Clarence Irving Lewis

First published Tue Sep 25, 2007; substantive revision Mon May 19, 2025

Clarence Irving (C.I.) Lewis was perhaps the most important American academic philosopher active in the 1930s and 1940s. He made major contributions in epistemology and logic, and, to a lesser degree, ethics. Lewis was also a key figure in the rise of analytic philosophy in the United States, both through the development and influence of his own writings and through his influence, direct and indirect, on graduate students at Harvard, including some of the leading analytic philosophers of the last half of the 20th century.

1. Brief Biography

C.I. Lewis was born on April 12, 1883 in Stoneham, Massachusetts and died on February 2, 1964 in Menlo Park, California. He was an undergraduate at Harvard from 1902–1906, where he was influenced principally by the pragmatist, William James, and the idealist, Josiah Royce. Royce also supervised Lewis’s 1910 Harvard Ph.D. dissertation “ The Place of Intuition in Knowledge”. While serving as Royce’s teaching assistant in logic, Lewis read Whitehead’s and Russell’s Principia Mathematica, a book he both admired and criticized. Later, while teaching at the University of California at Berkeley from 1911–1920, his principal research interests switched to logic. Lewis wrote a series of articles on symbolic logic culminating in his 1918 monograph A Survey of Symbolic Logic (SSL) (Lewis 1918) in which he both surveyed developments in symbolic logic from Leibniz up to his own day, including an extensive discussion of the work of C.S. Peirce, and presented his own modal system of strict implication. However, in response to criticism of his account of strict implication, Lewis deleted it from reprints of SSL and revised his treatment of this topic for his co-authored 1932 book Symbolic Logic (SL) (Lewis and Langford 1932) — “the first comprehensive treatment of systems of strict implication (or indeed of systems of modal logic at all)”, according to Hughes and Cresswell (1968, 216).

Lewis returned to Harvard in 1920, where he taught until his retirement in 1953, becoming Edgar Peirce Professor of Philosophy in 1948. At Harvard, Lewis’ major research interest switched to epistemology and his work was influenced by the access he had there to Peirce’s unpublished papers. Starting with his much reprinted 1923 article, “A Pragmatic Conception of the A Priori” (Lewis 1923), he developed a distinctive position of his own which he labeled “conceptual pragmatism” and which he presented in a systematic way in his 1929 book Mind and the World Order (MWO) (Lewis 1929). MWO established Lewis as a major figure on the American philosophical scene. In the 1930s and 1940s, partly in response to the challenge of positivism, the form and focus of Lewis’ views changed, and, arguably, in subtle ways, some of the substance. In his 1946 book Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation (AKV), based on his 1944 Carus lectures, Lewis (1946) provided a systematic and carefully analytic presentation of his mature philosophical views. The first two thirds of the book consist of a thorough refinement and more precise presentation of his theory of meaning and of his epistemological views, and the last third consists of a presentation of his theory of value.

After retirement from Harvard, Lewis taught and lectured at a number of universities, including Princeton, Columbia, Indiana, Michigan State, and Southern California, but principally at Stanford. His 1954 Woodbridge Lectures at Columbia and 1956 Mahlon Powell Lectures at Indiana resulted in two last short books in ethics, The Ground and the Nature of the Right (Lewis 1955) and Our Social Inheritance (Lewis 1957). Lewis was the subject of a posthumously published “Library of Living Philosophers” volume (Schilpp 1968) in which, unfortunately, his replies to critics were limited by illness, but which, nonetheless, was an honour that indicates his standing in and perceived significance for American philosophy in the 1950s.

In his over thirty years at Harvard, Lewis taught some of the most eminent American philosophers of the last half of the twentieth century as graduate students, including Brand Blanshard, W.V. Quine, Nelson Goodman, Roderick Chisholm, Roderick Firth, and Wilfrid Sellars. Although only Blanshard, Goodman, Chisholm, and Firth of these were supervised by Lewis, and Sellars left Harvard without graduating for academic employment, all refer occasionally to Lewis in their writings, usually critically, and their own views sometimes developed in reaction to his.

2. Overview of Conceptual Pragmatism

In MWO, Lewis (1929, Chp. 1) argued that the proper method of philosophy isn’t transcendental but reflective. Philosophy seeks to elicit the criteria or principles of the real, the right, the beautiful, and the logically valid that are implicit in human experience, thought, and activity.

Human beings are reflective, deliberative, self-critical and self-governing animals who don’t simply respond to current experience or emotive affect in thought and action. They act for reasons that apply to other cases as well and are formulatable as criticizable principles, directive, or imperatives in terms of which we can also criticize and correct even habitual modes of thought and action (Lewis 1955a, 86; Lewis 1953 [1969, 156]; Lewis 1959 [1969, 79]). Right doing for Lewis turns on right thinking. Objectively right action isn’t simply subjectively right action the agent thinks has overall good consequences (for the agent in the case of the prudentially right or for others as well in the case of the morally right.) Objectively right action is action that the agent is justified on all the evidence in so thinking (Lewis 1955a, 55).

Throughout his career, from MWO to OSI, Lewis thought that we were the products of evolution with similar needs and powers of discrimination, relation, and judgement, confronted by a common reality mediated through comparable sense experience (Lewis 1929, 91). However, we are also the products of socialization, benefitting from socially inherited institutions and practices, from education and learning from others, and from co-operation with others, all facilitated by communicating with others through a common language and definitions we also learn from others, all of which in turn facilitates our intellectual, moral, material, and political progress together. Verbal definitions relating symbols to symbols set up patterns and structures of orderly relation and give rise to knowledge of such, but are applicable in principle to quite diverse subject matters or characters of experience. (Lewis, 1926 [1970, 241–7]; Lewis 1946, 142). However, our concepts and meanings are revealed, “from the outside” (Lewis 1929, 102) as modes of “congruous behaviour” (Lewis 1926 [1970, 248]), drawing distinctions and making connections in language and other behaviour that are congruent with those drawn by others in our interactions with them. In MWO Lewis calls these the shared or “pure” concepts expressed in a common language, but notes that “a human being without fellows … would still frame concepts in terms of the relation between his own behaviour and his environment” (Lewis 1929, 117) . Nonetheless, what allows us to understand each other, to the extent we can, according to Lewis (1929, 110–11), is that “we are able to identify, each in his own experience, those systems of orderly relations indicated by behaviour, and particularly that part of behaviour that serves the ends of co-operation”, even were our experience qualitatively different.

On reflection on our cognitive experience and perceptual knowledge, Lewis (1929, 37–8) believed that we can abstract and distinguish three elements found together: (1) the given or immediate data of sense, (2) the act of interpreting the given as an experience of one sort of thing as opposed to another, and (3) the concept and criteria for its application by which we so interpret the given by relating it to other possibilities of experience. Our experience of the real is not given to us in experience but is constructed by us from the data of sense through acts of interpretation. When I know that I am looking at a table and reflect on my experience, I realize, on analysis, that there are certain highly specific but repeatable and recognizable sensuous qualities (sense qualia ) presented to me in experience that I am immediately aware of. Moreover, I realize that, in the light of this and other experiences I recall, I expect, with some likelihood, I would have certain other experiences, e.g. of feeling something apparently hard, were I to have the experience of performing certain acts, e.g. of reaching out with my hand. In doing so, it is the concept of seeing a table that I am applying to my experience rather than that of seeing a horse or that of hallucinating a table, either of which would have involved different expectations of experience consequent upon action (Lewis 1929, 143). Knowledge “must always concern principally the relations which obtain between one experience and another, particularly those in which the knower himself may enter as an active factor” (Lewis 1929, 117). Only an active being can therefore have knowledge, and the principal function of empirical knowledge “is that of an instrument enabling transition from the actual present to a future which is desired and which the present is believed to signalize” (Lewis 1946, 4).

The “totality of the possible experiences in which any interpretation would be verified—the completest possible empirical verification which is conceivable”, Lewis (1929, 32) says, is the “entire meaning which an interpretation has” (in some sense of “meaning”). Lewis (1946, 180, 208) later says that statements expressing our beliefs about reality are translatable into, and thus entail and are entailed by, an indefinitely large set of counterfactual statements about what experiences we would have or would be likely to have, were we to be presented with certain sensory cues and were we to carry out further tests (Lewis 1929, 130, 142–3; 1946, 180, 208). As counterfactuals, these statements can be true even if the experiences they concern never obtain and thus so can the objective beliefs that imply them. As a result, Lewis insists that the truth of our objective beliefs, as opposed to the believing or confirming them, is not “mind-dependent”. The idea of a reality neither confirmable nor disconfirmable in principle by experience was for Lewis (1954 [1970, 332–3]) without “empirical meaning”, but this did not mean that the physical table was just “the sum of its various appearances in experience” . What distinguished his verificationism, he thought, from the superficially similar verification principle of meaning of the logical positivists was his emphasis on the mediating role of agency in knowledge and verification, relating the given to the “to-be-given” or “could-be given” and correcting or confirming the resultant anticipations, rather than construing our knowledge simply as a system of logically related sentences or statements, one class of which gives meaning and confirmation to the other. (Lewis 1941a [1970, 94]).

Objectively, what we actually experience may depend on the physical circumstances of perception, e.g. lighting conditions, and the bodily actions we perform, e.g. moving our eyes, as well as the character of objects in our environment. And in much everyday practice and scientific practice, hypotheses are tested with the help of other generalizations previously accepted about the way the world works (Lewis 1936b [1970, 282]). However, what matters ultimately for the meaning and confirmation of statements about objective reality, Lewis (1946, 178–9, 245–6) makes clear are only the “felt experience” of action and the directly presentable sense experiences contained in sensory cues and forming the experiential circumstances of action ), as well as the directly presentable sense experiences they lead us to expect. An alternative was urged by Chisholm (1948) and Quine (1951) (and suggested by Lewis (1929, 286) himself in one place, albeit not by Lewis (1929, 318, 332, 336) elsewhere in MWO): “no statement of objective fact has consequences for direct experience without further premises specifying objective conditions of perception” (Lewis 1948a [1970, 318]), including we might add, objective conditions of agency. However, in response Lewis (1948a [1970, 318]) rejects the alternative, saying that if it were right, “the type of empiricism of which my account is one variant–verification-theories and confirmation-theories–will be altogether indefensible”. The result, he adds, would be a fatally flawed “coherence theory of empirical truth” that leaves us with “nothing … but skepticism”.

The direct apprehension of immediately given sense presentations and their specific but repeatable qualia makes no predictions concerning experience, is incorrigible, indubitable, not in need of verification, and not subject to error, and so, in these various (and distinct) senses, “certain”. (For a useful discussion of senses of “certainty” in Lewis, see Firth 1964, and Firth 1968 in Schilpp 1968.) However, with no possibility of error or incorrectness to contrast with the immediate awareness of the given, Lewis decides the normative label “knowledge” shouldn’t be applied to it. Objective interpretations of experience, on the other hand, are not only fallible—given and recalled experience doesn’t guarantee the satisfaction of our expectations of future experience—but are always subject to revision in the light of action and further experience. Yet, the terms we must employ to express or convey our apprehension of the given must be borrowed from objective language used to convey our objective interpretations of experience and communicate with others.

Whether our objective beliefs are true depends on their verifiable or confirmable implications for future possible experience. However, in order to guide action effectively now while saving us from the hazards of action without foresight, empirical belief and its expectations for experience must be justified (rationally credible, warranted) now, antecedent to future confirmation (Lewis 1946, 9. 254–7). Justification, as opposed to verification, is the focus of AKV much more so than MWO, and touched on in late writings discussing the ethics of belief. Nonetheless, throughout Lewis’ career from MWO to the end, there are common claims. First, empirical knowledge (rationally credible, justified, or warranted belief) is probable knowledge or belief. Second, probability is a logical or inferential relation between a conclusion and its premises or grounds. Third, the ultimate premises or grounds relative to which a conclusion or belief is probable must themselves be certain, not merely probable, and thus may be “verbally quite remote”, in contrast to more immediate or proximate ones that we might ordinarily cite to justify our beliefs (Lewis 1929, 328–9; Lewis 1952a [1970]). As a result, the probability not only of our perceptual beliefs but the expectations and predictions of future experience and its patterns they involve can’t ultimately be relative to premises or grounds consisting of beliefs about the world and the objective circumstances of perception, past or present, that are merely probable, rather than certain. Instead, fourth, the ultimate premises or grounds “must be actual given data for the individual” that are certain ((Lewis 1929, 329, 337, 340–1; Lewis 1946, 186–7).

