspectives on immune identity and function. While classical immune models emphasized the self/nonself dichotomy that depicts the immune response as a simple “on” and “off” binary switch, alternative models employ collectivist, relational and interactive relationships that take into account the context in which immune reactions are regulated. These various approaches focus on accounting for the frequency and intensity of an immune encounter as opposed to defining a simpler mechanical structure/function interaction. This dynamic perspective emphasizes that modulated responses better characterize immune functions, some of which require tolerance of recognized substances and others full activation of rejection.

According to ecological approaches, the incorporation of the contextual setting of immune reactivity demands an environmental (both internal and external) perspective. These approaches join alternative models in the literature (e.g., network and discontinuity accounts) to qualify, and in some cases challenge, insular conceptions of the organism by suggesting a dynamic interactive view that highlights how life experience alters the immune response to myriad challenges and opportunities (Pradeu 2012; 2019a; Grignolio et al 2014). From this vantage, immunity has been described as extending beyond defense of an atomistic individual to include the regulation of the organism’s ecological interactions. This includes the internal environment as well, inasmuch as the microbiome, established through immune niche formation, has directed attention toward the prevalence of immune tolerance, symbiosis, and the biology characterized by cooperative relationships of various sorts (Eberl 2010; Bilate and LaFaille 2012). These perspectives suggest that understanding the balance of defensive and assimilative processes may provide a more comprehensive conception of immunity.

In conclusion, philosophy of immunology is emerging as an area of inquiry with its own subjects of attention and methods that complement rather than mimic or replicate the pursuits in related areas of theoretical and experimental immunology. While the literature remains relatively small compared to other areas of philosophy of biology, the field has produced significant contributions to philosophical understanding. Philosophical studies of immunology have engaged with a range of topics central to philosophy of biology – organismal identity; individuality; dynamic causation in complex systems (integrating complexity theory with big data studies); the characterization of the goals and methods of systems biology; the organization of information; the characterization of the normative and deviant; and personal ontology (self). These inquiries connect to other biological disciplines of interest to philosophers, i.e., development, ecology, genetics, evolution and cognition. And beyond the purview of philosophy of biology, studies of immunology contribute to the more general discussions of reductionism/holism, theory change and conceptual modeling, and social and cultural studies of science (i.e., the function of metaphors in science, the role of a scientific discourse). In sum, a rich two-way traffic between philosophers of immunology and philosophers of science has emerged that allows the former to use tried-and-tested conceptual tools developed by their colleagues, while providing a unique outlook for the latter. Given the centrality of immunology in modern biology and the unique perspective offered by this science on crucial philosophical problems, further engagement not only seems likely, but an imperative for philosophy of science writ large.

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