Intensional Transitive Verbs

First published Wed Nov 3, 2004; substantive revision Thu May 29, 2025

A verb is transitive only if it can occur with a direct object, and in such occurrences it is said to occur transitively. Thus ‘ate’ and ‘left’ occur transitively in ‘I ate the meat and left the vegetables’, but not in ‘I ate then left’ (perhaps it is not the same verb ‘left’ in these two examples, but it seems to be the same ‘ate’). A verb is intensional if the verb phrase (VP) it forms with its complement is anomalous in at least one of three ways: (i) in the complement of the verb, substituting one expression for another that is coreferential with it can change the truth-value of the sentence in which the VP occurs – for instance, you might admire Mark Twain but not Samuel Clemens, unaware that your pesky neighbor Sam is the famous writer (in this case substitution of the coreferential ‘Samuel Clemens’ for ‘Mark Twain’ in the VP ‘admire Mark Twain’ will turn a true sentence, ‘you admire Mark Twain’, into a false one, ‘you admire Samuel Clemens’); (ii) the VP admits of a special “unspecific” reading if it contains a quantifier, or a certain type of quantifier (Quine’s example (1956, 185) is famous: he observes that if we paraphrase ‘I want a sloop’ as ‘there is a sloop such that I want it’, this will give the wrong idea if all I want is ‘mere relief from slooplessness’, a sloop but no specific one; for more examples, see section 1); and (iii) the normal existential commitments of names and existential quantifiers in the complement are suspended even when the embedding sentence is negation-free (again, see section 1). Zimmerman (2001, 516–20) discusses relationships among these three marks of intensionality.

Intensional phenomena are puzzling, and worth studying, because (a) it seems that the only way to account for language-speakers’ capacities to produce and understand sentences of their native languages which they have never produced or encountered before is to posit compositional structure in language along with a productive and interpretive capacity in speakers that exploits it. But (b) the simplest ideas about what such structure is like cannot accommodate intensionality. So we want to know what the smallest complication is which allows for the intensional. Investigation of intensional verbs has focussed mainly on verbs used to make propositional attitude reports. These verbs take clauses rather than direct objects as their syntactic complements. However, as we will see below, intensional transitive verbs (henceforth ITVs) do not merely duplicate the problems raised by propositional attitude verbs, but introduce special difficulties of their own.

1. Some groups of ITV’s and their behavior

Search verbs and desire verbs manifest all three of the behaviors listed in the prologue as “marks” or characteristic effects of intensionality. For example, Lois Lane may be seeking Superman, but it does not seem to follow that she is seeking Clark, even though Superman is Clark. So we have an example of the first kind of anomaly mentioned in the prologue: substitution of one name with another for the same person leads to a change in truth-value for the embedding sentence (here “Lois is seeking Superman”). Similarly, a thirsty person who believes that water quenches thirst and that H2O is a kind of rat poison may want some water but not some H2O. [According to some, this alleged failure of substitution to preserve truth-value is an illusion (the locus classicus of the view is Salmon 1986); but this would simply reduce the three marks to two for some cases, so I will not focus on it.]

Second, search verbs and desire verbs both create specific-unspecific ambiguities in their containing VPs when the syntactic object of the verb consists in a determiner followed by a nominal (this ambiguity is also known as the relational/notional ambiguity, following Quine 1956, where it was first studied in the modern period). For example, ‘Oedipus is seeking a member of his family’ could be true because Oedipus is seeking specifically Jocasta, who is a member of his family, though he doesn’t realize it. On such an occasion, what is true can be more carefully stated as ‘there is a member of his family such that Oedipus is seeking that person’. The alternative, unspecific or notional reading, is forced by adding ‘but no particular one’: ‘Oedipus is seeking a member of his family, but no particular one’. Here Oedipus is implied just to have a general intention to find some member or other of his family (who perhaps meets other conditions – young, female, and so on). Contrast the extensional ‘embrace’: Oedipus cannot embrace a member of his family, but no particular one.

Third, it is obvious that it is possible both to want, and to search for, that which does not exist, for instance, a fountain of eternal youth. But it isn’t possible to, say, stumble across such a thing, unless it exists.

Depiction verbs, such as ‘draw’, ‘sculpt’, and ‘imagine’, resist substitution in their syntactic objects, at least if the clausal ‘imagine’ does, for it is hard to see how a difference between imagining that Superman rescues you and imagining that Clark rescues you could arise if imagining Superman is the same thing as imagining Clark. A specific/unspecific ambiguity is also possible, as is attested by the wall label for Guercino’s The Aldrovandi Dog (ca. 1625) in the Norton Simon Museum, which states ‘this must be the portrait of a specific dog’, thereby implicating the existence of an alternative, that ‘Guercino drew a dog’ could be taken to mean that he drew a dog, but no particular dog — he just made one up. And we can clearly draw or imagine that which does not exist (as opposed to, say, photographing it). Braque’s Little Harbor in Normandy (1909) is an example, according to the curators of the Art Institute of Chicago: the wall-label says ‘it appears this work was painted from imagination, since the landscape depicted cannot be identified.’

However, whether or not a notional reading of a depiction VP is possible depends on which quantificational determiner occurs in the noun phrase complement. If we say ‘Guercino drew every dog’, ‘Guercino drew most dogs’, or ‘Guercino drew the dog’ (non-anaphoric ‘the dog’), we seem to advert to some antecedent domain with respect to which ‘drew every/most/the dog(s)’ are to be evaluated. So specific readings are required.[1] This resistance of some depiction VP’s to unspecific construal is robust across languages and is typical of those quantificational determiners which do not occur naturally in existential contexts such as non-demonstrative ‘there is’: contrast ‘there is a dog in the garden’ with ‘there is every dog in the garden’, ‘there are most dogs in the garden’, or ‘there is the dog in the garden’. An account of what is wrong with ‘there is every dog in the garden’, such as that in Keenan 2003, might well contain the materials for explaining the lack of unspecific readings of depiction VPs with determiners like ‘every’, ‘most’ and ‘the’; see further Forbes (2006, 142–150).

It should be emphasized that depiction verbs are special in this respect, for there is no problem getting unspecific readings in English with ‘every’, ‘most’ and ‘the’ using desire verbs or search verbs. Guercino might be looking for every dog Aldrovandi owns to see which one would make the best subject for the portrait that the Count has commissioned (‘paint a picture of one of my dogs for me’); in this case there are no particular dogs he is looking for. The police might be looking for everyone who witnessed the incident, though they have no idea who or how many those people are (a specific reading is also possible, since perhaps the four men A, B, C and D are all the people who witnessed the incident, and the police seek each individually for unrelated reasons: each of A, B, C and D is such that the police are looking for him, and so they are, as it turns out, looking for everyone who witnessed the incident, whether or not they know that A, B, C and D are those witnesses). The reader might be driving around an unfamiliar airport rental car lot, looking for the exit, and in this case there is no exit such that it is being sought. (‘Look’ isn’t really a transitive verb, but when the following preposition is ‘for’, a search activity is denoted, so it is customary to count the likes of ‘looking for’ as a “transitive verb” in contexts where intensionality is under discussion.)

Mixed behavior is also manifested by evaluative verbs, for example ‘respect’, ‘admire’, ‘disdain’ and ‘worship’. Lex Luthor might fear Superman, but not Clark, and Lois might disdain Clark, but not Superman. However, unspecific readings of VPs with quantified complements are harder to hear, at least when the quantifier is existential. ‘Lois admires an extraterrestrial’ can easily be heard in two ways: there is the ‘admires a particular extraterrestrial’ reading, and there is a generic reading, which means that among the kinds of thing she admires are extraterrestrials in general. Generic readings of evaluative VPs attribute dispositions, and are not the same as unspecific or notional readings (see Cohen 1999, 2008, and the entry on generics). There does not seem to be a sensible non-generic construal of ‘Lois admires an extraterrestrial, but no particular one’. However, there is some question about other verbs, especially ‘fear’. Den Dikken et al. point to examples like ‘Max fears an error in his proof’, where there is no specific error that is feared, yet the non-specific reading isn’t generic (2018, 84 n.40). But perhaps ‘fear’ in this example is simply masquerading as transitive, the words ‘that there is’ having been elided.