Ordinary beliefs and interpretations, including perceptual beliefs, are, for Lewis, typically the product of habit or association in which we are guided by the elements of the given in the epistemological present but rarely if ever attend to them. Nonetheless, the justification of these beliefs as rationally credible requires that there be an inferential or logical relationship of a belief or a statement of it to grounds or reasons in experience that constitute evidence, largely inductive, for it (Lewis 1946, 315; Lewis 1952a [1970, 326]). For Lewis (1946, 329), “the critical question for the validity of empirical knowledge is not whether grounds sufficient for the justification of the belief are actually contained in the explicit psychological state of the believer, but whether the knower’s situation in empirical belief is such that sufficient grounds could be elicited upon inquiry, or whether it is such that this is even theoretically impossible”. Restricting the term “knowledge” to cases where grounds are explicit would “be so rigoristic as to exclude most, if not all, of our attempted cognitions and would obscure the important distinction of practically valuable knowledge from ‘ignorance’ and from ‘error’”, just as restricting the term to what we are certain of would. Nor does Lewis (1946, 330–2) think that the act of reflecting on and eliciting what in the epistemological present justifies our beliefs loses that justification. Knowing for Lewis occurs in a non-instantaneous, temporally extended “epistemological present” of sense presentation embedded in a mass of recollections or sense of past experience (Lewis 1946, 331–2) within which they can be reflected on and elicited. Moreover, past justifying grounds can be remembered on reflection.

The probability of our perceptual belief and expectations of experience isn’t simply a matter of the natural or objective frequency with which such beliefs are true or expectations fulfilled, or of their propensity for such, in the face of the sensory data and memories that stimulate them. Lewis rejects frequency and propensity understandings of probability (advocated by Peirce and others) for a version of the logical theory of probability. Probability is a logical relation between a conclusion and premises or grounds in the light of its various a priori governing principles, including principles of induction. So what are the “premises” elicited and made explicit on reflection? If they are beliefs, linguistically expressed or not, cued to and responsive to experience and its patterns in ways that allow us to anticipate future experience and draw distinctions that facilitate cooperation, but which themselves concern present and past experience only in so far as we objectively conceptualize that experience, e.g as tasting sugar, or in more minimal but still objective comparative terms, tasting as sugar usually tastes (Lewis 1929, 126, 290), together with various other beliefs about the world and the way it works, then we have premises relative to which other beliefs may be probable, including beliefs about future experiences. However, all these beliefs will themselves involve their own predictions and be probable only relative to yet further premises. Much of our everyday or scientific practice of justifying beliefs to ourselves and others with available “proximate” premises may take this form (Lewis 1946, 326–7) and is not out of place with much of the presentation in MWO. However, it seems to commit him to a coherence theory of empirical knowledge that Lewis (1936b [1970, 289–93]) explicitly rejects. It also contradicts his explicit account of probability and its constraints in Lewis (1929, 328–9) as well as the role of primitive “generalization from direct experience” in the probability of our interpretations of sense presentation giving us knowledge of particular objects which in turn is “the basis” of more sophisticated inductive generalizations about objective reality (Lewis 1929, 332, 336–7). On the other hand, Lewis’ account of the psychology and phenomenology of the given in MWO raises questions about how the given could be both suitably available and have the right semantic and logical character to serve as the “ultimate” grounds relative to which our beliefs are probable, as we shall discuss in Section 3.

Past experience and our recollection of it play a key role in the credibility of our interpretations. Their inductive probability and credibility rests on premises or grounds concerning past experience as well as present experience. In MWO, Lewis (1929, 337) says that memory itself is an interpretation of given present recollection, and, as such, probable knowledge with testable or verifiable implications for future experience (Lewis 1946, 337). However, this doesn’t explain what warrants the interpretation and its expectations unless it is simply other objective beliefs, including further beliefs about the past, which seems to lead again to a coherence theory of empirical justification. This is an issue and a lacuna AKV corrects. What is given and indubitably certain in this present are these sense presentations and these rememberings (Lewis 1946, 354, 362)), but what we recall of past experience is prima facie and non-inductively credible for us, just because so ostensibly remembered or recalled (Lewis 1946, 334), and thus can serve to make our expectations of future experience rationally credible as well.

Despite their lack of theoretical certainty, the beliefs we form by applying concepts to experience may count as knowledge so long as they are true and sufficiently warranted or justified. The members of a set of beliefs and expectations of experience that already have some degree of confirmation or antecedent probability in relation to present and past experience may become even more credible if the antecedent probability of any one would be increased by assuming the others as given (Lewis 1946, 187, 338, 349, 351, 352). This congruence of a mature system of beliefs which exhibits this complex interlocking pattern of “compounding” (Lewis 1929, 336–7) probability relations to each other and to experience helps to explain how these beliefs can rise to the standards for knowledge and how they (and the predictions of experience they lead us to make) can be practically certain enough to be counted on in action.

We can’t directly verify the existence of other subjects of experience or what is given to them in experience. Nonetheless, importantly for ethics, Lewis (1934 [1970, 275–6]) claimed that by empathy, in terms of our own conscious experience, we can imagine or envisage the conscious experience of others, rather than simply our own experience of others and our objectively conceptualized beliefs about their bodies and our behavioural interactions with them. Moreover, relying on a distinction between direct and indirect verification and confirmation, the supposition of another consciousness like ours, with a body like ours, and similar to us in some ways (perhaps at least identifying in terms of its experience patterns of orderly behaviour that serve the ends of cooperation) can be indirectly confirmed and supported by induction (1941b [1970, 301–2]). Our understanding of others as subjects of experience and the experiences they have is not for Lewis an understanding of those experiences simply in terms of their manifestations in our experience. What takes us beyond the epistemological present and the egocentric situation of the knower then are imagination and empathy, but also principles of probability and credibility (Lewis 1946, 357ff). Memory gives us prima facie but non-inductively credible access to past experience to supply, together with current experience, grounds for inductively cogent expectations of future (and more distantly past) experience and its patterns that we can envisage, all reinforced, amplified and made more credible by their congruence with each other and other beliefs. In all this, there is a key distinction to be emphasized, Lewis (1934 [1970, 264–8]) thinks, between what is cognized and the current cognizing of it.

In MWO Lewis argues that probable empirical knowledge requires, on pain of infinite regress, some a priori knowledge of analytic principles explicating our concepts, their logical relationships, and the criteria for applying them to experience and determining what is real and what isn’t real. Moreover, this knowledge must be “more than probable” and “certain”, which suggests that they have a degree of warrant greater than the degree of probability empirical considerations could yield (Lewis 1929, 311–12, 317, 321). In the case of abstract mathematics applicable to any possible experience and formal logic applicable to different subject matters, analytic truths or meaning relations are known through definitions and their purely logical implications. (Lewis 1946, 122–30, 145–57). Lewis (1946, 29) notes that mathematical and logical cognitions “may be certain”, at least in certain cases, but he worries how they can refer to anything beyond the cognition itself, and be classified as knowledge, if their truth is simply the unthinkability of their falsity, given our concepts or way of thinking. He answers that we can be mistaken about what is implicit in our concepts. We can fail to observe what is implicit in them and definitions and what their adoption consistently commits us to in our thinking, and that contrast with error allows him to classify such a priori apprehension as knowledge. Nonetheless, any of these mistakes is “intrinsically possible of correction merely by taking thought of the matter” (Lewis 1946, 155) without empirical investigation. The same is true of our categorical a priori knowledge of more particular principles or criteria for interpreting experience (Lewis 1929, 275). The principles governing our concepts thus can be known a priori, independently of confirmation in experience, in so far as they can be certified or assured simply by analysis of meanings or reflection on the content of our concepts, our explicative principles and classificatory intentions (Lewis 1946, 31, 151, 165), and their logical implications. So, quite apart from issues about certainty, the degree to which we are warranted in our a priori apprehensions isn’t a function of their probability on the total set of empirical considerations (cf. Lewis 1926 [1970, 224], Sellars 1953 [1963, 299–300]).

What then is tested and confirmed or disconfirmed by experience is the interpretation of experience in the light of our concepts and explicative principles. What isn’t tested by experience is the validity of the concepts themselves, or the logical relationships amongst them, or the principles for applying them. Agents bring them to experience and the only criteria they answer to are pragmatic ones like utility or convenience or simplicity of the belief system employing them. (Lewis 1929, 271–2). That implies that our decision to adopt them is also revisable on pragmatic grounds, as Lewis himself recognizes he is doing with the concept of knowledge itself (Lewis 1946, 27–29, 188). However, empirical beliefs presuppose a priori beliefs and so revising what a priori beliefs we have will also lead to changing the former, and more dramatically so in a mature, complex system of probabilistically interconnected empirical beliefs and concept. For a simple example, the empirical belief (a) that there are no unicorns presupposes the concepts of unicorn and negation and more general a priori principles governing negation and explicating the concept of a unicorn, e.g. (b) that if anything is a unicorn it is a horse-like creature with a horn in its nose. Repeatedly failing to apply the concept of unicorn to experience might make (a) practically certain and lead us to drop the concept altogether from our conceptual repertoire as useless clutter, along with beliefs (a) and (b). Experience can thus lead us to revise our a priori beliefs, though with logical principles, given their centrality to our whole system of belief, a priori and empirical, and the massive alteration that would require, we may be reluctant to do so on pragmatic grounds (Lewis 1923 [1970, 236–7]; 1929, 306). However, experience won’t have done so by disconfirming (b). “What simplicity and convenience determine is not truth or even probability but merely simplicity or convenience”, Lewis (1936b [1970, 286]) says. They may give us a reason for no longer believing (b) but not a reason for believing (b) is false or less likely to be true. They don’t determine epistemic justification concerning our “purely cognitive interest in (the) validity and truth” of what is believed rather than “ulterior” interests knowledge serves (Lewis 1946, 441; 1955a, 34). What makes the principles explicating concepts something we are warranted in believing to be true, for Lewis, are neither pragmatic considerations favouring their adoption nor their empirical probability, but our a priori reflection on our concepts and the criteria for their application.

In an extended discussion of the interplay of pragmatic considerations, coherence, and empirical evidence in empirical belief and its probable truth, Lewis (1936b [1970, 281–90]) notes that sometimes considerations of evidence and probability won’t suffice to decide choices about empirical beliefs to accept or reject, especially when faced with a complex body of interlocking beliefs. Probability on the evidence can underdetermine choice: “In the absence of any more decisive criterion”, pragmatic factors like simplicity or convenience come to the fore in the acceptance of “working hypotheses”, at least temporarily. However, Lewis (1936b [1970, 286] ) says “no hypothesis was ever a bit more probable for having been simple or otherwise convenient”. The desire to make the least disruption to our system of belief in the face of disconfirming experience (perhaps for the sake of action, not just whim) may lead us to hold onto beliefs, at least until we have further and more decisive tests, even when, in the face of recalcitrant experience, some of them are now less probable and trustworthy for action. However, that conservativism doesn’t make them more probable in relation to the evidence in a congruent system of belief than they were. In a more challenging sort of case, less crude concepts might allow us to make finer grained distinctions in experience, and, with scientific and technological developments they make possible (e.g. electron telescopes), increase the range and variety of available experience, thereby making for more and stronger probabilistic connections in a more complex but more congruent system of belief . As a result, the empirical beliefs our new concepts make possible may be more probable in relation to experience and the rest of our beliefs than our former empirical beliefs framed in our former concepts were (Bonjour, 1985, Chps 6–8). So it seems here that a criterion for the adoption of new concepts and explicative principles is the prospect for beliefs that are more probable relative to experience and a congruent system of belief than our old beliefs, and the achievement of such a congruent system and the prospect for further fruitful investigation a criterion for the retention of these concepts. In response to this sort of suggestion, citing the case of the heliocentric theory of the universe vs the geocentric and the role of the telescope, Lewis (1929, 269–71) suggests that an overall probable system of belief could in principle be achieved with either set of guiding principles and thus the criterion for choice is pragmatic. Perhaps, but this isn’t so clear, and a possible equiprobable alternative is not thereby an available one. The issues here seem more complex than Lewis’ dichotomies (pragmatic vs empirically probable) might suggest.

