Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Derivation of Sum Rule and Product Rule from FUNC

The three principles, in full detail, are:

FUNC: Let A be a self-adjoint operator associated with observable A, let f: RR be an arbitrary function, such that f(A) is a self-adjoint operator, and let | φ> be an arbitrary state; then f(A) is associated uniquely with an observable f(A) such that:
v(f(A))|φ> = f(v(A))|φ>

Sum Rule: If A and B are commuting self-adjoint operators corresponding to observables A and B, respectively, then A + B is the unique observable corresponding to the self-adjoint operator A + B and

v(A + B)|φ> = v(A)|φ> + v(B)|φ>

Product Rule: If A and B are commuting self-adjoint operators corresponding to observables A and B, respectively, then if A · B is the unique observable corresponding to the self-adjoint operator A · B and

v(AB)|φ> = v(A)|φ> · v(B)|φ>

In order to derive Sum Rule and Product Rule from FUNC, we use the following mathematical fact: Let A and B be commuting operators, then there is a maximal operator C and there are functions f, g such that A = f(C) and B = g(C).

So, for two commuting operators A, B:

Since A = f(C) and B = g(C), there is a function h = f+g, such that A + B = h(C).

Therefore:

v(A + B)|φ>   =   h(v(C)|φ>)           (by FUNC)
    =   f(v(C)|φ>) + g(v(C)|φ>)            
    =   v(f(C))|φ> + v(g(C))|φ>           (by FUNC)
    =   v(A)|φ> + v(B)|φ>           (Sum Rule)

Similarly:

Since A = f(C) and B = g(C), there is a function k = f·g, such that A·B = k(C).

Therefore:

v(A · B)|φ>   =   k(v(C)|φ>)           (by FUNC)
    =   f(v(C)|φ>) · g(v(C)|φ>)            
    =   v(f(C))|φ> · v(g(C))|φ>           (by FUNC)
    =   v(A)|φ> · v(B)|φ>           (Product Rule)

Return to The Kochen-Specker Theorem

Copyright © 2022 by
Carsten Held <carsten.held@mailbox.org>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free