The verb ‘need’ is an interesting case. A sports team might need a better coach, though no specific better coach, and might need a better coach even if there are none to be had. So two out of three marks of intensionality are present. However, ‘need’ contrasts with ‘want’ as regards substitution: our dehydrated subject who does not want H2O because he believes it to be a kind of rat poison, nevertheless needs H2O, regardless of his beliefs about it. It seems that co-denoting terms may be interchanged in the complement of ‘need’ (and also of ‘require’). But merely accidentally co-extensive ones cannot be: Larson (2001, 232) gives the example of Max the theater impresario, who needs more singers but not more dancers, even if all who sing dance, and vice-versa. The property singer and the property dancer are different properties, so expressions for them cannot be exchanged in the complement of ‘need’. Similar restricted substitutivity is observed with transaction verbs such as ‘wager’, ‘owe’, ‘buy’, ‘sell’, ‘reserve’, and perhaps the transaction resultative ‘own’. One may reserve a table at a restaurant, though there need not be a specific table one has reserved in making the reservation, since the restaurant may be expecting a slow night. But these verbs do allow interchange of co-referential expressions (a purchase of water-rights is a purchase of H2O-rights) though not of accidentally co-extensive ones (Zimmerman 1993, 151) . For ‘own’ see (Zimmerman 2001, passim).

Indeed, it is even arguable that some marks of intensionality are present with verbs that do allow interchange of accidentally co-extensive expressions. A case in point is verbs of absence, such as ‘omit’ and ‘lack’. If it so happens that all and only the physicists on the faculty are the faculty’s Nobel-prize winners, then a faculty committee that lacks a physicist must, it seems, lack a Nobel-prize winner, if no particular one. However, not too much weight can be put on this case, since it may be that at some level, ‘lack’ should be analyzed (possibly in a complicated way) in terms of not having, and ‘omit’ in terms of not including, in which case they would not really be intensional verbs at all; though so far as the author knows, no convincing analysis of this type has been formulated. One objection to any equivalence is pursued in Moltmann 2024. Moltmann points out that ‘lack’ statements can carry prescriptive implications that “doesn’t have” counterparts don’t carry. If someone asks for a ride home, you may say “Sorry, I don’t have a car” but it would be odd to say ‘I lack a car’, which seems to suggest that you should have one. To explain this and other cases, Moltmann gives a truth-maker analysis of ‘lack’-ascriptions on which they involve adverting to a conception C of a complete whole, and imply that the thing to which the ascription of lack is being made fails to match up to C. For this reason, lacking a physicist would only imply not having (as opposed to lacking) a Nobel prize-winner: there may well be good reason why the committee in question should have a physicist on it, without there being any reason why it should have a Nobel-prize winner.

2. How many mechanisms for how many marks?

We have distinguished three “marks” or effects of intensionality: substitution-resistance, the availability of unspecific readings, and existence-neutrality. A natural question is whether one and the same semantic mechanism underlies all three effects, whether they are entirely independent, or whether two have a common source distinct from the third’s.

In the context of a discussion of propositional attitude verbs, that is, verbs which take clausal or clause-embedding noun-phrase complements rather than simple noun-phrase (NP) objects, one hypothesis which keeps explanatory apparatus to the minimum is that all three effects of intensionality arise from the possibility of the complement having narrow scope with respect to the attitude verb. Thus we might distinguish two readings of

(1)
Lex Luthor fears that Superman is nearby,

namely

(2a)
Lex Luthor fears-true the proposition that Superman is nearby[2]

and

(2b)
Superman is someone such that Lex Luthor fears(-true the proposition) that he is nearby.

In (2a) we make the clause ‘that Superman is nearby’ the complement of ‘proposition’ to guarantee that ‘Superman’ is within the scope of ‘fears’ (the resulting NP ‘the proposition…’ is a “scope island”). And in (2b) we use a form of words that encourages an audience to process ‘Superman’ ahead of ‘fears’. We can associate substitution-resistance with (2a), while allowing substitution in (2b). (2b) ascribes a complex property to Superman, and therefore also to Clark; namely, being someone who Lex fears is nearby. (2a), on the other hand, puts Lex in the fearing-true attitude relation to a certain proposition, with essentially no logical implications about what other propositions he may fear-true. So, provided the proposition that Superman is nearby is distinct from the proposition that Clark Kent is nearby, substitution-failure in (1) construed as (2a) is explicable.

As for taking these two propositions to be distinct, there are many familiar accounts, mostly involving some variation of the original proposal in modern philosophical semantics, found in Frege 1892. According to Frege, every meaningful expression or phrase has both a customary reference that it denotes, and a customary sense that it expresses. In the case of clauses, the customary reference would be a truth-value which is compositionally derived from the denotations of the words of the clause, and the customary sense would be a way of thinking of that truth-value, compositionally derived from the senses of the words of the clause. Therefore, provided that ‘Superman’ and ‘Clark Kent’ have different though coreferential senses, i.e., provided they express different ways of thinking of the same individual, we will get different propositions. However, it’s highly non-trivial to find an adequate account of the senses of names, given the critique in Kripke 1972 of standard accounts and certain variations on them.

But on the face of it, this distinction between sense and reference only has (1), intended in the (2a) manner, expressing a different proposition from

(2c)
Lex Luthor fears that Clark is nearby.

Since truth-value is on the level of reference, and the corresponding words of (2a) and (2c) all have the same referents, the resulting truth-values for (2a) and (2c) will be the same; but they are supposed to be different. So Frege makes the ingenious suggestion that it is an effect of embedding in intensional contexts (he only considered clausal verbs) that expressions in such contexts no longer denote their customary references, but rather their customary senses. Then (1) intended as (2a) is true iff (‘if and only if’) the reference of ‘Lex’ stands in the fearing-true relation to the switched reference of ‘Superman is nearby’, namely, its customary sense. Now we have our explanation of why merely interchanging customarily co-referential expressions in (1) can produce falsehood from a truth: the substitution does not preserve reference, since the names are now denoting their customary senses. However, if (1) is intended as (2b), there will be no truth-value switch, since there is no name-reference switch: in (2b) ‘Superman’ is not in the scope of ‘fears’, therefore it denotes its customary reference, the alien Kal-El, and interchange with any other expression denoting that same referent must of necessity be truth-value preserving. However, importation of the substituted name to move from a (2b)-style meaning to a (2a)-one will of course be fallacious. (Readers in search of more detailed discussion of Frege’s notion of sense might consult the section on Frege’s philosophy of language in the entry on Frege. See also the entry on propositional attitude reports, and for other uses of Frege-style “switcher semantics”, Gluer and Pagin 2012.)

A view like this has the capacity to explain the other intensionality effects. The specific-unspecific ambiguity in ‘Lex fears that an extraterrestrial is nearby’ is explained in terms of scope ambiguity, the notional or unspecific reading corresponding to

(3a)
Lex fears-true the proposition that an extraterrestrial is nearby

and the relational or specific reading to

(3b)
An extraterrestrial is such that Lex fears that it is nearby.

Existence-neutrality is also explained, since the proposition, that an extraterrestrial is nearby, is available for its truth to be feared, believed, suspected or doubted, whether or not there are extraterrestrials.

There are other accounts of substitution failure, but details are incidental at this point. For there are real issues about (A) whether a single mechanism could be responsible for all three effects, and (B) whether an account of any effect in terms of a scope mechanism is workable for transitive, as opposed to clausal, verbs.

(A) The behaviors cited in the previous section suggest that substitution-resistance and the availability of an unspecific reading have different explanations. For we saw that the verb ‘need’ contrasts with the verb ‘want’ as regards substitution-resistance, but is similar as regards the availability of unspecific readings of embedding VPs. So it seems that there is a mechanism that blocks substitution, perhaps the Fregean reference-switch one, perhaps something else more compatible with what Davidson calls “semantic innocence” (Davidson 1969, 172—a semantically innocent account of substitution-failure is one that does not alter the semantics of the substitution-resisting expressions themselves for the special case in which they occur in intensional contexts). And this mechanism cannot occur with ‘need’, but can with ‘want’ (‘can’ rather than ‘does’ because it is optional; this is to allow for “transparent” or substitution-permitting readings of the likes of ‘Lex fears Superman’ analogous to (3b)). On the other hand, whatever explains notional readings is evidently available to both verbs, and therefore it is not the same mechanism as underlies the substitution-resistance of ‘wants’. However, this reasoning is not conclusive, since the substitution-resistance mechanism may be present with ‘needs’ but somehow rendered ineffective (see Parsons 1997, 370), though one would want to hear how the ineffectiveness comes about.

Some evaluative verbs, for instance, ‘admire’, present the converse challenge: substitution-resistance but apparently no unspecific readings of embedding VPs, certainly not existential ones. It is less clear how a defender of a ‘single explanation’ theory would handle this, at least if the single explanation is a scope mechanism, since it appears from other cases that occurrence of an existential genuinely within the scope of the intensional verb immediately produces an unspecific reading.