In a late paper on realism and phenomenalism, Lewis (1955b, [1970, 345–7]) says he prefers to think of himself as a sort of realist. What we experience depends on our own nature and on the nature of objects in themselves. There are objects “existent are they are in themselves”, i.e. distinct from us conscious beings, with “objective properties, which are potentialities resident in the nature of them as they objectively exist” to manifest themselves in experience in such a way that conditionals about experience hold, namely those which express the implicit expectations of experience we have when we objectively interpret given experience in perception, together with whatever we might validly infer probabilistically from “the observable interactions of objects with one another”. “This manner of knowing suffices for all that we conceivably might be able to accomplish in any world of things existing independently of being known by us”, Lewis (1955b [1970, 346]) adds, apart perhaps from some “curiosity”. It doesn’t preclude properties we don’t yet know about or have concepts or terms for. Nor does it preclude properties “forever beyond our finding out” or whose nature other creatures might be able to apprehend with capacities for experience and discrimination radically different from ours, but which we are not able to.

Lewis (1955b [1970]) gives no indication that he thinks his ontological position had changed significantly over the years, but it may have or at least become clearer. However, his account of meaning did. Lewis (1929, 37, 115, 121) says (A) that concepts “denote” the temporally extended complexes or patterns of actual and possible sense qualia that are criterial for their application and “the empirical object” denoted just is this pattern, suggesting perhaps an “ontological phenomenalism” (B) that empirical objects are nothing but these complexes. Lewis (1946, 137; 1954 [1970, 333]) calls (A) a “confusion” and denies that his verificationism implies (B). The denotation of a term consists of what is actual, not possible, and the sense criteria for its application constitute its sense meaning and belong to its intension or connotation, not denotation. Nor does it sit well with his views throughout his career on the communicative and cooperative purposes of language. “It is essential for the purposes of language” that “individuals should signalize the same objective realities by the same language”, but “the presence of the same objects” can be signalized to individuals without them “necessarily sharing the same sensory criteria of application”(Lewis (1946, 143). Even in MWO, Lewis (1929, 78–9) says we can “verify common meaning” through common verbal definitions, or by “exhibiting” or “exemplifying its denotation” in behaviour and “examples pointed to”, but we don’t exhibit our sense qualia to each other in our behaviour. Two people in their linguistic and other “congruous” behaviour might be systematically distinguishing the same things and their orderly relations by their use of the terms “dog” and “cat”, distinguishing the barkers from the meowers, so to speak, and so it seems referring to and thus denoting the same things, albeit by identifying those relations in their own potentially quite different sense experience. What clearly doesn’t change in his view is that objects are known empirically by us only so far as there are potentialities for experience that are criterial for the application of concepts and what we may infer from that application. The issue remains of whether these potentialities can be spelled out without assuming some conditions about the objective circumstances of perception and the way the objective world works.

Right at the heart of Lewis’ philosophical system, then, are several theses that weren’t original to Lewis, but the critical discussion (and sometimes rejection) of which, sometimes in the form Lewis gave to them, was central to much analytic philosophy in the last half of the twentieth century. Among them are: (1) an epistemic distinction between a priori and a posteriori warrant or knowledge, and a semantic distinction between analytic and synthetic truth (2) reductionism concerning the meaning, in some sense, of physical object statements to the actual and possible sense experiences that would confirm them (3) an epistemic foundation for all empirical knowledge in our direct apprehension or immediate awareness of the given character of experience and our recollections of it, and (4) the division of experience into its given content or character, on the one hand, and the form we impose on it, or the concepts in the light of which we interpret it, on the other. (Quine 1951) famously called (1) and (2) the “two dogmas of empiricism”; Sellars (1963) called (3) the “myth of the given”; and Davidson (1973–1974]) called (4) the “third dogma of empiricism”, although in Lewis’ mind (4) may owe more to Kant—on whom Lewis taught a course regularly at Harvard—than to the empiricists.) At the same time, Lewis (1946, 9–11, 254–9) also laid down a framework of assumptions, most explicitly in AKV, within which analytic epistemology flourished in the last half of the 20th century: (1) knowledge is sufficiently justified (warranted, rationally credible) true belief, (2) a belief may be justified without being true and true without being justified, and (3) epistemology seeks to elicit criteria or principles of justification or rationally credibility. Lewis’ views on some of these issues will be discussed in greater detail below.

3. The Given

Lewis’ views about the given are at once among his best known and most criticized. The pre-analytic datum for philosophical reflection is our “thick” experience and knowledge of the world around us, but reflection on this experience and knowledge reveals two elements: the given or immediate data of experience and the activity of thought whereby we conceptually interpret the given. The given in sense experience consists of specific sensuous qualities that we are immediately aware of when, for example, we take ourselves to be seeing or hearing or tasting or smelling or touching something, or even to be hallucinating or dreaming instead. These distinct qualities or qualia are the repeatable felt characters of experience, a type of “universal” (Lewis 1929, 123), and include the felt goodness or felt badness of particular experiences or stretches of experience, as well as qualities of sight, sound, taste, smell, touch, motion, and other familiar modes of sense experience. When we conceptually interpret the given, we form hypothetical expectations and make predictions, in the light of past experience, concerning experiences we would have were we to engage in specific actions, and so, in applying concepts, as Kant suggests, we relate our experiences to each other. Usually, we do so automatically and without conscious reflection, in ways that express habitual attitudes and associations rather than engaging in (explicit) inference. What we recall of past experience, even immediately, isn’t given to us or certain, but our immediate recollection or sense of past experience as having been so and so is given to us (Lewis 1946, 353), and so is our awareness of the qualitative similarity of current sense experience to experience as ostensibly remembered or mnemically presented.(Lewis 1929, 125; 1936b [1970, 289]). That is important both for Lewis’ ethics and the comparative value of experience, and, potentially, for inductive inference. The given, unlike our interpretation of it, isn’t alterable by our will (Lewis 1929, 52) and consists of what remains when we subtract from ordinary perceptual cognition all that could conceivably be mistaken (Lewis 1946, 182–3).

In MWO, Lewis (1929, 51, 402) says that the given in cognition never occurs in the absence of interpretation and characterizes the distinction as an “abstraction” of elements that are synthesized in our judgment, but which we may realize are common to quite different conceptualizations such as those of the adult and the child and perhaps can be retained in memory (Lewis 1929, 49–50. 53). Lewis (1926 [1970, 249]; 1946, 437) cites the passive absorption in the sound of symphonic music without any attempt to analyze the musical experience as an instance of pure, unabstracted awareness of the sensuous qualities in given experience. However this is a product of the “aesthetic attitude” of “distinterested interest in the presented as such” , “attentiveness to the given in its own right”, which is “not of necessity mutually exclusive” of, but is still in contrast to, the cognitive attitude’s concern with prediction and the practical or moral attitude’s concern with attaining absent goods (Lewis 1946, 437–43), Further, when we passively take in and enjoy the visual experience presented from where we are sitting, it seems clear we are presented with a vast, complex array of sense qualia, and how much awareness of sensory qualia and their similarity to past experience as mnemically presented for the purposes of prediction would require selective attention and demarcation of qualia (Lewis 1929, 58; 1946, 424), AKV is more circumspect. Although the given is what we are immediately aware of or directly apprehend as it guides and corrects our interpretations, it isn’t something we focus on or attend to or are clearly conscious of in our automatic interpretations, any more than in riding a bicycle we attend to or focus on the various sensory and motion and balance sensations that are elements in and guide our activity, though we could on reflection—perhaps not for long without falling off—and perhaps did so in learning (Lewis 1946, 10, 172–5). In perceptual cognition, what is given in sense experience serves as a natural sign of future experience contingent on action in the light of past experience, and prompts the anticipation of such experience. What is given is of no interest to active beings apart from what it signifies for future experience and anticipations it prompts for action. (Lewis 1946, 10). Is practical and cognitive need here implicitly dictating selective attention and making “premises” available (Lewis 1929, 50)?

Nonetheless, Lewis (1952a [1970, 326]) says “the validity of this interpretation is that and that only which could attach to it as an inductive inference from the given visual presentation … the incorrigible presentational element”. What matters for the credibility or warrant or validity of the belief is that there is a logical, inferential relation between the belief and grounds in experience that prompt it in the light of past experience and that can be elicited on critical reflection and its character made clear enough for our theoretical purposes. However, the credibility or validity of the belief isn’t created by the reflective attempt to elicit sufficient grounds (Lewis 1946, 186, 189, 262, 329–32). Probability, for Lewis, is a logical relation between a conclusion and premises, and a statement is categorically assertable with a degree of probability or credibility, or a belief warranted to that degree, as opposed to being merely hypothetically probable a priori to that degree on premises, only to the extent that the premises or data are sufficiently warranted or probable. (Lewis 1946, 315–27). Ultimately, the conclusion must be warranted or probable on premises or data that are certain, not just true, and that are not just warranted or credible only on other premises or data, even if we never reach these ultimate premises ordinarily in showing probability or justification. Otherwise we have “an indefinite regress of the merely probable … and the probability will fail to be genuine” (Lewis 1946, 186). Here he echoes MWO (1929, 328–9).

The given, thus, plays a causal role as the ultimate or remote ground responsible for belief, the “to-be-given” a semantic role as the content of the predictions implied by our objective belief, and the given an epistemic role as the ultimate justifying grounds of empirical belief (Lewis 1946, 262, 328–30). Lewis is defending a normative standard for empirical knowledge that he thinks is implicit in cognition and revealed on reflection but which is also psychologically and “verbally remote” from everyday cognitive practices of justifying beliefs to ourselves or others in the light of more proximate assumptions, often taken for granted in the context of inquiry or discussion. That may also make some of his presentation and discussion of examples, expressed in everyday language, misleading. In any case, many pragmatists might feel there is tension here.

In MWO, Lewis (1929, 53) says that the given is “ineffable”. So how can what is ineffable even be true, and how can what is neither true nor false (nor as a result probably true, much less certain), serve as the ultimate premises of a priori valid logical probability relations licensing belief or assertion with probability or credibility? And how can we anticipate or predict future experience that isn’t yet given, much less elicit an inductive inference concerning it on reflection, except in conceptual terms, at least comparatively, e.g. comparing future experience to the way sugar usually looks or tastes? Again, there may seem to be tension in Lewis’ views of the given and the epistemic role he assigns it. Lewis (1936a and 1936b [1970, 155–7, 292–3]; 1946, 179–83) recognizes the logical and epistemological problems, and he responds by introducing categories of expressive statements and the expressive use of language.

Expressive statements like “It seems as though I am seeing a red round thing” serve to convey or express or denote what we directly apprehend in experience without conceptualizing and interpreting it. They are true by virtue of the qualitative character of experience they express and are verified by it (or don’t need verification), and false only when we knowingly lie about our experience, and the ineffability of what they express just consists in their not implying possibilities of further experience. Moreover, their truth is something of which we are certain (Lewis 1946, 171–2, 183, 204, 327). The expressive use of language is to convey or express what is not only directly apprehended but what may be directly apprehensible in the future or, perhaps, was directly apprehensible in the past. (Lewis 1946, 179). It borrows its terms from the language used to express objectively conceptualized interpretations of experience but not its use or the epistemic status of its uses. (Firth (1964) in a commemorative symposium on Lewis discusses some of these issues in relation to Sellars (1956 [1963]), which led to continued correspondence.) Nonetheless, Lewis notes that the expressive use of language is needed only for the discussion of knowledge, not for knowledge itself (Lewis 1946, 183; 1952a [1970, 327]). So, perhaps it isn’t surprising that he also talks of “facts” as “grounds” standing “in the relation of premises to conclusion” (Lewis 1929, 326), of “immediately given facts of sense” and “facts of our seeming to remember” (Lewis 1946, 327, 353) and of “datum facts” and “logical relations of facts” (Lewis 1952a [1970, 325]), suggesting that what the expressive use of language is supposed to help convey are data facts (premises) and states of affairs (conclusions), past and future, that are probable relative to the data facts via logical relations. Yet that still seems to require that in given experience, whether present sense experience or mnemonic presentation, we are aware of such and such specific qualities, but without conceptualizing them in ways that predict other experiences and make them subject to revision.

