Notes to The Analysis of Knowledge

1. For more detail about the distinctions, see Ichikawa and Jenkins 2017: 116.

2. Hazlett takes this to motivate divorcing semantic considerations about the verb “to know” from knowledge, the state of traditional epistemic interest. Though he thinks “to know” is not a factive verb, even Hazlett accepts that knowledge itself is a state that can only obtain if its content is true (Hazlett 2010).

3. On the distinction between outright belief and less committal notions, see e.g. Fantl & McGrath 2009: 141, Nagel 2010: 413–4, Williamson 2005: 108, Clarke 2013, Gibbons 2013: 201, Jackson 2020, and Schulz 2021.

4. On the distinction between justified beliefs and justifying beliefs, see Alston 1991: 71. For an opposing view, see Almeder 1999: 90 and 123.

5. On “warranted”, see especially Plantinga 1993 and Wright 2004. On the relationship between “rational” and “justified”, see Siscoe 2021 and the citations therein.

6. See Feldman & Conee 1985 and Conee & Feldman 2004 for a general presentation of their “evidentialist” view; see Feldman & Conee 2001 for a distinctive focus on their internalism. For criticisms of evidentialism, see DeRose 2000, Plantinga 1996: 358–361, and the essays of Dougherty 2011; for criticisms of internalism more generally, see Goldman 1999 & 2009.

7. This is a simplified statement of reliabilism; a more precise one distinguishes conditionally reliable mechanisms (like inference) from unconditionally reliable ones (like perception). See Goldman 1979.

8. Finer distinctions are sometimes drawn; for example, one might consider ex ante justification (in a position to have a justified belief) as distinct from both doxastic (having a justified belief) and propositional (having sufficient reason to believe) justification. For one such motivation, see Ichikawa & Jarvis 2013: 162–4. For another example, Lowy 1978 articulates a notion of personal justification that is importantly distinct from doxastic justification.

9. This talk of “sufficient reason” is intended to be consistent with the idea that in some cases, no reasons are needed to suffice for propositional justification—that some justification comes “for free”, not dependent on the possession of any reasons at all. See e.g., Lyons 2009, Wright 2004. In such cases, the null set of reasons constitutes “sufficient” reason.

10. Russell’s focus in this discussion is on the nature of belief, not the analysis of knowledge. He also does not highlight the role of the justification condition in his case.

11. See, e.g., Armstrong 1973: 152 and Clark 1963. For further references, see Shope 1983: 24. This monograph provides a comprehensive discussion of the Gettier literature up to 1980. For a shorter helpful discussion of the Gettier problem, see the Appendix in Pollock 1986.

12. This case is similar to Chisholm’s (1989) “sheep on a hill” case.

13. More sophisticated articulations of a sensitivity condition will relativize it to bases or methods. See Nozick 1981: 179, Williamson 2000: 152, Ichikawa 2011: 302. The argument against sensitivity given in the main text should apply equally well to these subtler formulations.

14. Note that a sensitivity condition, being only a necessary condition on knowledge, does not itself imply the nonskeptical claim. A skeptic could commit to a sensitivity condition without admitting abominable conjunctions.

15. See Williamson 2000: ch. 7 for a more detailed discussion.

16. See especially Roush 2005, 2012 for a defense of a subtle sensitivity condition. Ichikawa 2011 gives a version of a sensitivity condition designed to avoid the commitment to abominable conjunctions.

17. This is one of several formulations of safety Sosa offers.

18. Ichikawa (2011) offers a semantics for counterfactuals in which, pace Sosa, sensitivity and safety are equivalent.

19. Suppose S truly believes that P. On Lewis’s view, to evaluate the subjunctive conditional, “if S were to believe that P, it would not be false that P,” we examine all the nearest worlds in which S believes P. The actual world is the unique nearest such world, and P is (by stipulation) not false in that world, so the conditional is true.

20. See e.g., Goldman 1967, 1976; Armstrong 1973; Dretske 1981. See also Sturgeon 1993. Kornblith (2008, 7) suggests that the decline in attention for such views is attributable to Goldman’s (1979) shift from his previous position to one in which knowledge requires justification, where the latter is understood as reliability, but questions the motivation for Goldman’s move.

21. For examples of reliabilist approaches to knowledge, see: Armstrong 1973, Dretske 1981, and Nozick 1981.

22. Note that process reliabilism is an example of a view that requires a “causal condition” in a weaker sense: features of the process that caused the belief are important for justification. As the term is used here, “causal theories” require a causal connection between the belief and the truth of the proposition believed.

23. Gaṅgeśa Upādhyāya articulated an early version of the causal theory in the 14th century CE (Phillips & Ramanuja Tatacharya 2004).

24. Dretske’s own information-theoretic account of knowledge, given in ch. 4 of his 1981 book, is more complicated than Simple K-Reliabilism. Dretske claims (1981: 97) that his view avoids Gettier problems, but this is controversial. For some discussion of what Dretske would say about the barn facades case, see Dretske 2005: 24, note 4.

25. For an example of a reliability condition amended with an eye toward the Gettier problem, see Goldman 1976 and Goldman 1986: 46–7.

26. Sturgeon (1993) made a similar observation, pointing out that any non-conclusive justification will permit Gettier cases. He endorsed an externalist conception of justification that entailed truth, defending a simpler “JB” theory of knowledge.

27. Whether it also entails the third will depend on one’s particular theory of justification. Alternatively, another analysis in this spirit, following the lead of the views discussed in §6, could simply omit the justification condition.

28. On such “evidential luck,” see Unger 1968:159 or Pritchard 2005: 136–7.

29. For more on distinct notions of epistemic luck, see Pritchard 2005, Steglich-Petersen 2010, and McKinnon 2013.

30. Sosa (2007) characterized the relevant skill in reliabilistic terms; a belief is adroit if and only if it is produced by a mechanism that tends to produce true, rather than false, beliefs. But the AAA model, and the corresponding account of knowledge, does not obviously depend on this reliabilism. One could characterize skill differently and still define knowledge in terms of skill as Sosa does.

31. This is how Sosa characterizes a particular kind of knowledge, which he calls “animal knowledge”, distinguishing another, more ambitious state of “reflective knowledge”. See Sosa 2007: 24.

32. Millar seems to be defending one or both of these strategies in Pritchard, Millar, & Haddock 2010: 129–30. Greco (2009) seems to be defending the first.

33. Sutton (2007) and Bird (2007) each offer an approach to justification given in terms of knowledge.

34. In favor of something like the knowledge-first stance, see Williamson 2000, Nagel 2013, Miracchi 2015, and Ichikawa 2017-a; against, see McGlynn 2014 and many of the essays in Greenough & Pritchard 2009.

35. The term “pragmatic encroachment” was first used by Jon Kvanvig on the Certain Doubts weblog on June 12, 2004.

36. Owens (2000) gives an early defense of pragmatic encroachment; see his 2000: 29 et seq. Note that talk of “sameness of epistemic position” must be understood carefully. There is a sense in which knowing that P is part of one’s epistemic position; when we say that Sandra and Daniel are in the same epistemic position, this cannot be the sense that we intend. One might—and some epistemologists do—say that Sandra and Daniel have the same (or equivalent) evidence. This will suffice only if pragmatic encroachment does not extend to evidence as well; it will not if, for example, Williamson (2000) is right that a subject’s evidence consists in one’s knowledge, or if Stanley (2005: 124) is right that encroachment extends to all interesting epistemic notions.

Copyright © 2026 by
Jonathan Ichikawa <ichikawa@gmail.com>
Matthias Steup

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