Suspension of existential commitment may group with availability of unspecific readings for explanatory purposes. There appear to be no cases of intensional transitives which allow notional readings of embedded VPs, but where those VPs have the same existential consequences as ones which differ just by the substitution of an extensional for the intensional verb. For instance, you might be looking for an extraterrestrial to prove such things exist, but that you are looking for one doesn’t entail their existence, whereas if you have found one, then such things exist. So switching from the intensional search verb to the extensional success verb changed existential consequences.

(B) The scope account is the only real contender for a single explanation of the intensionality effects. But there is a major question about whether it can be transferred at all from clausal to transitive verbs. For the intensionality effects would all be associated with narrow-scope occurrences of noun phrases (NPs), and with a transitive verb such syntactic configuration is problematic when the NP is quantified. This is because, in standard first-order syntax, a quantifier must have a sentence within its scope (an open sentence that has a free variable which the NP binds, if redundant quantification is ruled out in the syntax). We can provide this for relational or wide-scope readings, for example

(4)
An extraterrestrial is such that Lois is looking for it

in which ‘Lois is looking for it’ is the scope of ‘an extraterrestrial’ and the latter binds ‘it’. But if ‘an extraterrestrial’ is supposed to be within the scope of ‘looking for’ there is no clause to be its scope; it has to be an argument of the relation, which is not allowed in first-order language. As Kaplan says, ‘without an inner sentential context…distinctions of scope disappear’ (Kaplan 1986, 266). Of course, readers who have taught symbolic logic will be very familiar with the student who, having symbolized ‘Jack hit Bill’ as ‘Hjb’, then offers something like ‘Hj(∃x)’ as the symbolization of ‘Jack hit someone.’

The description of the problem suggests two forms of solution. One is to preserve first-order syntax by uncovering hidden material to be the scope of a quantified NP even when the latter is within the scope of the intensional verb. The other is to drop first-order syntax in favor of a formalism which permits the meanings of quantified NPs to be arguments of intensional relations such as fearing and seeking. We consider these options in turn in the following two sections.

3. Propositionalism

The idea of uncovering hidden material to provide NPs in notional readings of intensional VPs with sentential scope was prominently endorsed in Quine 1956, where the proposal is to paraphrase search verbs with ‘endeavor to find’. So for (5a) we would have (5b):

(5a)
Lois is looking for an extraterrestrial
(5b)
Lois is endeavoring to find an extraterrestrial

Partee (1974, 97) objects that this cannot be the whole story, since search verbs are not all synonyms (‘groping for’ doesn’t mean exactly the same as ‘rummaging about for’), but den Dikken, Larson, & Ludlow (1996) and Parsons (1997, 381) suggest that the search verb itself be used in place of ‘endeavor’. So we get

(6a)
Lois is looking to find an extraterrestrial

or in somewhat non-Quinean lingo,

(6b)
Lois is looking in order to make true the proposition that an extraterrestrial is such that she herself finds it.[3]

Here ‘an extraterrestrial’ is both within the scope of ‘looking’ and has the open sentence ‘she herself finds it’ as its scope.

It may or may not be meaning-preserving to replace (5a)’s prepositional phrase with (6a)’s purpose clause, but even if it is meaning-preserving, that is insufficient to show that (6a) or (6b) articulates the semantics of (5a); it may merely be a cognate. However, with ‘need’ and desire verbs, evidence for the presence of a hidden clause is strong. For example, in

(7)
Physics needs some new computers soon

it makes little sense to construe ‘soon’ as modifying ‘needs’; it seems rather to modify a hidden ‘get’ or ‘have’, as is explicit in ‘Physics needs to get some new computers soon’, i.e., ‘Physics needs it to be the case that, for some new computers, it gets them soon’. (This is ‘get’ in the sense of ‘receives’; for ‘get’ versus ‘have’, see Harley 2004.)

Secondly, there is the phenomenon of propositional anaphor (den Dikken, Larson, & Ludlow 2018, 52–3), illustrated in

(8)
Physics needs some new computers, but its budget won’t allow it.

What is not allowed is that Physics gets (or for this case, ‘purchases’) some new computers.

Third, attachment ambiguities suggest there is more than one verb present for modifiers to attach to (Dikken, Larson, & Ludlow 1996, 332):

(9)
Physics will need some new computers next year

could mean that a need for new computers will arise in the department next year, but could also mean that next year is when Physics should get new computers, if its need (which may arise later this year) is to be met.

Finally, ellipsis generates similar ambiguities:

(10)
Physics will need some new computers before Chemistry

could mean that the need will arise in Physics before it does in Chemistry, but could also mean that Physics will need to get some new computers before Chemistry gets any.

However, the strength of the case for a hidden ‘get’ with ‘need’ or ‘want’ contrasts with the case for propositionalism about search verbs. As observed by Partee (1974, 99), for the latter there are no attachment ambiguities like those in (9). For example,

(11)
Physics will shop for some new computers next year

can only mean that the shopping will occur next year. There is no second reading, corresponding to the other reading of (9), in which ‘next year’ attaches to a hidden ‘find/buy’. The phenomena in (8) and (10) also lack parallels with search verbs; for example, ‘Physics will shop for some new computers before Chemistry’ lacks a reading that has Physics shopping with the following goal: to find/buy new computers before Chemistry finds/buys any. And although the propositionalist might offer something like

(12)
Physics will seek more office space by noon

as an analog of (7), it is far from clear that (12) genuinely has a reading of the ‘seek to find more office space by noon’ sort, or whether the hint of such a reading is just an echo of (7).

Other intensional transitives, such as depiction verbs and evaluative verbs, don’t have an evident propositional paraphrase in the first place. However, for psychological depiction verbs such as ‘fantasize’ and ‘imagine’, Parsons (1997, 376) proposes what he calls “Hamlet ellipsis”: ‘Mary imagined a unicorn’ would become the clausal ‘Mary imagined a unicorn to be’. Larson (2001, 233) suggests that the complement is a “small” or “verbless” clause, and for ‘Max visualizes a unicorn’ proposes ‘Max visualizes a unicorn in front of him’. This is too specific, since we can understand ‘Max visualizes a unicorn’ without knowing whether he visualizes it in front of him, above him or below him. But even if we change the paraphrase to ‘Max visualizes a unicorn spatially related to him’, this proposal, as well as Parsons’, has problems with negation: ‘Mary didn’t imagine a unicorn’ is not synonymous with either ‘Mary didn’t imagine a unicorn to be’ or with ‘Mary didn’t imagine a unicorn spatially related to her’, since the first of these allows for her to imagine a unicorn but not imagine it to be, and the second, for her to imagine a unicorn but not as spatially related to her. There may be philosophical arguments that exclude these options,[4] but the very fact that a philosophical argument is needed puts the proposals above the level of semantics.

Clausal paraphrases for verbs like ‘fear’ are even less likely, since the extra material in the paraphrase can be read as the focus of the fear, making the paraphrase insufficient. For example, fearing x is not the same as fearing encountering x, since it may be the encounter that is feared, say if x is an unfearsome individual with a dangerous communicable disease. In the same vein, fearing x is not the same as fearing that x will hurt you: you may fear that your accident-prone dentist will hurt you, without fearing the dentist (see further Forbes 2006, 66–7).

We conclude that if any single approach to intensional transitives is to cover all the ground, it will have to be non-propositionalist. But it is also possible, perhaps likely, that intensional transitives are not a unitary class, and that propositionalism is correct for some of these verbs but not for others (see further Schwarz 2006, M. Montague 2007).

4. Montague’s semantics

The main non-propositionalist approaches to ITVs begin from the work of Richard Montague, especially his paper “The Proper Treatment of Quantification in Ordinary English” (R. Montague 1973, usually referred to as PTQ in the literature); Montague’s condition (9) (1974, 264) defines ‘seek’ as ‘try to find’, but this is optional. Montague developed a systematic semantics of natural language based on higher-order intensional type-theory; for an accessible introduction, see (Dowty et al., 1981). We explain the term ‘higher-order intensional type-theory’ right-to-left.

Type theory embodies a specific model of semantic compositionality in terms of functional application. According to this model, if two expressions x and y can concatenate into a meaningful expression xy, then (i), the meaning of one of these expressions is taken to be a function, (ii) the meaning of the other is taken to be an item of the kind that the function in question is defined for, and (iii) the meaning of xy is the output of the function when applied to the input. The type-theoretic representation of this meaning is written x(y) or y(x), depending on which expression is taken to be the function and which the input or argument. A functional application such as x(y) is said to be well-typed iff the input that y denotes is the type of input for which the function x is defined.