Sellars (1956 [1963, 132]) claimed that the classical empiricist given was an inconsistent triad of three claims: (1) being appeared to as if there were something red entails non-inferentially knowing that one is appeared redly to, (2) the ability to be appeared to is unacquired, and (3) the ability to know facts of the form x is F is acquired. Lewis clearly denied (1), but he recognized this was the result of a choice about how to use “know” and that others, “without fault”, might choose to extend it to direct apprehensions of sense because they are certain for us (Lewis 1946, 29–30, 188). However, if Lewis followed suit and granted (1), it seems he would deny (3) on the grounds that the ability to be certain of the given wasn’t acquired. Sellars’ criticism of classical empiricism goes well beyond this simple triad. For Sellars (1954 [1963]; 1956 [1963, 161–70], 1953 [1963, 316–7]), the content or meaning of states capable of being true and known to be true depends on their inferential role in a normative, rule-governed, reflectively self- critical practice that makes them subject to correction. Their truth is a form of correctness in that practice (Sellars 1968, 101). Sellars (1953 [1963, 310–11]) thought Lewis’ talk of immediate awareness of universals fails these constraints. Lewis’ defense of the certainty of the given rests on two claims. First, it is just an undeniable fact, apparent to anyone who reflects on experience, that there is a sensuous character of experience which we are aware of and can’t be mistaken about and which, until it fades to memory, isn’t subject to correction and isn’t further confirmable. As Lewis (1952a [1970, 329]) put it in a symposium on the given with Reichenbach (1952) and Goodman (1952), there is no requirement of “inductive consistency” on expressive statements. Second, the supposition that probability is always relative to something else that is itself only probable means that probabilities can never get off the ground. As Lewis says, “if anything is to be probable, something must be certain” (Lewis 1946, 186). Goodman (1952) argued that the premises relative to which other statements are credible or probable just have to be initially credible on their own to some degree, not certain, though subject to future confirmation or disconfirmation in the light of further experience. So long as they are initially credible on their own rather than because something else is initially credible, Lewis’ regress fails. This is a view that attracted many epistemologists after Lewis in some form or other.

Lewis’ response is instructive for his understanding of epistemology. For Lewis (1952a [1970, 330]), a principal task of epistemology is with the “validity” of knowledge, i.e., with the justification or warrant for cognition that distinguishes empirically warranted belief from lucky or unlucky guess or hazard of belief. If a class of beliefs in principle may be false, we need some reason or grounds for thinking its members true or likely to be true, especially if we plan to base other beliefs on them. That requires present or past justifying grounds of belief, not just future potential for verification or confirmation as he thinks Goodman proposes. Otherwise, we confuse justification with verification, or ignore the former for the latter. (Might Goodman, like Chisholm (1948), think Lewis had already opened the barn door by conceding that our ostensible recollections are prima facie but non-inductively probable in their own right?) Nor can the grounds consist solely in other beliefs that might be mistaken without grounds for thinking them true or likely to be true, or in beliefs that stand in conditional probabilistic relations to each other, as he thinks Reichenbach proposes, without any antecedent probabilities deriving from something else (Lewis 1952a [1970, 328]). Lewis acknowledges that his (somewhat traditional) concerns with validation or justification, skepticism, and the need for given justifying grounds, lead him to depart from or supplement standard pragmatic theories.

4. Logic, Language, and Meaning

In SSL Lewis (1918) surveyed and discussed developments in symbolic logic from Leibniz to his own day and followed his discussion of systems of material implication with a penultimate chapter presenting his own system of strict implication (omitted from the 1960 Dover reprint). In the concluding chapter (also omitted from the 1960 Dover reprint), Lewis distinguished three possible types of “logistic procedure” and resultant system (Lewis 1918, 354–62, 367–72). The first restricts proofs in mathematics to special cases of the propositions of symbolic logic, but grants branches of mathematics their own primitive or undefined ideas and postulates distinct from those of symbolic logic. The second goes further, reducing mathematics to symbolic logic by defining or analyzing the ideas and postulates of the former in terms of those of the latter. However, the third “heterodox” or “external” conception of mathematics – “mathematics without meaning” – treats mathematical and logical systems alike as purely formal, abstract systems performing operations on recognizable ideographic marks and strings of marks in ways that are independent of what they denote or mean, or even the type of thing they are interpreted as standing for, e.g. concept or proposition, and thus independent of the truth of strings of marks. What matters instead are simply the types of order and relation with which recognizable marks or complexes of marks are distributed and “extra-logical” rules or principles for manipulating them, like the consistent substitution of marks for marks within a string of marks. Post (1921) credited Lewis as the first to make substitution an explicit rule for logic, whether under an orthodox conception as with his system of strict implication (Lewis 1918, 295) between propositions, or under a heterodox conception concerning recognizable marks and their order (Lewis 1918, 355, 358), and cited Lewis’ discussion of the heterodox conception as a stimulus for his own formalist research.

Lewis was dissatisfied with the extensional truth functional logic of Principia Mathematica, and with its understanding of implication as material implication, according to which the truth of the if-then conditional \(p \supset q\) expressing the material implication of \(q\) by \(p\) is a function just of the truth or falsity of \(p\) and \(q. p \supset q\) is equivalent to \({\sim}(p \amp{\sim}q)\) and is true just in case it isn’t the case both that \(p\) is true and \(q\) is false. As a result, among the theses of Principia Mathematica are \(p \supset(q \supset p)\) and \({\sim}p \supset(p \supset q)\). In other words, a true proposition, whatever it happens to be, is implied by any proposition whatsoever, true or false, and a false proposition, whatever it happens to be, implies any proposition whatsoever, true or false. Lewis didn’t deny these theses, properly understood relative to the definition of material implication. However, he did think that these so-called “paradoxes of material implication” meant that material implication doesn’t provide a proper understanding of any ordinary notion of implication, according to which one proposition implies another just in case the latter logically follows from and is deducible from the former.

To explicate this notion he defined strict implication, according to which the if-then conditional \(p \fishhook q\) expressing the strict implication of \(q\) by \(p\) is equivalent to \({\sim}\Diamond(p \amp{\sim}q)\), and is true just in case it is not possible that \(p\) is true and \(q\) is false. Strict implication is an intensional notion, and the logic of strict implication is a form of modal logic. The system of strict implication developed in SSL (Lewis 1918) was distinguished from earlier modal logics by its axiomatic presentation in the light of the work of Whitehead and Russell. However, Lewis faced a number of criticisms, including one by Emil Post that one of Lewis’ postulates led to the result that it was indeed impossible that \(p\) just in case it was false that \(p\), so that Lewis’ SSL system reduced to an extensional one. Lewis (Lewis and Langford 1932) eliminated these problems in SL and provided distinct systems of strict implication or modal logic, S1–S5, each stronger than its predecessor (with S3 the system of SSL). S1 contained the following axioms:

\[\begin{align} & (p \amp q) \fishhook(q \amp p) \\ &(p \amp q) \fishhook p \\ &p \fishhook(p \amp p) \\ &((p \amp q) \amp r) \fishhook (p \amp(q \amp r)) \\ &((p \fishhook q) \amp(q \fishhook r)) \fishhook(p \fishhook r) \\ &(p \amp(p \fishhook q)) \fishhook q \end{align}\]

S2 adds to S1 the consistency postulate

\[ \Diamond(p \amp q) \fishhook \Diamond p, \]

which allows one to show that if \(p \fishhook q\) is a theorem, then so is \({\sim}\Diamond{\sim}p \fishhook{\sim}\Diamond{\sim}q\), i.e., \(\Box p \fishhook \Box q\), expressing the strict implication of the necessity of \(q\) by the necessity of \(p\). S3 adds to S1 the postulate

\[ (p \fishhook q) \fishhook({\sim}\Diamond q \fishhook{\sim}\Diamond p) \]

S4 adds to S1 the iterative axiom:

\[\begin{align} &{\sim}\Diamond{\sim}p \fishhook{\sim}\Diamond{\sim}{\sim}\Diamond{\sim}p, \text{ i.e.,} \\ &\Box p \fishhook \Box \Box p \end{align}\]

S5 adds to S1 the iterative axiom:

\[\begin{align} &\Diamond p \fishhook{\sim}\Diamond{\sim}\Diamond p, \text{ i.e.,} \\ &\Diamond p \fishhook \Box \Diamond p \end{align}\]

Critics objected that strict implication posed its own alleged paradoxes. Within Lewis’ systems S2–S5, a necessarily true proposition is strictly implied by any proposition whatsoever, and a necessarily false proposition strictly implies any proposition whatsoever. However, Lewis (Lewis and Langford, 1932) replied in SL that these alleged paradoxes are simply the result of entirely natural assumptions about valid deductive inference and entailment quite apart from the systems of strict implication, and thus are not a problem for the claim that strict implication provides an explication of deducibility and entailment. (The presentation in this and the previous two paragraphs owes much to the excellent account and discussion of Lewis’ systems of strict implication in Hughes and Cresswell (1968, Chapters 12–13).)

Lewis thought that there are an unlimited number of possible systems of logic. One example is the extensional propositional calculus of Principia according to which there are two truth values, true and false; other examples are the various systems of many valued logic that Lewis surveyed in SL, and, of course, Lewis’ own various modal systems S1–S5. Lewis thought that each of these systems is valid so long as it is internally consistent. The principles of the various alternatives simply define the meaning of the logical concepts and operators such as negation, truth/falsity, disjunction, implication, and thus they are all true (Lewis 1932 [1970, 401]). Bivalent systems simply have a different notion of truth and falsity from non-bivalent ones. Nonetheless, some systems may accord better than others with notions of truth or implication or deduction that are implicit in our everyday reasoning. Logics can thus be assessed pragmatically by their sufficiency for the guidance and testing of our usual deductions, systematic simplicity and convenience, and accord with our psychological limitations and mental habits. However, Lewis denied that he was claiming that principles of logic could be true without being necessarily true, or necessarily true without being necessarily necessary. A logic in which \(\Box p \fishhook \Box \Box p\) holds simply operates with a different notion of necessity from one in which it doesn’t.

Lewis (1943, 1946, Chps. 3–6) distinguished several modes of meaning. The denotation of a term is the class of actual things to which the term applies and is distinct from the comprehension — the class of possible or consistently thinkable things to which it applies. The signification of a term is the property the presence of which in a thing makes the term applicable, The term “dog” denotes the actual dogs but names what it comprehends and the abstract term “dogness” names what “dog” signifies. The intension or connotation of a term is what is applicable to any possible thing to which the term is applicable. Intension can be linguistic intension, in which case it is the conjunction of terms applicable to any possible thing to which the term is applicable and thus substitutable for the term salva veritate. However, since definitions must have criteria of application and these must ultimately be non-circular, the more basic dimension of intension for most terms is sense meaning. Sense meaning is the criterion in mind in terms of sense experience for classifying objects and applying a term—a schema or rule that speakers have in mind whereby a term applies to an actual or thinkable thing or signifies some property, and which would exist even if there were no linguistic expression for it. What is essential to having a “criterion in mind” is “entertained in advance of instances of application”, which could in principle be construed in terms of incipient behaviour and behavioural tendencies, but for Lewis (1946, 144) it is just “common sense” that the criteria are sensory and “inwardly observable”. A proposition is a linguistic expression that is capable of signifying a state of affairs and is the content of an assertion (or question, assumption, hypothesis, etc.) Every statement asserts a proposition and attributes a state of affairs to the actual world. What every true proposition denotes as a result is the actual world and what it comprehends is the set of possible worlds. A world is such that one or the other of every pair of contradictory propositions would apply or be true of it. (Are there alternative logics in which the law of excluded middle doesn’t hold?) The intension of a proposition comprises everything that the proposition entails and nothing else. The set of conditionals about what experiences we would have, were we to have other experience and act, that are entailed by a proposition expressing our objective interpretation of experience thus comprises for us the intension of the proposition, thanks to its sense meaning (Lewis 1946, 136) not the verbal definitions of its terms. This position has sometimes been called “analytic phenomenalism” but not by Lewis. It does not straightforwardly entail what the denota are, apart from satisfying the criteria, or their ontological status (Lewis 1954 [1970, 333]). Lewis (1929, 115, 121) says that terms denote the actual and possible experiences that constitute the experiential criteria for the application of the term, but in AKV Lewis (1946, 137) calls this a “confusion” of intension with denotation. Nonetheless, the sense meaning of a term is coterminous with its comprehension. A term used by two individuals with different sense meanings, or linguistic intensions of differing scientific sophistication, might then presumably mostly overlap in denotation, or even agree entirely, but not in comprehension.