For example, in the simple theory of types, a common noun such as ‘sweater’ is assigned a meaning of the following type: a function from individuals to truth-values (a function of type ib, for short, where b is for ‘boolean’; the notation is a compressed version of that in Carpenter, 1997). For ‘sweater’ the function in question is the one which maps all sweaters to the truth-value TRUE, and all other individuals to the truth-value FALSE. On the other hand, an (“intersective”) adjective such as ‘woollen’ would be assigned a meaning of the following type: a function from (functions from individuals to truth-values) to (functions from individuals to truth-values), or a function of type (ib)(ib) for short. Thus the meaning of ‘woollen’ can take the meaning of ‘sweater’ (an ib) as input and produce the meaning of ‘woollen sweater’ (another ib) as output; this is why the meaning of ‘woollen’ has the type (ib)(ib). woollen(sweater) is the specific function of type ib that maps sweaters made of wool to TRUE, and all other individuals to FALSE.

In this framework, a quantified NP such as ‘every sweater’ has a meaning which can take the meaning of an intransitive verb (e.g., ‘unravelled’), or more generally, a Verb Phrase (VP), as input and produce the meaning (truth-value) of a sentence (e.g. ‘every sweater unravelled’) as output. Intransitive verbs and VPs are like common nouns in being of type ib. For example, the VP quickly(unravelled) is of type ib, mapping all and only individuals that unravelled quickly to TRUE. So a quantified NP is a function from inputs of type ib to outputs of type b, and is thus of type (ib)b. ‘Every sweater unravelled quickly’ would be represented as (every(sweater))(quickly(unravelled)), and would denote the truth-value that is the result of applying a meaning of type (ib)b, that of every(sweater), to a meaning of type ib, that of quickly(unravelled) (the adverb quickly itself is of type (ib)(ib), like the adjective woollen). Rules specific to every guarantee that every(sweater) maps quickly(unravelled) to TRUE iff quickly(unravelled) maps to TRUE whatever sweater maps to TRUE.

So far, the apparatus is extensional, which, besides providing only two possible sentence-meanings, TRUE and FALSE, imposes severe limitations on the range of concepts we can express. Suppose that the Scottish clothing company Pringle has a worldwide monopoly on the manufacture of woollen sweaters, and makes sweaters of no other material. Then a garment is a woollen sweater iff it is a Pringle sweater, meaning that woollen(sweater) and pringle(sweater) are the same function of type ib, and these two terms for that function are everywhere interchangeable in the type-theoretic language. Then modal operators such as ‘it is contingent that’ cannot be in the language, since interchanging woollen(sweater) and pringle(sweater) within their scope should sometimes lead to change of truth-value, but cannot if the two expressions receive the same meaning in the semantics. For example, ‘it is contingent that every Pringle sweater is woollen’ is true, but ‘it is contingent that every woollen sweater is woollen’ is false. Therefore the concept of contingency has no adequate representation in the type-theoretic (boldface) language.

Shifting to intensional type theory deals with this difficulty. The intension of any expression X is a function from possible worlds to an extension of the type which that expression has in the extensional theory just sketched, if it has such an extension, otherwise to something appropriate for intensional vocabulary such as ‘it is contingent that’. An intension which is a function from possible worlds to items of type t is said to be of type st. sweater, for instance, will have as its intension a function from possible worlds to functions of type ib, providing for each possible world a function that specifies the individuals which are sweaters at that world; so sweater’s intension is of type s(ib). However, a modal sentential operator such as ‘it is contingent that’ will have as its intension a function that, for each possible world, produces the very same function, which takes as input functions of type sb and produces truth-values as output. So the extension of ‘it is contingent that’ at each world is the same function, of type (sb)b. (The operator is said to be intensional because its extension at each world is a function taking intensions, such as functions of type sb, as input.)

A function of type sb is sometimes called a possible-worlds proposition, since it traces the truth-value of a sentence across worlds. For example, with appropriate assignments to the constituents,

(13)
(every(woollen(sweater)))(woollen)

should be true, that is, refer to TRUE, at every world.[5] So the intension of (13) is the function f of type sb such that for every world w, f(w) = TRUE. This is a constant intension. On the other hand,

(14)
(every(pringle(sweater)))(woollen)

is true at some worlds but false at others, those where Pringle makes non-woollen sweaters; so its intension is non-constant.

We define the intension of contingent to be the function which, for each world w as input, produces as output the function c of type (sb)b such that for any function p of type sb, c(p) is true at w iff there are worlds u and v such that p(u) = TRUE and p(v) = FALSE (this is the meaning of ‘contingent that’ in the sense ‘contingent whether’). So the intension of ‘contingent’ is also constant, since the same function c is the output at every world.

Since contingent expects an input of type sb, we cannot write

(15)
contingent((every(woollen(sweater)))(woollen))

since in evaluating this formula at a world w we would find ourselves trying to apply the reference of contingent at w, namely, the function c just defined, to the reference of (every(woollen(sweater)))(woollen) at w, namely, the truth-value TRUE. But c requires an input of type sb, not b. So we introduce a new operator, written ^, such that if X is an expression and t is the type of X’s reference at each world w, then at each w, the reference at w of ^X is of type st. ^X may be read as ‘the intension of X’, since the rule for ^ is that at each world w, ^X refers to that function which for each world u, outputs the reference of X at u.

If we now evaluate

(16)
contingent^((every(woollen(sweater)))(woollen))

at a world w, the result will be FALSE. This is because the function p of type sb that is the reference of ^((every(woollen(sweater)))(woollen)) at every world, maps every world to TRUE. So there is no u such that p(u) = FALSE. But there is such a u for ^((every(pringle(sweater)))(woollen)), and so

(17)
contingent^((every(pringle(sweater)))(woollen))

is TRUE at w. Note that choice of w doesn’t matter, since the intension of contingent produces the same function c at every world, and the reference of, e.g., ^((every(pringle(sweater)))(woollen)), is the same function of type sb at every world.

Finally, our type-theory, intensional or extensional, is higher-order, because the semantics makes available higher-order domains of quantification and reference. sweater refers to a property of individuals, a first-order property. (every(sweater)) refers to a property of properties of individuals, a second-order property. For just as sweater(my favorite garment) attributes the property of being a sweater to a certain individual, so we can think of (every(sweater))(woollen) as attributing a property to the property of being woollen. Which property is attributed to being woollen? The rules governing every ensure that (every(F)) is truly predicated of G iff G is a property of every F. In that case, G has the property of being a property of every F. So (every(F)) stands for the property of being a property of every F.

Treating quantified NPs as terms for properties of properties means they can occur as arguments to any expression defined for properties of properties. We can even rescue the uncomprehending student’s attempt at ‘Jack hit someone’, for provided ‘hit’ is of the right type — which is easily arranged — we can have (hit(someone))(jack). Here hit accepts the property of being a property of at least one person, and produces the first-order property of hitting someone, which is then attributed to Jack. In extensional type-theory, hit has the type ((ib)b)(ib) if (hit(someone))(jack) is well-typed and jack is of type i.[6]

The significance of this for the semantics of intensional transitives is that we now have a way of representing a reading of, say,

(18)
Jack wants a woollen sweater

in which the quantified NP is within the semantic scope of the verb without having scope over a hidden subsentence with a free variable for the NP to bind (recall (6b)): the quantified NP ‘a woollen sweater’ can just be the argument to the verb. To allow for the intensionality of the transitive verb, Montague adopts the rule that if x and y can concatenate into a meaningful expression xy, the reference of the functional expression is a function which operates on the intension of the argument expression. Suppressing some irrelevant detail, this means that if ‘wants’ syntactically combines with ‘a woollen sweater’ to produce the VP ‘wants a woollen sweater’, then in its semantics, want applies to the intension of (a(woollen(sweater))), resulting in the following semantics for (18):

(19)
want(^(a(woollen(sweater))))(jack).[7]

In (19), a(woollen((sweater))) is within the scope of want. So if we take (19) to represent the notional reading of (18), the idea that notional readings are readings in which the quantified NP has narrow scope with respect to the intensional verb is sustained.

5. Revisions and refinements

How does Montague’s account of intensional transitives fare vis à vis the three marks of intensionality? The existence-neutrality of existential NPs is clearly supported by (19), for there is nothing to prevent the application at a world w of want to ^(a(woollen(sweater))) from producing a function mapping Jack to TRUE even if, at the same w, (woollen(sweater)) maps every individual to FALSE (i.e., woollen sweaters don’t exist at w).

Substitution-failure is supported for contingently coextensive expressions. For instance, (19) does not entail want(^(a(pringle(sweater))))(jack) even if there are worlds where all and only woollen sweaters are Pringle sweaters, so long as there are other worlds where this is not so. Let u be a world of the latter sort. Then a(pringle(sweater)) at u and a(woollen(sweater)) at u are different functions of type (ib)b, making ^(a(pringle(sweater))) and ^(a(woollen(sweater))) different at every world. Therefore want(^(a(pringle(sweater)))) may map Jack to FALSE at worlds where want(^(a(woollen(sweater)))) maps Jack to TRUE: since want is applied to different inputs here, the outputs may also be different.

But this result depends on the fact that (pringle(sweater)) and (woollen(sweater)) are merely contingently coextensive. If ‘water’ and ‘H2O’ are necessarily co-extensive, then wanting a glass of water and wanting a glass of H2O will be indistinguishable in higher-order intensional type theory. This failure to make a distinction, however, traces to the intensionality of the semantics — to its being (merely) a possible-worlds semantics — not to its being higher-order or type-theoretic. So possible solutions include (i) augmenting higher-order intensional type theory with extra apparatus, or (ii) employing a different kind of higher-order type theory. In both cases the aim is to mark distinctions like that between wanting a glass of water and wanting a glass of H2O.

A solution of the first kind, following (Carnap 1947), is proposed in Lewis 1972 (182–6); the idea is that the meaning of a complex expression is not its intension, but rather a tree that exhibits the expression’s syntactic construction bottom-up, with each node in the tree decorated by an appropriate syntactic category label and semantic intension. But as Lewis says (p. 182), for non-compound lexical constituents, sameness of intension implies sameness of meaning. So although his approach will handle the water/H2O problem if we assume the term ‘H2O’ has structure that the term ‘water’ lacks, it will not without such an assumption. For the same reason, it cannot explain substitution-failure involving unstructured proper names, on the usual view (deriving from Kripke 1972) that identity of extension (at any world) for such names implies identity of intension. So we have no account of why admiring Cicero isn’t the same thing as admiring Tully.

A solution of the second kind, employing a different kind of higher-order type theory, is pursued in Thomason 1980. In Thomason’s “intentional” logic, propositions are taken as a primitive category, instead of being analyzed as intensions of type sb. In turns out that a somewhat familiar higher-order type theory can be built on this basis, in which, roughly, the type of propositions plays a role analogous to the type of truth-values in extensional type theory. A property such as orator, for example, is a function of type ip (as opposed to ib), where p is the type of propositions: given an individual as input, orator will output the proposition that that individual is an orator. Proper names, however, are not translated as terms of type i, for then cicero and tully would present the same input to orator, resulting in the same proposition as output: orator(cicero) = orator(tully). So there would be no believing Cicero is an orator without believing Tully is an orator. Instead, Thomason assigns proper names the type (ip)p, functions from properties to propositions. And merely the fact that Cicero and Tully are the same individual does not require us to say that cicero and tully must produce the same propositional output given the same property input. Instead, we can have cicero(orator) and tully(orator) be distinct propositions, allowing for an agent to {assume/believe/doubt/hear/suggest} one but not the other (see Muskens 2005 for further development of Thomason’s approach).

Applying this to intensional transitives is just a matter of assigning appropriate types so that the translations of, say, ‘Lucia seeks Cicero’ and ‘Lucia seeks Tully’, are different propositions (potentially with different truth-values). We need to keep the verb as function, and we already have the types of cicero and tully set to (ip)p. The translations of ‘seeks Cicero’ and ‘seeks Tully’ should be functions capable of accepting inputs of type (ip)p, such as lucia, and producing propositions as output. seeks therefore accepts input of type (ip)p and produces output that accepts input of type (ip)p and produces output of type p. Thus seeks is of type ((ip)p)(((ip)p)p), and we get substitution-failure because seeks(cicero) and seeks(tully) can be different functions of type ((ip)p)p so long as cicero and tully are different functions of type (ip)p (as we already said they should be). seeks(cicero) can therefore map lucia to one proposition while seeks(tully) maps it (not ‘her’) to another; and these two propositions can have different truth-values.[8]

Finally, there is the question whether (19) shows that Montague’s semantics supports notional readings. One problem is that Montague’s semantics for extensional verbs such as ‘get’ is exactly the same as for intensional verbs, and it takes an extra stipulation, or meaning-postulate, for ‘get’, to guarantee that the extension of get(^(a(woollen(sweater)))) at w maps Jack to TRUE only if the extension of (woollen(sweater)) at w maps some individual to TRUE (you can want a golden fleece even if there aren’t any, but you can’t get one if there aren’t any). So apparently (19)’s pattern embodies something in common to the notional meaning of ‘want a woollen sweater’ and the meaning of ‘gets a woollen sweater’, something which is neutral on the existence of woollen sweaters. This is unintuitive, but is perhaps not a serious problem, since it can be avoided by a different treatment of extensional transitives.

A more pressing question is what justification we have for thinking that (19) captures the notional, ‘no particular one’, reading of (18).[9] On the face of it, (19) imputes to Jack the wanting attitude towards the property of being a property of a woollen sweater. This is the same wanting attitude as Jack may stand in to a particular woollen sweater, say that one. But it is not at all clear that we have any grasp of what a single attitude with such diverse objects could be, and the difficulty seems to lie mainly with the proposed semantics for notional readings. What does it mean to have the attitude of desire towards the property of being a property of a woollen sweater?

Two ways of dealing with this suggest themselves. First, we might supplement the formal semantics with an elucidation of what it is to stand in a common-or-garden attitude to a property of properties. Second, we might revise the analysis to eliminate this counterintuitive aspect of it, but without importing the propositionalist’s hidden sentential contexts.

Both (Moltmann 1997) and (Richard 2001) can be read as providing, within Montague’s general approach, an account of what it is to stand in an attitude relation to a property of properties. Both accounts are modal, having to do with the nature of possible situations in which the attitude is in some sense “matched” by the situation: an attitude-state of need or expectation is matched if the need or expectation is met, an attitude-state of desire is matched if the desire is satisfied, an attitude-event of seeking is met if the search concludes successfully, and so on. According to Moltmann’s account (1997, 22–3) one stands in the attitude relation of seeking towards ^(a(woollen(sweater))) iff, in every minimal situation σ in which that search concludes successfully, you find a woollen sweater in σ (see also Moltmann (2013, Ch.5) for development of her views). Richard (2001, 116) offers a complex analysis that is designed to handle negative quantified NPs as well (‘no woollen sweater’, ‘few woollen sweaters’, etc.). On this account, a search π demands ^(a(P)) iff for every relevant success-story m = <w, s> for π, things in s with a property entailing P are in the extension of ^(a(P)) at w. Here s is the set of things that are found when the search concludes successfully in w.

By contrast, Zalta (1988), Zimmerman (1993) and Forbes (2000; 2006) propose revisions in (19) itself and its ilk. Zalta formulates an intensional semantics in which propositions are constructed directly, using various construction operations, beginning with primitive objects and properties. For instance, a primitive monadic property has a gap, and there is a plugging operation which allows the gap to be filled with an object to produce a monadic proposition. This in turn may be identified as that which is expressed by a particular sentence, arrived at by standard recursion. However, Zalta’s main objection to the Montagovian approach is not that the idea of holding an attitude towards a property of properties has no intuitive content, special cases aside. It is rather that some correct entailments are not verified, for example, the entailment from ‘John is looking in his briefcase for a pen’ to ‘John is looking in his briefcase for something’. There may or may not be a particular pen John is looking for in his briefcase, but in either case, as Zalta remarks (1988, 81), “if one tapped him on the shoulder and asked what he was doing, he might respond “I’m looking for something””, which seems natural and true however the premise is construed. Montague could force this consequence with a meaning-postulate, but it flows directly from Zalta’s account of unspecific readings, in which there is a distinction between exemplifying and encoding properties. The notional reading of ‘looking for a pen’ is satisfied only if there is an abstract object which encodes being a pen and to which John stands in the seeking relation, so indeed John is looking for something (Zalta 1988, 82–3).

Zimmerman (1993, 161–2) replaces the quantifier intension with a property intension, since he holds that (i) unspecific readings are restricted to “broadly” existential quantified NPs, and (ii) the property corresponding to the nominal in the existential NP (e.g., ‘woollen sweater’) can do duty for the NP itself. Of course, the proposed restriction of unspecific readings to existentials is controversial (cf. our earlier example, ‘the police are looking for everyone who witnessed the incident’). It may also be wondered whether there is any less of a need to explain what it is to stand in the seeking relation to a property of objects than to a property of properties (but for a response to this kind of objection, see Grzankowski 2018, 146–9).