In MWO, Lewis (1929, 107) argued that verbal definition is eventually circular and logical analysis not a reduction to primitive terms, but a matter of relating terms to each other. Concepts consist in relational structures of meaning and require criteria of application in experience. The “total meaning” of a term for an individual, Lewis (1929, 115) says, consists of the concept it expresses and the sensory criteria for its application. However, the sensory criteria needn’t be identical across individuals, and indeed are unlikely to be so given variations, potentially dramatic, in experience between individuals. Nonetheless, there can be shared, common, communicable, “pure” concepts in so far as there are shared structures of linguistic definition and common or congruent patterns of behavioural discrimination in particular co-operative behaviour that both requires and fosters common concepts and that find correlates in experience (Lewis, 115–6). Common concepts are an “abstraction” (Lewis 1929, 115) from the actual psychological states of individuals, implicit in their practice, and their possibility is conditioned by two facts: we are creatures having in large the same needs and interests and powers of discrimination and relation, and are confronted by a common reality mediated to us in sense experience which is comparable, if not identical (Lewis 1929, 91).

One problem for Lewis’ view of common concepts was pointed out by Quine (1960) in Word and Object with his indeterminacy of translation argument. From the standpoint of an interpreter, there can be alternative translation manuals or schemes that are consistent with the total set of a speaker’s verbal and other behavioural dispositions. This is a problem that Lewis (1946, 144–5, 164) seems aware of in AKV. There he draws back from the discussion of common concepts, but not common meaning entirely, and rests content with pointing out that any attribution of either linguistic meaning or sense meaning to another is inductive and only probable, and any attribution of linguistic or sense meaning similar to ours is likewise inductive, fallible, and problematic. There is no special problem, he thinks, concerning sense meaning.

Lewis (1946, 84–5, 93–5) distinguished between analytic and synthetic truth. Analytically true statements are true by virtue of the definition of the terms they contained, and have zero intension (and universal comprehension). They are necessarily true, true in all possible worlds, no matter what else might be true of a world or thing, and yet are not equivalent in meaning to each other only due to the distinct intensions of their constituents. Explicitly analytic statements (“Necessarily, cats are animals”) assert the logically necessity of a proposition; implicitly analytic ones (“Cats are animals”) merely assert a proposition which is analytic.(Lewis 1946, 89). The putative differences seem sharply distinguished in Lewis’ semantics, but the application of the distinctions to statements in practice less so.

In MWO Lewis occasionally claimed that we create necessary truth by adopting concepts and criterial principles; in AKV he was more circumspect. It is a matter of convention or legislation that a term has the meaning it does, including sense meaning, but Lewis (1946, 155–7) denied that analytic truth was truth by convention or stipulation. “A dog is an animal” is analytically true by virtue of the sense meaning of “dog” and “animal”, in particular, the inclusion of the criterion for applying the latter in the criterion for applying the former, and that isn’t a matter of convention. However, Lewis never tried to define such inclusion further. Quine (1951) explicitly criticized Lewis and the analytic/synthetic distinction and would have objected to the idea of resting it on an undefined notion of meaning inclusion. Lewis (1946, 154), on the other hand, thought that meaning inclusion is as unproblematic and recognizable a fact as the inclusion of one plan in another, e.g. a plan to visit France in a plan to visit Paris, and didn’t need further explication. Nonetheless, taking meaning inclusion to be a primitive fact also makes it more difficult to distinguish Lewis’ analytic necessity from the rationalists’ synthetic necessity, despite his (Lewis 1946, 157) vigorous rejection of the latter. This is especially so since Lewis denied that analytic truth is usefully elucidated as one that is reducible to logical truth with the substitution of definitions. For Lewis (1946, 129–30, 122–24) , the adequacy of a definition itself is a matter of analytic truth and a logical truth is an analytically true formal statement “certifiable” from its intension as constituted by the intension of its constituent symbols and their syntax.

5. The A Priori and the Analytic

Lewis (1946, 29–31) thought that necessary truths are analytic and knowable a priori, independently of experience. In applying concepts like those of red or apple, as well as more abstract concepts and categories, to current experience and interpreting it, we form expectations and make predictions about future experience, conditional on actions we might perform. Our beliefs constitute empirical knowledge in so far as past experience gives us good reason (largely inductive) for making these predictions. However, we aren’t making predictions about future experience simply in stating what these concepts are, what their definitions are, and what the criteria are for applying them to experience. Such statements are explicative, not predictive, and so neither falsifiable by failed prediction nor verifiable by successful prediction nor justified by inductive evidence. The a priori is what we are not required to abandon, no matter what experience may bring (Lewis 1929, 267). However, a priori principles are neither principles that are universal nor ones that we have to accept. The acceptance of a set of concepts is a matter of decision or legislation or the adoption of an intention to employ certain criteria in the interpretation of experience, something for which there are alternatives but for which the criteria are not empirical but pragmatic.

In MWO, Lewis (1929, 254) thought that the a priori extended to fundamental laws of nature defining basic concepts like mass or energy or simultaneity, and thus included some of what are typically regarded as the basic principles of a scientific theory, as well as abstract mathematics and logic usually regarded as a priori. Besides criteria like convenience and conformity to human bent, pragmatic considerations mentioned in MWO (Lewis 1929, 267) include factors like intellectual simplicity, economy, comprehensiveness, and thus the overall achievement of intellectual order. However, unlike many in the latter half of the 20th century, Lewis never recognized such factors as criteria of empirical justification. The reason seems to be that Lewis (1936b [1970, 286]) didn’t think that these factors make a hypothesis any more probable, in contrast, presumably, to conformity to logical principles of inductive inference: “What such simplicity and convenience determine is not truth or even probability but merely simplicity and convenience”. As a result, they are not criteria of epistemic warrant or justification, concerned with the truth or validity of what we believe (Lewis 1946, 441; 1955a, 34). Nor are they criteria of a priori epistemic justification. The simpler set of concepts and explicative principles is no more valid or true than the simpler logic is more true or valid

Pragmatic considerations might lead us in the face of experience to abandon our scientific concepts and a priori principles explicating them and adopt others without making the former any less epistemically warranted. Repeated failure to apply a scientific concept to experience might lead us to stop employing it to interpret experience without disconfirming or making its explicative principles any less epistemically warranted, and eventually lead us to drop them altogether in favour of others that are more fruitful. In more interesting cases, cruder categories may be replaced by more fine grained ones that carve up experience in ways that are more valuable for our purposes, or lead to inventions that open up the bounds of experience in ways that our old principles can accommodate but in a less simple or more ad hoc way than new ones and lead us to abandon an old theory that can accommodate such experience but in a less simple way than a novel one. Concepts or categories “do not literally change” but are given up. Old a priori truths are replaced by new ones, not contradicted by them and not made false by them (Lewis 1929, 267–8). The terms might remain but their meaning has changed.

The most radical challenge to Lewis came from Quine (1951). He argued that the distinction between so called a priori truths and a posteriori truths is just one of degree. The argument has two steps. First, empirical hypotheses have implications for experience only in conjunction with various empirical generalizations and other background assumptions, e.g. about the circumstances of perception. Recalcitrant experience thus tells us only that some belief or assumption in the total set that implies a contrary experience is false, not which one, and thus any statement can be held true, no matter what experience brings, so long as we make enough adjustments to the rest of our beliefs and assumptions. Second, empirical hypotheses can’t logically imply anything about experience except against a background of assumed laws of logic. Recalcitrant experience can, in principle, then, lead us to revise an assumed logical principle in our web of belief rather one of our other beliefs. We may be reluctant to do so because of the relative centrality of a logical principles to our system of belief and the disruption its revision would cause, and so “choose that revision which requires the least alteration” (Lewis 1936b [1970, 283]), but in principle we could.

With respect to the second step, some might object that logic is part of the framework within which beliefs have logical implications and can’t be part of the same system of belief itself. However, Lewis himself might have trouble with this suggestion, since he recognized the possibility of alternative logics, and presumably, any decision, even pragmatic, about the adoption or rejection of a logic must operate on some logical assumptions. In any case, Lewis himself recognizes that in principle experience could lead us to abandon logical beliefs and replace them with others. What he will deny is that it does so by making these principles empirically improbable. With respect to the first step, Lewis (1948, 1952a [1970]), will deny Quine’s assumption that objective statements never entail conditionals about experience on having other experiences without supposing other objective statements true and deny his assumption that the antecedents of these conditionals are never themselves certain. Moreover, objective hypotheses, despite their various interconnections in a system of empirical belief, aren’t tested as a “block”, but have separable and distinct probabilistic connections to others (but not thereby to all) and to experience, establishing differing antecedent probabilities and degrees of confidence, in the light of which the relevance of tests for the probability of the various hypotheses needs to be assessed differentially (Lewis 1936b [1970, 285–6]; Lewis 1946, 349–52). So it is open to Lewis to argue also that the logical principles relevant to the empirical testing of hypotheses aren’t tested or warranted as part of a block with those hypotheses, but warranted differentially, in an a priori way.

However, this response highlights the need for Lewis to provide a positive account of our a priori knowledge of principles explicating our concepts and how we have it, not just a negative account that simply contrasts it with empirical knowledge. That need is also highlighted by the fact that Lewis thinks that we learn empirical generalizations about objects by inductive inference from other empirical knowledge and this presumably affects further predictions Yet, presumably, our concepts and their sense meaning aren’t changing with every change to the predictions we are in a position to make, without the distinction between the a priori and a posteriori collapsing. In MWO, he says the a priori is knowable by the reflective and critical formulation of our own principles of classification, at least with respect to meaning connections explicitly before the mind (Lewis 1929, 287–8) and in AKV that a priori truths are certifiable by reference to meanings alone (and their relations like inclusion), and tested simply by what we can think or imagine being so (Lewis 1946, 35, 94–5, 151–3). However, the only explanation he gives of why this should warrant us in thinking anything necessary or possible is that “as what we intend at the moment at least, a meaning seems to be as open to direct examination as anything we are likely to discover” (Lewis 1946, 145). It is this that warrants us in dismissing an apparent Euclidean triangle the sum of whose angles isn’t 180 degrees as either a mismeasurement or not a Euclidean triangle rather than a counterexample to Euclidean geometry. There seems to be a half-acknowledged, non-inductive, basic principle of a priori credibility assumed here, to the effect that if on reflection on our concepts and meanings and classificatory intentions, we think A includes B, then we are at least prima facie warranted in thinking A does include B. As we saw with memory, Lewis isn’t in principle averse to non-inductively supported principles of prima facie warrant.

However, prima facie warrant is fallible and defeasible. We may fail to recognize what is implicit in our concepts and what their adoption consistently commits us to in our thinking. Any of these mistakes, Lewis (1946, 155) says, is “intrinsically possible of correction merely by taking thought of the matter”, without empirical investigation. The correctness of explicative principles can be warranted a priori in so far as their truth can be certified or assured simply by analysis of meanings or reflection on the content of our concepts and explicative principles. (Lewis 1946, 151, 165). Yet, suppose we recognize a posteriori through empirical investigation of our classificatory verbal behaviour that it doesn’t accord with what it should be in the light of our a priori reflection on our concepts and explicative principles? Does that give us empirical grounds for some doubt about the latter, rendering it at least somewhat less warranted, at least for the time being, even if the response should be further reflection on our concepts and classificatory intentions, as Lewis says? In any case, it wouldn’t be grounds for rejecting the distinction altogether between a priori and a posteriori warrant. It would be grounds, however, for denying that unrevisability of degree of warrant in the light of empirical evidence is a defining criterion of the a priori.