According to (Forbes 2000) the need for such an explanation already threatens the univocality of a verb such as ‘look for’ as it occurs in ‘look for that woollen sweater’ and ‘look for some woollen sweater’. Observing that search verbs are action verbs, Forbes applies Davidson’s event semantics to them (Davidson 1967). In this semantics, as revised and extended in Parsons 1990, search verbs become predicates of events, and in relational (specific) readings, the object searched for is said to be in a thematic relation to the event, one denoted by ‘for’; thus if I am looking for a specific woollen sweater, that one you see in the top drawer, this means ‘some search e such that I am the agent of e is for that woollen sweater’. By contrast, in unspecific readings no thematic relation to sweaters is invoked; rather, the quantified NP is used to characterize the search, or to assign it a kind. So we would have ‘some search e is characterized by ^(a(woollen(sweater)))’, i.e., e is a search of the a-woollen-sweater kind (Forbes 2000, 174–6; 2006, 77–84). The predicate ‘search’ is univocal across specific and unspecific readings, and what it is for a search to be characterized by a quantifier, say ^(a(woollen(sweater))), is explained in terms of ‘outcome postulates’. For the current example, as a first approximation, a search is characterized by ^(a(woollen(sweater))) iff any course of events in which that search culminates successfully includes an event of finding a woollen sweater, and the agent of the finding is the agent of the search. Similar postulates can be given for, e.g., the meeting of expectations and the satisfaction of desires: thus, a state of desire is characterized by ^(a(woollen(sweater))) iff any course of events in which that desire is satisfied includes an event of getting a woollen sweater whose recipient is the agent of the search (Forbes 2006, 94–129). So this part of the theory is similar to those of Moltmann and Richard, but is an analysis of an event being characterized by a quantifier, as opposed to being for that quantifier. Zalta’s requirement that looking for a woollen sweater, but no particular one, entail looking for something, can be met in various ways, of which the simplest is to treat it as a conjunction-elimination: “I’m looking for something” means that I am the agent of some event of looking. Alternatively, since the ‘something’ here is what Moltmann calls a ‘special’ quantifier (see, e.g., Moltmann 2013, 169–175) a semantics keyed to such quantifiers could be employed.

There is therefore a range of different non-propositionalist approaches to intensional transitives. As we already remarked, one possibility is that propositionalism is correct for some verbs and non-propositionalism correct for others. However, there is also the option that non-propositionalism is correct for all. A non-propositionalist who makes this claim will have to explain the phenomena illustrated in (7)–(10), without introducing degrees of freedom that make it unintelligible that these phenomena do not arise for all intensional transitives.

6. Prior’s Puzzle

Intensional transitive verbs are also involved in another substitution puzzle besides the ones already discussed. In the literature on propositional attitude reports, it’s the received view that the complement clauses in such reports refer to propositions. So, for example, in ‘Holmes believes that Moriarty has returned’, the clause ‘that Moriarty has returned’ is taken to stand for the proposition that Moriarty has returned. The whole ascription is then understood to have the form Rab, which in terms of the example means that Holmes (a) stands in the relation of belief (R) to the proposition that Moriarty has returned (b). However, as well as being denoted by that-clauses, propositions are the likely candidate for the things denoted by proposition-descriptions, noun phrases that explicitly use ‘the proposition’, such as, in the previous sentence, ‘the proposition that Moriarty has returned’. So, if the clause and the description co-denote, we have the following truth:

(20)
that Moriarty has returned is the proposition that Moriarty has returned.

But then we should be able to substitute proposition-description for that-clause, which, indeed, works well enough for ‘believes’: believing that Moriarty has returned does not seem much different from believing the proposition that Moriarty has returned, even though a side-effect of replacing the clause by the description is to convert a clausal use of ‘believes’ into a transitive one. However, ‘believes’ is rather special in this respect. Despite (20), examples (21a) and (21b) below appear to have very different meanings:

(21a)
Holmes {fears/suspects} that Moriarty has returned.
(21b)
Holmes {fears/suspects} the proposition that Moriarty has returned.

(21a) may well be true, but it is unlikely that Holmes fears a proposition, or that some proposition is a thing of which he is suspicious (though a mathematician might be suspicious of a proposition he has used, without rigorous proof, as a lemma in obtaining an unexpected result). So replacing either clausal VP in (21a) with the corresponding intensional transitive VP in (21b) opens the door to change in truth-value. This phenomenon seems first to have been noted in print in Prior 1963.

‘Believe’ is hardly the only intensional verb which allows clause/proposition-description interchange. There are also inference verbs such as ‘assume’, ‘conclude’, ‘deduce’, ‘entail’ and ‘establish’, along with some others such as ‘accept’, ‘assert’, ‘convey’, ‘doubt’, ‘proclaim’, ‘state’ and ‘verify’, perhaps ‘insinuate’, and arguably ‘show’ and ‘signal’ (for more on ‘believe’, see King 2002, 359–60, Forbes 2018, 118, and Nebel 2019, 97–9). For example, if an accomplice signals to a thief that someone is coming, to my ear it doesn’t sound out of the question to say that the accomplice thereby signals the proposition to the thief, especially if we are happy to say that conveying that p and conveying the proposition that p are the same thing, since signalling is a way of conveying. There are also speech-act verbs we could include here, perhaps somewhat stipulatively: ‘mention’, ‘vow’, maybe ‘volunteer’. For example, if Holmes vows that he will apprehend Moriarty, some speakers will be willing to say that he thereby vowed the proposition.

But clear failures in the style of (21b) are also common, despite the fuzziness of the boundary between verbs which do and verbs which don’t generate instances of Prior’s Puzzle. The following verbs appear to be similar to ‘fears’ and ‘suspects’: ‘acknowledge’, ‘announce’, ‘anticipate’, ‘ask’, ‘boast’, ‘calculate’, ‘caution’, ‘decide’, ‘detect’, ‘discover’, ‘dream’, ‘estimate’, ‘find’, ‘forget’, ‘guess’, ‘judge’, ‘know’, ‘love’, ‘notice’, ‘observe’, ‘perceive’, ‘prefer’, ‘question’, ‘realize’, ‘require’, ‘see’, ‘suggest’, ‘surmise’, ‘suspect’, ‘trust’, ‘understand’, ‘vote’, and ‘wish’. With some of these verbs, substitution produces something with a reasonably clear meaning, just not the same meaning as the sentence the substitution was made in (as in 21a,b). With others, intelligibility is strained. The case of ‘estimate’ illustrates violation of a selection constraint. An early astronomer may estimate that the Sun is 90 million miles away, but he cannot be said to have estimated the proposition that the Sun is 90 million miles away. In transitive uses, the direct object of ‘estimate’ must be for something at least roughly measurable in some dimension. Thus you can estimate the acceptability, plausibility, or probability of a proposition, but you cannot estimate (as opposed to assess) a proposition for plausibility; this is at best an inept way of saying that you estimate the proposition’s plausibility. ‘Boast’ and ‘plan’ are similar to ‘estimate’ in this respect. For example, you may plan that the money you’ve borrowed will last to the end of the month, but you don’t plan the proposition; and while Lestrade may boast that he has found Moriarty, ‘boast’ in its transitive use will take on the sense it has in ‘At dinner Elizabeth boasted the necklace Richard had just bought her’.

In another group of intensional verbs are ones which don’t seem to have transitive uses in English, other than, in some cases, with anaphoric pronouns anchored by clauses (if this is a transitive use at all). These include ‘agree’, ‘complain’, ‘crow’, ‘hope’, ‘insist’, ‘object’, ‘pretend’, ‘rejoice’, ‘wish’, and perhaps ‘insinuate’ (if you balked at counting it an ITV that doesn’t give rise to Prior’s Puzzle). These verbs will give rise to instances of the Puzzle in which the conclusion isn’t even grammatical (see Nebel 2019, 72–5, for discussion; ungrammatical conclusions are also obtained from verbs like ‘warn’, where grammatical ‘x warned y that p’ would become ‘x warned y the proposition that p’).