6. Empirical Knowledge and Probability

In AKV, Lewis distinguished three classes of empirical statements. First, there are expressive statements formulating what is presently given in experience and about the truth of which we can be certain (Lewis 1946, 171–71, 183, 204, 327). Second, there are terminating judgements and statements formulating and predicting what we would experience were we to be presented with some sensory cue and perform some action. The form of terminating judgements is (Lewis 1946, 184, 205, 250):

If (or given) \(S\), then if \(A\), it would be the case that \(E\), i.e. \(((S \amp A) \rightarrow E)\)

where \(S, A\), and \(E\) are each formulated in expressive language and concern particular presentable experiences about which we can be certain, and “\(\rightarrow\)” is neither logical entailment nor material implication but what Lewis calls “real connection” giving rise to subjunctive or counterfactual conditionals. Real connections (including causal connections) are inductively established correlations by virtue of which one observable item may indicate another. The subjunctive \((S \amp A) \rightarrow E\) is “implicitly general” (Lewis, 1946, 219) and may be decisively falsifiable but is not decisively verifiable (though Lewis sometimes suggests otherwise). Third, there are non-terminating judgements, including objective judgment, that are confirmable and disconfirmable by experience, thanks to their sense meaning, but are neither decisively verifiable nor decisively falsifiable.

Objective judgements include not only perceptual judgements like “There is a white piece of paper before me” in which we conceptualize and interpret a given experience by relating it to other possible experiences, but also a vast number of other beliefs about the material world supported by our perceptual beliefs, e.g. statements about the future outcome of space explorations, or generalizations like “All men have noses”, or non-analytic statements about theoretical entities. Objective judgements don’t strictly imply terminating judgements of the form \((S \amp A) \rightarrow E\) (Lewis 1946, 237). Instead, the sense meaning of objective judgments consists of an indefinitely large set of general probabilistically qualified conditional judgements of the form “If it were the case that \(S \amp A\), then, in all likelihood, \(E\)” (Lewis 1946, 237). Any objective perceptual judgement \(P\) thus analytically entails and is entailed by, an indefinitely large set of hypothetical or conditional judgements of the form,

\((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\),
where \((h)E\) means that, in all probability \(E\), and expresses, not the probability of the conditional \((S \amp A) \rightarrow E)\), but “a relation of probability” between \(E, S\), and \(A\) (Lewis 1946, 250).

Lewis also calls these conditional judgements terminating judgements, but they are neither decisively verifiable nor decisively falsifiable. Nonetheless, as expressing real connections, they are confirmable and disconfirmable by experience, as are the objective judgements whose sense meaning they constitute.

For example, to use Lewis’s examples, suppose \(P\) is “a sheet of paper lies before me”. Its analytic entailments might include, “If \(S_1\) (I were to seem to see a sheet of paper before me) and \(A_1\) (I were to seem to move my eyes), then, probably, \(E_1\) (I would seem to see the sheet of paper displaced)”, as well as “If \(S_2\) (I were to seem to feel paper with my fingers), and \(A_2\) (I were to seem to pick it up and tear it), then, probably, \(E_2\) (I would seem to see or feel torn paper)”, and so on. On the other hand, suppose \(P\) is “There is a doorknob before me”. Its truth might then entail the truth of a complex set of conditionals like “If I were to seem to see a doorknob, and were to seem to reach out towards it and grasp it, then, probably, I would seem to feel something hard and round”, etc.

In MWO Lewis says in one place that not only are appearances physically conditioned by objects and the physical circumstances of one’s body and perception, which is certainly a reason for wanting to know such physical facts, but that these conditions enter into the basic understanding or meaning of material object statements: “It is such conditions which are expressed in the ‘if’ clause of those ‘If … then …’ propositions in which the predictions implicit in an interpretation may be made explicit” (Lewis 1929, 286). Now, Lewis might here simply be recognizing that, according to MWO (before the introduction of the category of expressive language), any attempt to make the conditional explicit in linguistic form as a proposition will result in both the antecedent and consequent being linguistically expressed propositions and thus expressed in the language of objective interpretation. However, he seems to be making a stronger point (albeit contrary to Lewis [1929, 336]). If so, it is a point which he explicitly rejects in AKV: “Thus those conditions which are directly pertinent to a confirmation and genuinely ascertainable are not objective facts but must be included amongst the given appearances. They must be items of direct presentation; and we might think of them as already covered by ‘\(S\)’ in our paradigm: \(S\) being given, if \(A\) then, with probability \(M, E\)” (Lewis 1946, 246). The result is that \(S\) in Lewis’ paradigm strictly speaking won’t just stand for the visual presentation of a doorknob, for example, but the appearance of daylight or the feeling of being clear headed as part of the whole presentation. It will stand for a “complex of sense qualia”.

No number of successful or failed tests will render the objective judgement true or false with theoretical certainty. However, Lewis thought the principle of inverse probabilities meant that the judgement can be highly probable with a few positive confirmations, even practically certain, in so far as the probability of \(P\) increases and approaches certainty when \(S\) and \(A\) and \(E\) are true, in the degree that \(E\) would be improbable were \(P\) false and \(S\) and \(A\) were true, or, more generally, in so far as the probability of \(P\) increases on supporting evidence to the extent that the latter would be unlikely were \(P\) false (Lewis 1946, 190–2, 240–1). The principle also explains why further tests may continue to increase our warranted assurance in the judgement even more, though not as dramatically as earlier tests increased our warrant (Lewis 1946, 191, fn. 4). Since confirming and gaining assurance that \(P\) gives us assurance in all the predictions \(P\) entails about future experience (Lewis 1946, 239; 1954 [1970], 334), the principle of inverse probabilities may explain how we can act on these predictions with increasing confidence. As a result, although experience of instances of \(S\) and \(A\) and \(E\) can confirm and increase the probability of one sensory conditional entailed by \(P\) independent of direct experiential confirmation of the other sensory conditionals entailed by \(P\), experiential confirmation of one conditional also increases the probability of the others, and vice versa (Lewis 1946, 348 fn. 6; 1954 [1970], 334).

Our empirical knowledge of objects and objective events and properties, the generalizations they support concerning patterns of objective events and properties, and the use we make of all this for further inductions, has a complex “many-storied character”. Nonetheless, the “whole edifice still rests at bottom on these primitive generalizations which we make in terms of direct experience” (Lewis 1946, 261). (Lewis [1929, 332; 1946, 261] contrasted these primitive generalizations that underlie our objective beliefs with what he says we normally call “empirical generalizations” that concern patterns of objective events and may formulate natural laws supporting causal explanations.) However, the empirical justification for these primitive generalizations and ultimately for our objective beliefs can’t rest on current sense experience alone and requires evidence concerning the past. At the same time, what is given to us isn’t the past itself about which we can never be certain, but just current sense presentation and current recollection or sense of past experience.

Lewis appreciated the problem memory posed for his epistemology much more clearly in AKV than in MWO. In AKV, Lewis (1946, 334) argued that whatever we ostensibly remember, whether as explicit recollection or merely in our sense of the past, is prima facie credible just because so remembered. So there are data of sense presentation and also data of “seeming to remember” or “present memory” or “mnemic presentation” (Lewis 1946, 353, 354) that constitute our ultimate evidence. It is only through the latter and the principle of memorial prima facie credibility that empirical generalizations and the beliefs they support can be inductively supported by premises about past experience as well as by premises about directly apprehended present experience. Further the credibility of our recollections, together with the whole range of empirical beliefs more or less dependent on them, can be solidified and increased through the mutual support or congruence of the whole, or can be diminished through incongruence.

A set of beliefs is congruent for Lewis (1946, 338) when the antecedent probability of each is increased by the assumption of the truth of the rest. A physical object statement \(P\) and the set of sensory conditionals that constitute its content form a congruent set, as we have seen. Indeed, by virtue of exhausting the empirical content of \(P\), Lewis (1946, 348–9, fn. 6; 1954 [1970, 334]) thinks the sensory conditionals constitute a congruent set by themselves. In any case, the degree of warrant enjoyed by the various elements of a mature system of empirical belief about our world, especially one that counts as knowledge, depends on the inferential support the elements provide each other and the total empirical and memorial data present. However, Lewis emphasizes that for the members of a congruent system to have any degree of probability, “it is absolutely requisite that some at least of the set of statements possess a degree of credibility antecedent to and independent of the remainder of those in question, and derivable from the relation of them to direct experience” (Lewis 1946, 339).

As a result, the “whole intricate network” of the empirically credible, Lewis notes, “will be constituted at bottom by linkages of ground and consequence, which is in general a one way relation” (Lewis 1946, 351). Disentangling the network would reveal particular linkages of prior probability relationships that would confer some degree of initial probability not just on what we recall of past experience but on simple generalizations from past experience and the expectations of future experiences and thus interpretations of experience these recollections inductively support, even in the hypothetical absence of objective beliefs with which they are congruent (Lewis, 1929, 332, 336, Lewis 1946, 335). Moreover, the recollections that support them and form part of an overall congruent system must have some degree of credibility independent of each other and the rest. The improbability of independently probable congruent recollections all being true were the beliefs they inferentially support and that inferentially support them not true makes it unlikely that they are illusions of memory and increases the initial probability enjoyed antecedently by the recollections and what they support (Lewis 1946, 352–3). Spelling out the antecedent and independent probability constraints is tricky and receives an extended discussion (Lewis 1946, 332–57).

The prima facie credibility of mnemic presentation of past experience can’t itself be justified inductively for Lewis, on pain of circularity. Nor did he think it is simply a postulate we have to assume for empirical knowledge to be possible. Instead, he argued that it is constitutive of the lived world of experience and something for which there is no meaningful alternative. Sceptical alternatives designed to undermine it are inaccessible to knowledge and thus ones for which there is no criterion in experience. So it is an “analytic statement” that the past is knowable, and a similar claim was made for the relevance of past experience to the future, and thus for the knowability of empirical reality. The philosophical problem for Lewis (1946, 360–2) is to formulate correctly the criteria that “delimit empirical reality and explicate our sense of it”.

In MWO, he defended induction in more detail by arguing that not every prediction is compatible with an evidence base, and that successive revision of one’s predictions in the light of new experience can’t help but make for more successful predictions (Lewis 1929, 367, 386). Goodman’s (1955) well known “grue” example and his New Riddle of Induction pose problems for the relevance of the first claim and the force of the second. At other times, Lewis (1946, 325) simply followed Reichenbach in claiming that we can be assured only that if any procedures will achieve success in prediction, inductive ones will, without clearly distinguishing that claim from any attempt at an analytic justification of induction.

Rationally credible or warranted or justified belief, Lewis thought, is probable on the evidence, but the presentation of his views on probability was underdeveloped in MWO, and complex, and sometimes confusing, in AKV. In AKV, Lewis defended an a priori account of probability or what he sometimes called expectation. However, citing Peirce, he rejected the Principle of Indifference often associated with a priori accounts, understood as the principle that in the absence of any reason for thinking one a priori possibility more likely than another, they are equiprobable (Lewis 1946, 306–314). The expectation or probability \(a/b\) of a proposition \(P\) is always relative to some set of empirical data or premises \(D\). The expectation corresponds to an a priori valid estimate of the frequency of some property mentioned in \(P\) in some reference class mentioned in \(P\) , which estimate is derived from data or premises \(D\), given the a priori valid principles of probabilistic inference, including the principles of induction. Hypothetical or conditional probability statements that are a priori valid license valid probabilistic inferences from premises about evidence or data to conclusions. However, for Lewis, both hypothetical and categorical probability are always relativized to an evidence base, despite his occasional apparent talk of a priori valid probability statements as licensing inferences from empirical evidence to a (detachable) conclusion “Probably, \(P\)”.

Lewis (1946, 282–90) rejected the view that probabilities are empirically based estimates of the limiting value of the frequency of instances of a property in a population, and thus expressed in non-terminating judgments. First, he thought that any attempt to define probability as the ratio of instances of one property among instances of another property as the latter approaches infinity would make probability judgments empirically untestable. Second, he argued that, if probability judgements were empirical frequency claims, then the probability judgements would themselves only be probable, something that can’t be coherently accounted for. Nonetheless, Lewis recognized the need to assure ourselves rationally that the frequency as validly estimated from the data is closely in accord with the actual frequency and that there is nothing in the case at hand affecting the occurrence of the property which isn’t taken into account in the specification of the reference class. Lewis dubbed this the reliability of the determination of probability or expectation. He thought that reliability is a function of the adequacy of data (e.g. size of sample), the uniformity with which the frequency of some property in the data as a whole also holds for subsets of the data, and the proximateness or degree of resemblance of the case at hand in \(P\) to the data, all of which he thought are also logical relations.

Thus, in AKV, Lewis (1946, 305) claimed that the full statement of a probability judgement should be of the form “That \(c\), having property \(F\), will also have property \(G\), is credible on data \(D\), with expectation \(a/b\) and reliability \(R\)”, and is assertable in whatever sense \(D\) is. The judgement is valid when, in accordance with the a priori rules of probability and the correct rules of judging reliability, \(D\) gives the estimate \(a/b\) of the frequency of \(F\)s among \(G\)s, and \(D\)’s adequacy, uniformity, and proximateness to the case in point, yields reliability \(R\). A valid probability judgement is true when \(D\) is true, and is a categorical rather than a hypothetical judgement when \(D\) is categorically asserted as true. The assertion of the empirical data \(D\) is the only empirical element in the probability judgement, which otherwise has no testable implications for experience. However, the belief \(P\), that \(c\) which has \(F\) is also \(G\), is an empirical belief that may be rationally credible, empirically justified or warranted, in so far as \(D\) is given and the degree of assurance or belief corresponds to an a priori degree of probability (expectation) of \(P\) on \(D\) that is sufficiently high and sufficiently reliable. Further, acceptance of \(P\) counts as empirical knowledge in so far as, first, \(P\) is true, second the degree of probability or expectation of \(P\) on \(D\) is sufficiently high as to approach practical certainty, and, third, \(D\) consists of all relevant data (Lewis 1946, 314–15).

It is important to distinguish probabilistically qualified counterfactual statements of the form \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) from a priori probability statements of the form \(\text{Prob}(E, \text{ given } S \amp A) \gt .5\). Both express conditional probabilities. However, the former express ‘real’ connections knowable by induction from past experience (Lewis 1946, 250). They constitute the analytically entailed consequences of an objective material objective statement \(P\), but can’t themselves be analytic truths. The latter, on the other hand, if true, are analytically true, knowable a priori, with zero intension, and entailed by any statement whatsoever, and so can hardly constitute the empirical meaning of contingently true material object statements. Yet, apart from denying that “\(\rightarrow\)” can be understood either as material implication or strict implication, Lewis had little to say in print about what the truth conditions of subjunctive or counterfactual conditionals are. Murphey (2005, 332) quotes correspondence from Lewis, in which he complains that Goodman and Chisholm in their writings miss the obvious interpretation of “If \(A\) were the case, then \(B\) would be the case”, namely that \(A\) plus other premises of the (actual or hypothetical) case inductively justify the conclusion \(B\). Lewis needs to say more then about what, if anything, distinguishes \((S \amp A) \rightarrow E\) from \((S \amp A) \rightarrow (h)E\). Is it the degree of probability of \(E\) on the premises, practically certain in the former case, only somewhat probable in the latter? Another problem is to interpret the remark so as to avoid turning counterfactuals into a priori analytic truths, albeit ones concerning probabilities. Nonetheless, Lewis emphasized their importance, and the importance of the real connections they express, for the possibility of realism about the material world and the rejection of any sort of idealism or view that physical objects are simply mind-dependent collections of experiences (Lewis 1946, 226). The counterfactual sensory conditionals \((S \amp A) \rightarrow E\) and \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) can be true quite apart from the truth of the expressive statements \(S\) and \(A\), and thus so can material object statements.

Chisholm (1948) raised an important objection to Lewis’ claim that a physical object statement \(P\) entails a set of counterfactual statements expressing claims about what experiences one would have or would be likely to have were one to (seem to) carry out certain tests upon being presented with certain sensory cues. If \(P\) entails \(T\), then for any \(Q\) consistent with \(P\), \(P\) and \(Q\) also entail \(T\). However, Chisholm argued, for any material object statement \(P\) and for any sensory conditional \((S \amp A) \rightarrow (h)E\), there will be some other material object statement \(M\) about the circumstances of perception that is consistent with \(P\), such that \(P\) and \(M\) can both be true while \((S \amp A) \rightarrow (h)E\) is false. (Chisholm oversimplifies his objection by leaving out the probabilistic qualifier in the counterfactual, but I correct this.) For example, suppose \(P\) is “There is a doorknob before one” and \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) is “If one were to seem to see a doorknob and have the experience of reaching out with one’s hand, then, in all likelihood, one would seem to feel something hard and round”, and \(M\) is “One’s fingers have been permanently anaesthetized”. (Expanding the understanding of \(S\) to include sensory correlates of circumstances of perception, as Lewis (1946, 245–6) suggests, presumably just requires expanding the understanding of \(M\) with some imagination.) A material object statement like \(P\), therefore, doesn’t entail sensory conditionals like \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) . Instead of Lewis’ empiricism about the meaning and justification of material object statements, Chisholm proposed that our spontaneous perceptual beliefs about the world, e.g. that one is seeing a doorknob, are prima facie justified just by virtue of being such spontaneous perceptual beliefs, quite apart from any inductive justification from present and past experience that might be reconstructed. Lewis’ own defence of the prima facie credibility of memory, Chisholm thought, prepared the way for his alternative. Quine (1969), on the other hand, thought that Chisholm’s problem just shows that what have consequences for experience and are tested by experience are never individual material object statements in isolation from each other but only sets of them or theories. Quine saved empiricism by drawing a holistic moral from the sort of problem Chisholm posed.

In a rare reply to critics, Lewis (1948a [1970, 322–3]) objected that Chisholm had misunderstood the implication of the probability qualifier. The familiar rule “If \(P\) entails \(T\), then for any \(Q\) consistent with \(P\), \(P\) and \(Q\) entail \(T\)” doesn’t apply, he claims, when \(T\) is any kind of probability statement. \(E\) not being probable on \(P\) and \(M\) and \(S\) and \(A\) is perfectly consistent with \(E\) being probable on \(P\) and \(S\) and \(A\) and its truth doesn’t undermine the truth of the claim that \(P\) entails \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\). However, Chisholm might respond that the familiar rule is simply a consequence of the meaning of entailment or strict implication, according to which it is not possible that \(P\) and not \(T\). Moreover, Lewis isn’t simply claiming that \(E\) is probable on \(P\) and \(S\) and \(A\), but, as Lewis (1946, 248–50) himself says in his formal summary of his view, that the subjunctive conditional \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) is an analytic consequence of \(P\), at least in the way \(X\) is coloured is a consequence of \(X\) is red, and is (strictly) implied by \(P\), as a conclusion to a premise, even if not solely by reference to the “rules of deductive logic”.

(Of course, “\(P\) strictly implies \(((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E)\)” itself strictly implies “\((P \amp S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\)” (but not conversely), and neither is contradicted by “\((P \amp S \amp A \amp M) \rightarrow\) not\((h)E\)”. However, \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) expresses in its own right an “in all likelihood” relation of probability between \(E\) and the possibly counterfactual \(S\) and \(A\) (Lewis 1946, 250), quite apart from \(P\), a relation that, for Lewis, holds when it is in accord with the a priori rules of probability (including inductive inference) relative to the empirical data D (Lewis 1946, 305, 314), in the simplest case, recollections of past instances of \(E\) usually following \(S\) and \(A\).)

Chisholm’s challenge seems to remain, whether it is possible for both:

\(P\) = There is a doorknob before one.
\(M\) = One’s fingers have been permanently anaesthetized.

to be true and:

\((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) = If one were to seem to see a doorknob and have the experience of reaching out with one’s hand, then, in all likelihood, one would seem to feel something and round.

to be false. However, Lewis (1948a) also gives a second, less clear cut, but perhaps more promising, response: when we break down the possible scenarios in Chisholm’s counterexample in detail, the challenge fails. First, in normal cases where \(M\), “One’s fingers have been permanently anaesthetized” manifests itself by affecting the sensory cues and making \(S_1\) “one seems to have tingly, numb fingers” true, in addition to \(S\) “one seems to see a doorknob”, \((S \amp S_1 \amp A) \rightarrow\) not \((h)E\) might indeed be true, but, as Lewis emphasizes, it is consistent with \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\). Second, in other scenarios where the truth of \(M\) somehow doesn’t affect the sensory cues and is recent enough to have not (yet) significantly altered the patterns in the data D, e.g. of instances of \(E\) usually following \(S\) and \(A, (S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) remains true when \(P\) and \(M\) are true. That’s because in such cases \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) is still supported by the extant data of experience and memory D in accord with the a priori rules, despite the truth of \(M\). Further, the reliability of that probability assessment is still warranted by the data and rules for judging reliability, although \(M\) might affect the actual reliability of the probability assessment in the cases at hand, and might eventually affect the actual frequency of \(E\) over time. Of course, there may be occasional failures, but, as Lewis notes, the probabilistically qualified subjunctive \((S \amp A) \rightarrow (h)E\) is compatible with occasional failures of prediction. (Much depends here on Lewis’ own questionable understanding of probability and counterfactuals. ) Finally, there are yet different (and more bizarre) cases where the longstanding truth of \(M\) when \(P\) was true in the past didn’t affect the sensory cues but significantly affected the pattern with \(E\), making D1, e.g. \(E\) not usually following \(S\) and \(A\) in recalled instances, the actual empirical data, rather than D as in the second case. However, in these scenarios it seems that D1 wouldn’t have led us to expect \(E\) upon \(S\) and \(A\). Yet, that expectation is constitutive in part of our objective thought \(P\), and thus, as Firth (1950) suggests, the failure of the sensory conditional \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) to hold relative to D1 is arguably irrelevant to its entailment by the thought we express by “P”.

In any case, one might wonder how sensory conditionals like \((S \amp A) \rightarrow (h)E\), which for Lewis express generalizations concerning what any one would (likely) experience and which must do so if they are to provide the empirical content of objective judgements about an interpersonal material world, can nonetheless be warranted inductively by premises concerning only patterns in the personal experience of the putative knower, in particular how their probability can be judged to be sufficiently reliable, without reference to any background beliefs about how the material world interacts with persons generally and their bodies to affect experience. (Sellars (1959 [1963, 180–84]) makes a stronger claim: without such reference we can’t even understand the notion of the possible experience of other persons. Lewis might think that empathy and imagination allow us to.)

Yet, if Lewis were simply to drop the analytic entailment claim that gives probabilistically qualified sensory conditionals like \((S \amp A) \rightarrow(h)E\) a privileged semantic role, and rest content with the various consistent probability statements relating \(E\) to \(P\), \(S\), \(A\), and \(M\), the character of his empiricism would become puzzling. If the consistent relative probability statements in question are the probabilistically qualified subjunctive conditionals, \((P \amp S \amp A \rightarrow(h)E\) and \((P \amp S \amp A \amp M) \rightarrow \text{not}(h)E)\) , then the statements in question are empirical propositions justified by induction. The justification for them thus will presuppose prior knowledge of the truth of material object statements like \(P\) and \(M\), perhaps in the way Chisholm suggests, rather than explain why and how we can know such propositions solely on the basis of present and past experience of the given. On the other hand, if the relative probability statements are a priori analytic statements in their own right, then it is the total set of such statements that will constitute the empirical meaning of \(P\), statements like

\[ \text{Prob}(E, \text{ given } P \amp S \amp A \amp M) \lt .5 \]

as much as

\[ \text{Prob}(E, \text{ given } P \amp S \amp A) \gt .5 \]

thus containing other material object statements like \(M\). Even when the relativization to other background material object statements isn’t explicit, the probability statement would seem to be implicitly relative to some background assumption of material normality. In other words, Lewis would have abandoned reductionism for Quine’s holistic conclusion that individual material object statements like \(P\), apart from other material object statements, have “no fund of experiential implications to call their own” (Quine 1969, 79).