The puzzle doesn’t depend on the credentials of (20) as an identity sentence. Even if, for whatever reason, it isn’t, it is still hard to see how truth-value can change going from (21a) to (21b), granted that the proposition that Moriarty has returned and that Moriarty has returned are co-denoting. There also doesn’t seem to be a useful application of a traditional account of referential opacity, such as Frege’s (discussed in connection with (2c) above). Substitution-failure is explained in Fregean terms by a switch in denotation of normally co-denoting expressions, when those expressions are put into an intensional context. But if we accept that (20) states a true identity between intensional entities, and that the denotations of the expressions flanking the ‘is’ are grasped in the same way, by compositional construction, then these expressions for propositions will express the same sense in (20). Therefore, rotating the expressions in the context ‘Holmes fears…’ cannot produce a change in truth-value, even if the reference of each switches to the sense it expresses in (20). For the new reference of ‘that Moriarty has returned’ in (21a) will still be the same as that of ‘the proposition that Moriarty has returned’ in (21b). There is even less of a solution to the Puzzle if these examples are a special case in which the embedding does not produce a switch.

We also expect that examples of substitution-failure are made weaker if the subject is attributed explicit belief in the identity premise. However, adding that Holmes is absolutely clear about the truth of (20), and has it at the forefront of his consciousness, doesn’t make it any more likely that (21b) is true when (21a) is. Consequently, there is some appeal to solutions of Prior’s Puzzle that discern an equivocation in the inference, or propose that the crucial terms, the proposition that Moriarty has returned and that Moriarty has returned, aren’t really coreferential as they occur in the inference. An approach of the first kind, in King 2002, argues that the transitive and clausal forms of the intensional verb are polysemous, that is, weakly ambiguous (the two senses are related, as, plausibly, with ‘boast’ or ‘understand’). The polysemy thesis has been criticized on the basis of ellipsis examples, such as ‘Bob didn’t even mention the proposition that first-order logic is undecidable, let alone that it is provable’ (Boer 2009, 552), and ‘the Soviet authorities genuinely fear a religious revival, and that the contagion of religion will spread’ (after Nebel 2019, 77). Since these examples don’t strike one as amusingly incongruous, in the way that typical examples of zeugma do (‘All over Ireland the farmers grew potatoes, barley, and bored’), they are in tension with a postulation of polysemy. Consequently, Boer (2009) and Nebel (2019) propose that the problem lies in non-synonymy in Prior’s Puzzle of the terms the proposition that Moriarty has returned and that Moriarty has returned. On both their accounts, it is the propositional description ‘the proposition that p’ which fails to denote the proposition that p. On the other hand, as evidence in favor of polysemy, there is the fact that some cases of ellipsis seem in some way anomalous, such as ‘John heard thunder and that a storm was rolling in’. Here the anomaly can be explained in terms of how different the two senses of ‘heard’ are.

Event semantics (see section 5 above, ad fin) provides an alternative which may avoid the need for any kind of equivocation. An initial proposal is made in Pietroski 2000 for ‘explain’, which behaves like ‘fear’ and ‘suspect’, as in

(22a)
Martin explained that the nothing nothings itself.
(22b)
Martin explained the proposition that the nothing nothings itself.

A student raises his hand in Martin’s class and asks why, if the nothing is a something, he has never encountered it. Then (22a) may well be true, but (22b) need not be. The proposal is that the clausal and transitive forms of ‘explain’ take different thematic complements, content versus theme: with the clausal verb of (22a), a ‘that’-clause provides the content of the explanation, while with the transitive verb of (22b), a proposition-description provides a theme, the thing that gets explained. Since, as already noted, a side-effect of the substitution is to change the verb from its clausal to its transitive form, a consequent side-effect is to change the role ascribed to the proposition from content to theme, a change which is truth-condition-altering. This account is developed in Pietroski 2005 and also, as an extension of the event semantics of Forbes 2006, in Forbes 2018.

In addition to its intrinsic interest, Prior’s Puzzle has wider significance. For there are many approaches to the semantics of intensional clausal verbs which employ the corresponding transitive form in the semantics in place of the clausal one, and Prior’s Puzzle shows that in general this switch is dangerous. A paradigm case of the clausal to transitive shift is in the ‘paratactic’ theory developed by Davidson (1969). According to the paratactic theory, an attitude or speech-act ascription made in a single sentence is in fact the product of a two-sentence discourse, where the order of the two sentences is immaterial. So, according to Davidson (1969, 169–70), ‘Galileo said that the Earth moves’ is more perspicuously rendered as [The Earth moves. Galileo said that.] (I use brackets to mark a paratactic discourse). Here the italicized ‘that’ is a demonstrative, one whose reference is much debated in the literature on Davidson’s theory (see Frankish 1996). But regardless of what position we take on this question, there is a problematic change in going from ‘Galileo said that the Earth moves’ to [The Earth moves. Galileo said that.], since clausal ‘said’ in the former has become transitive ‘said’ in the latter. This may not matter much to this example, if we are happy with talk of saying a proposition, or whatever else we think the ‘that’ refers to. But when we replace ‘say’ with an intensional clausal verb that clearly does generate instances of Prior’s Puzzle, for example, ‘discover’, then the second sentence of the analysis will mean that, whatever entity the ‘that’ refers to, Galileo discovered it. This entity might be a sentence (token or type), or a more elaborate abstract object of some sort, but in no case was it discovered by Galileo (though he did discover the fact that the Earth moves – see also Moffett (2003, 82ff.) on ‘the fact that’ and ‘the possibility that’). So the example is just like (21b). And there is, obviously, the problem of verbs with no corresponding transitive form (see Forbes 2025, §3, for discussion of this difficulty). Thus the paratactic analysis and others like it in the crucial respect are of limited scope, applying at best to verbs like those listed two paragraphs below (21b) as allowing (clause)/(proposition-description) interchange.

7. The logic of intensional transitives

There may be no such topic as the logic of propositional attitudes: it may be doubted whether ‘Mary wants to meet a man who has read Proust and a man who has read Gide’ logically entails ‘Mary wants to meet a man who has read Proust’, if we understand the infinitival clause as specifying a conjunctive desire with no ellipsis. For even if standing in the wanting-to-be-true attitude to the proposition I meet a man who has read Proust and a man who has read Gide somehow necessitates standing in the wanting-to-be-true attitude to I meet a man who has read Proust, the necessitation appears to be more psychological than logical. On the other hand, what we might call ‘objectual attitudes’, the non-propositional attitudes ascribed by intensional transitives, seem to have a logic (for a compendium of examples, see Richard 2000, 105–7): ‘Mary seeks a man who has read Proust and a man who has read Gide’ does seem to entail ‘Mary seeks a man who has read Proust’, even if there is no second ‘seeks’ elided following ‘and’.

Yet, as Richard notes (Richard 2001, 107–8), the inferential behavior of quantified complements of intensional transitives is still very different from the extensional case. For example (his ‘Literary Example’), even if it is true that Mary seeks a man who has read Proust and a man who has read Gide, it may be false both that she seeks at most one man and that she seeks at least two men; for she may be indifferent between finding a man who has read both, versus finding two men, one a reader of Proust but not Gide, the other of Gide but not Proust. Contrast ‘saw’, ‘photographed’, or ‘met’: if she met a man who has read Proust and a man who has read Gide, it cannot be false both that she met at most at one man and that she met at least two men. As Richard insists, it is a constraint on any semantics of intensional transitives that they get this type of case right.

By contrast, in other cases, even very simple ones, it is controversial exactly what inferences intensional transitives in unspecific readings support. If Mary seeks a man who has read Proust, does it follow that she seeks a man who can read? After all, it is unlikely that a comic-book reader will satisfy her tastes in men.[10] If Perseus seeks a mortal gorgon, does it follow that he seeks a gorgon?[11] After all, if he finds an immortal gorgon, he is in trouble. Zimmerman (1993, 173) takes it to be a requirement on accounts of notional readings that they validate these detachment or “weakening” inferences, in which, typically, a restrictive relative clause is detached, or a subsective or intersective adjective (so looking for a lost Picasso entails looking for a Picasso, but looking for an alleged Picasso does not, nor does looking for a forged Picasso). But some accounts of unspecificity certainly invalidate these inferences, even if the inferences are restricted as just indicated, for instance, an account in terms of indifference towards which object of the relevant kind is found (Lewis uses such an ‘any one would do’ characterization in Lewis 1972, p. 199). For even if it is true that Mary seeks a man who has read Proust, and any male Proust-reader would do, it does not follow that Mary seeks a man who can read, and any man who can read would do. However surprising, not every man who can read has read Proust. So by the lights of the indifference account, the premise that Mary seeks a man who has read Proust doesn’t entail that she seeks a man who can read; thus weakening is fallacious.

But the indifference characterization of unspecificity (‘any one would do’) is itself dubious. One objection is that the characterization does not work for every verb or quantifier: ‘Guercino painted a dog, any dog would do’ makes little sense, and ‘the police are looking for everyone who was in the room, any people who were in the room would do’ is not much better. Worse, the characterization puts warranted assertibility out of reach, since the grounds which we normally take to justify ascribing an existentially quantified search-goal will rarely give reason to think that the agent has absolutely no further preferences going beyond the characterization of the object-kind given in the ascription (Mary would surely pass on finding a Proust-reading but murderous misogynist); see further (Graff Fara 2013) for analogous discussion of desire.

Still, this is not to validate weakening inferences; for that we would probably want to show that the more usual gloss of the unspecific reading, using a ‘but no particular one’ rider, supports the inferences as strongly as the indifference characterization refutes them. And it is unclear how such an argument would proceed (Forbes 2006, 94–6). In addition, making a good case that the inferences are intuitively valid is one thing, getting the semantics to validate them is another (though things are simpler in a non-model-theoretic approach to the question – see Francez 2016, 811–814). Both the propositionalist and the Montagovian need to add extra principles, since there is nothing in their bare semantics to compel these inferences. For even if Jack stands in the wanting relation to ^(a(woollen(sweater))), that by itself is silent on whether he also stands in the wanting relation to ^(a(sweater)). Zalta’s semantics decides the matter positively, however. For example, if there is an intentional object encoding being a woollen sweater, it encodes being a sweater, so if ‘wants a woollen sweater’ is true of Jack, ‘wants a sweater’ will also be true of him. The analyses Moltmann and Richard give of intensional transitive relations such as wanting also support weakening. For example, if in every minimal situation in which Jack’s desire is satisfied, he gets a woollen sweater, then in every such situation, he gets a sweater; so he wants a sweater.

But the intuitive validity of weakening can also be directly challenged. For example, via weakening we can infer that if A is looking for a cat and B is looking for a dog, then A and B are looking for the same thing (an animal). For discussion of this kind of example, see (Zimmerman 2006), and for the special use of ‘the same thing’, (Moltmann 2013, 95–120). Asher (1987, 171) proposes an even more direct counterexample. Suppose you enter a competition whose prize is a free ticket on the Concorde to New York. So presumably you want a free ticket on the Concorde. But you don’t want a ticket on the Concorde, since you know that normally these are very expensive, you are poor, and you strictly resist desiring the unattainable. Asher is here assimilating notional uses of indefinites to generics, which on his account involve quantification over normal worlds. So if for some bizarre reason you want a sloop, but one whose hull is riddled with holes, it will not be literally true to say you want a sloop.

Undeniably there is a real phenomenon here, but perhaps it belongs to pragmatics rather than semantics. If I say ‘I want a sloop’, someone who offers to buy me any sloop floating in the harbor could reasonably complain ‘You should have said that’ if I decline the offer on the grounds that none of those sloops meets my unstated requirement of having a hull riddled with holes. And my aspirational benefactor’s complaint would be justified if normality is a default implicature or presupposition that a co-operative speaker is under some obligation to let her audience know isn’t in force, when it isn’t. It is still literally true, on this view, that you want a sloop, despite the idiosyncrasy of the details of your desire. However, this is far from the end of the story. Those with doubts about weakening will find the discussion in Sainsbury 2018(129–133) congenial.

Another interesting logical problem concerns the “conjunctive force” of disjoined quantified NPs in objectual ascriptions. There is a large literature on the conjunctive force of disjunction in many other contexts (e.g., Kamp 1973, Loewer 1976, Makinson 1984, Jennings 1994, Zimmerman 2000, Simons 2005, Fox 2007, Forbes 2014), for instance as exhibited in ‘x is larger than y or z’ and ‘John can speak to you in French or in Italian’. In these cases the conjunctive force is easily captured by simple distribution: ‘x is larger than y and larger than z’, ‘John can speak to you in French and can speak to you in Italian’.[12] However, with intensional transitives we find the same conjunctive force, but no distributive articulation. If we say that Jack needs a woollen sweater or a fleece jacket, we say something to the effect that (i) his getting a woollen sweater is a way his need could be met, and (ii) his getting a fleece jacket is a way his need could be met. But ‘Jack needs a woollen sweater or a fleece jacket’ does not mean that Jack needs a woollen sweater and needs a fleece jacket. This last conjunction ascribes two needs, only one of which can be met by getting a woollen sweater. But the latter acquisition by itself can meet a disjunctive need for a woollen sweater or a fleece jacket. So there is a challenge to explain the semantics of the disjunctive ascription, while at the same time remaining within a framework that can accommodate all cases of conjunctive force — comparatives, various senses of ‘can’, counterfactuals with disjunctive antecedents (“if Jack were to put on a woollen sweater or a fleece jacket he’d be warmer”) and so on; see further (Forbes 2006, 97–111).

A penultimate type of inference we will mention is one in which intensional and extensional verbs both occur, and the inference seems valid even when the intensional VPs are construed unspecifically. An example:

(23a)
Jack wants a woollen sweater
(23b)
Whatever Jack wants, he gets
(23c)
Therefore, Jack will get a woollen sweater

Obviously, (23a,b) entail (23c) when (23a) is understood specifically. But informants judge that the inference is also valid when (23a) is understood unspecifically, with ‘but no particular one’ explicitly appended. If we seek a validation of the inference that hews to surface form, Montague’s uniform treatment of intensional and extensional verbs has its appeal: (23b) will say that for whatever property of properties P Jack stands in the wanting relation to, he stands in the getting relation to. So the inference is portrayed as the simple modus ponens it seems to be. It would then be the task of other meaning-postulates to carry us from his standing in the getting relation to ^(a(woollen(sweater))) to there being a woollen sweater such that he gets it.

The final example to be considered here involves fictional or mythical names in the scope of intensional transitives. An example (Zalta 1988, 128) of the puzzles these can lead to is:
(24a)
The ancient Greeks worshipped Zeus.
(24b)
Zeus is a mythical character.
(24c)
Mythical characters do not exist.
(24d)
Therefore, the ancient Greeks worshipped something that does (did) not exist.

Or even:

(24e)
Therefore, there is something that doesn’t exist such that the ancient Greeks worshipped it.

One thing the example shows is that specific/unspecific is not to be confused with real/fictional. (24a) is a true specific ascription, just as ‘the ancient Greeks worshipped Ahura Mazda’ is a false one. (24b) is also true. So the ancient Greeks, who would not have knowingly worshipped a mythical character, were making a large, if common, mistake.

(24c) is also true, if we are careful about what ‘do not exist’ means in this context. It is contingent that Zeus-myths were ever formulated, and one sense in which we might mean (24c) turns on the assumption that fictional and mythical characters exist iff fictions and myths about them do. In this sense, (24c) is false, though an actual fictional character such as Zeus would not have existed if there had been no Zeus-myths. This also explains why (24a) and (24b) can both be true: ‘Zeus’ refers to the mythical character, a contingently existing abstract object.

However, by far the more likely reading of (24c) is one on which it means that mythical characters are not real. Zeus is not flesh and blood, not even godlike flesh and blood. With this in mind, (24d) and (24e) are both true. The quantifier ‘something’ ranges over a domain that includes both real and fictional or mythical entities, and there is something in that domain, the mythical character, which was worshipped by the ancient Greeks and which is not in the subdomain of real items.

This gets the right truth-values for the statements in (24), but might be thought to run into trouble with the likes of ‘Zeus lives on Mt. Olympus’: if ‘Zeus’ refers to an abstract object, how can Zeus live anywhere? One way of dealing with this kind of case is to suppose, evidently plausibly, that someone who says ‘Zeus lives on Mt. Olympus’ and knows the facts means

(25)
According to the myth, Zeus lives on Mt. Olympus.

On the other hand, if an ancient Greek believer says ‘Zeus lives on Mt. Olympus’, he or she says something that isn’t true, there being no reason to posit a covert ‘according to the myth’ in this case.

However, even the covert operator theory might be contested, on the grounds that within its scope we are still unintelligibly predicating ‘lived on Mt. Olympus’ of an abstract object. Simply prefixing ‘according to the myth’ to the unintelligible cannot render it intelligible. But there is the evident fact that (25) is both intelligible and true. So either prefixing ‘according to the myth’ can render the unintelligible intelligible, perhaps by being metalinguistic, or what is going on in the embedded sentence is not to be construed as standard predication. Further discussion of these matters may be found in, for example, van Inwagen 1977, Parsons 1980, Zalta 1988, Thomasson 1998, and Salmon 2002.

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