As noted earlier, Lewis (1929, 286) (and also Lewis (1936b [1970, 285–6]), though there he may simply be alluding to the role of congruence) flirts with a version of Quine’s alternative. However, in AKV and in his reply to Chisholm, Lewis clearly repudiates it: if Chisholm were right that “no statement of objective fact had consequences for direct experience without further premises specifying objective conditions of perception”, then, Lewis says, “the type of empiricism of which my account is one variant—verification-theories and confirmation-theories—will be altogether indefensible” (Lewis 1948a [1970, 318]). The result, he adds, would be a fatally flawed “coherence theory of empirical truth” that leaves us with “nothing..but skepticism”

7. Values and Imperatives

In contrast with those logical positivists who thought that statements of value merely express attitudes, pro or con, to objects, persons, or situations, but are neither true nor false, Lewis (1946, 396–98) thought that statements of value were as true or false as other empirical statements, and every bit as confirmable or disconfirmable. Directly or immediately felt value, felt goodness and badness, is given to us in directly prized experience and directly apprehended in experience or stretches of experience, not so much as one specific, separable quale of experience like the pitch of middle C, but as a gamut of such and as a mode pervasive in all experience, and expressive statements must be used to indicate or convey it (Lewis 1946, 398, 401). However, such statements, like Lewis’ other expressive statements, may be true or false for Lewis, and simply convey the occurrence of given qualia in experience and no more, instead of indicating the existence of objects, situations, or persons, and expressing our attitudes to them. Moreover, there are also for Lewis terminating judgments of value concerning what some experiences, perhaps including their felt value, indicate about the felt value of further experiences. Finally, there are “objective” judgements of value, judgements attributing value to persons, objects, and objective situations, in so far as they have the potential, depending on circumstances, to produce felt goodness or badness in us or others. These are non-terminating judgements of value and are empirically confirmable or disconfirmable by induction just like any other objective empirical judgement. Lewis thus claims that his theory of value is thoroughly naturalistic and humanistic, rather than transcendental, but still objectivist.

The felt goodness of experience is what is intrinsically good or valuable for its own sake. It is only experience in so far as it has such value quality that is intrinsically good rather than merely extrinsically valuable for its contribution to something else that is intrinsically valuable. Value and disvalue are modes or aspects of experience to which desire and aversion are “addressed” (Lewis 1946, 403). Lewis denies that “pleasure” is adequate to the wide variety of what is found directly good in experience, and thus thinks it inadequate as a synonym for “good”. However, as Frankena (1964) argues, for Lewis directly found goodness still seems to be as natural a quality or property of certain experiences as any other qualia directly apprehended in experience. Nonetheless, the value of a stretch of experience, indeed a whole life, isn’t just the value (and disvalue) of the parts, and in AKV, Lewis criticized Bentham’s attempt at a calculus of values. For Lewis, the intrinsic value found in the experience of a symphony isn’t just the sum of the intrinsic value of the movements taken individually, but reflects the character of the symphony as a temporal Gestalt. What is ultimately good for Lewis is the quality of a life found good in the living of it. (Lewis 1952b [1970, 179]) The constituent experiences thus might have value for their own sake, but also value for their contribution to the value of the whole life of which they are parts. However, Lewis thought that judgements about how a valued experience contributes to the value of a life as a whole are not decisively verifiable or falsifiable. First, any attempt to apprehend a life as a whole and the value of it as experienced goes beyond the present of experience and relies on memory and expectation of past and future experience and their values, and thereby leaves room for error. Second, any attempt to simplify the problem by breaking a whole life into parts and apprehending their value, and then calculating the probability of their contributing to a good life as a whole, also leaves room for error.

The value of an object consists in its potentiality for conducing to intrinsically valuable experiences, and is thus a real connection between objects, persons, and the character of experience, which we can be empirically warranted in accepting on the basis of empirical evidence and the probability of such objects yielding such intrinsically valuable experiences. For Lewis (1946, 432), therefore, no object has intrinsic value. Nonetheless, objects can have inherent value in so far as the good which they produce is disclosable in the presence or observation of the object itself rather than some other object. Lewis (1946, 437–443) contrasted aesthetic value with cognitive and moral value, not by virtue of distinctive characters of their felt goods, but chiefly by distinctive attitudes to experience. The aesthetic attitude is one of disinterested interest in the presented, attentiveness to the given in its own right, as opposed to the cognitive attitude’s concern with prediction and significance for future experience, and the concern on the part of the attitude of action or morality with the pursuit of absent but attainable goods. Thanks to these differences, aesthetic values in experience tend to be of high degree and long lasting and don’t require exclusive possession, and aesthetic values in objects are inherent ones.

Lewis recognized that potentialities are in various ways relative to particular circumstances and manners of observation. There is thus a plurality of judgements of the value of objects, of the various ways in which they can contribute and fail to contribute to intrinsically valuable experiences, and an apparent contradictory nature to incomplete verbal statements of them (e.g., “\(X\) is good”, “\(X\) isn’t good”). For Lewis (1946, 528), issues about the relativity or subjectivity of judgements of the value of objects aren’t issues about the empirical truth of attributions of value to objects, but just issues about whether the conditions under which an object produces directly apprehended value are peculiar to the nature and capacities of a particular person and thus not indicative of the possibility of similar value finding on the part of other persons. Quine (1979) argued that variation within and among individuals and societies, and the variable and open ended character of what they find valuable, means that predicates like “pleases” or “ feels good” don’t support inductive inferences from case to case in the way that “green” or “conducts electricity” do. Skepticism concerning the prospects for empirical truth of attributions of value to objects is thus in order. Lewis, on the other hand, seems to have thought that this contention implies that no one could ever act with empirical warrant to improve his own lot in life or do others any good, an absurdity in his view. Lewis argued at length for the possibility of empirically warranted judgements of the social or impersonal value of objects. The key is that “value to more than one person is to be assessed as if their several experiences were to be included in that of a single person” (Lewis (1946, 550). Rawls (1971, 188–90) criticized Lewis for mistaking impersonality for impartiality, and denied the relevance of Lewis’ account of impersonal value for questions of justice, at least, for which impartiality is key. In the end, nonetheless, the differences between Rawls’ view of the requirements of justice and Rawls’ may seem to diminish.

Lewis (1946, 554) ends AKV by claiming that “valuation is always a matter of empirical knowledge” but “what is right and what is just can never be determined by empirical fact alone”. An action, for Lewis (1955a, 49), is subjectively right, and one we are not to be blamed for doing, if we think it objectively right. An action is objectively right if it is correctly judged on the evidence that its consequences are such as it will be right to bring about, in particular if we are justified in believing its consequences are overall good, for us in the case of the prudentially right, for others as well in the case of the morally right. Justified beliefs aren’t simply beliefs that are probable on the evidence, even all the available evidence, a logical requirement for him that he tends to emphasize in AKV and earlier works. They are in addition “characterized by that objectivity and integrity that summons all pertinent evidence and gives all items their due weight” in conclusions drawn (Lewis 1955a, 79; Lewis 1959 [1969, 35]), in other words, by the character exhibited in the thinking that produces them.

Right doing thus calls for right thinking, but “thinking is itself a way of acting and is indeed the manner of acting that is peculiarly human” (Lewis 1949 [1969, 127]) and “constitutes the possibility” for distinctively human deliberateness in action, corrigible, self-critical, self-governing, and responsible. Humans, in distinction from other animals, Lewis (1959 [1969, 78–9]) says, don’t simply respond to immediate experience, feelings, impulses, and promptings in instinctive ways, but have the capacity to assess, correct, and direct their thought and action in the light of foreseeable results and other reasons, asking themselves “Why?” and adjudicating their answers. We thereby constrain our impulses and immediate promptings, act on reasons and do so by reference to principles that hold for others in the same circumstances. Often we may fail to do so, but we have the capacity to do so, honed by self-improvement and critical input from others, communication with and learning from others, and a vast amount of socialization the practices of which have been honed and improved over generations and represent the social memory of humans (Lewis 1957, 94–5, 103–4). Directing action to foreseeable ends, moreover, requires applying to the present and future something learned from the past, and this is possible, Lewis (1956, [1969, 120]) thinks, only by subsumption of the former in some class with the latter and thus by reference to generalities constituting reasons for thought and action and formulatable as maxims or principles or imperatives. To be subject to imperatives is to find a constraint of action or thought in what is not immediate. “To be rational”, Lewis (1946, 480) says, “means to be capable of constraint by prevision of some future good or ill, to be amenable to the consideration ‘You’ll be sorry if you don’t’”, and subjection to imperatives is simply a feature of acting and living “in human terms” (Lewis 1946, 481).

Right doing and thinking requires acting and thinking for reasons that violate no categorical imperative. Lewis (1946, 480–82, 1955a, Chapter 5, 1952b, 1952c, 1969) outlines categorical rational imperatives of doing and thinking, or versions of one categorical rational imperative in various ways, formulations, and detail. The general idea is laid out briefly in AKV (Lewis (1946, 480–82), but developed at greater length in his later ethical writings. Rationality turns on consistency, and the logical is derivative from the rational. Indeed, consistency of thought is for the sake of and aimed at consistency in action, which in turn derives from consistency in willing, i.e., of purposing and setting a value on. Logical consistency turns on nowhere repudiating that to which we anywhere commit ourselves to in our thought. Consistency in general consists in not accepting now what we are unwilling to commit to elsewhere or later. Consistency in what we think and do requires and is required by conformity to principles, and consistency in what we think and do also consists in not conforming to principles now, conformity to which we are unwilling to commit to elsewhere or later.

So there is a categorical rational imperative of consistency, “ Be consistent in valuation and in thought and action” (Lewis 1946, 481). This isn’t an imperative never to change one’s mind, Lewis (1956 [1969, 122]) notes, but rather never to do so unless your previous belief or the reasons for it were incogent and not governed by consistency, or your present change is made in the light of further evidence and so on different premises. And there is a broader imperative of cogency or basing one beliefs on cogent reasoning from all the relevant evidence (Lewis 1955a, 32; 1952b, 202; 1952c, 213). And there likewise is an imperative of prudence, or seeking the good, indeed the good life, for oneself on the advice of cognition or foresight based on all the relevant evidence, overruling opposed impulsions or inclinations. A proposition denying the imperatives is not self-contradictory, but the act of denying them, Lewis argues, is pragmatically self-contradictory and thus the imperatives cannot be rationally repudiated. Is the person denying the principle consistent in his denial, or taking himself to have good reason for his denial , or seeking the good for himself with his prescription, and so in these various ways contradicting himself? And if he isn’t and doesn’t, why should we take him to be making an assertion and saying something we should take seriously rather than simply making idle noise? “The making of any statement implies, as an act, an import of credible fact” (Lewis 1949 [1969, 133], Lewis 1953 [1969, 168]), but the denial of the imperatives undercuts that import. Lewis’ cited models here are the Cretan who says “All Cretans are liars” or the Cyrenaic who advises “Take no heed for the morrow!” “The ground of the validity of imperatives”, Lewis (1955a, 85–6) sometimes says, lies in our human nature as social, deliberative, self-governing animals, but not as an empirical premise for a conclusion. Imperatives that cannot be rationally repudiated by us are a priori valid, Lewis (1956, in Lewis 1969, 125) sometimes says. However, this is an a priori validity that is different from the way that analytically true propositions are a priori valid.

At the root of these imperatives and others, Lewis (1953 [1969, 167]; 1955a, 89) claims, is the Law of Objectivity: “So conduct your deliberate activities as to conform to the objective actualities cognitively signified by your representational experience and not by reference to any impulsion exercised by the affective quality of experience”, or more simply, govern oneself by the advice of cognition (Lewis (1956 [1969, 167]; 1949 [1969, 135]). This is an imperative that can be avoided only by the incapacity to deliberate and make decisions, by ceasing, whether permanently or temporarily, to be capable of that distinctively human activity, and thus that is valid for all those capable of such activity. The law of objectivity leads us to recognize that the feelings of others have as much poignancy for them as ours do for us, that the reasons for acting and thinking that we have are, when identical in them, as valid for them as ours are for us (Lewis 1949 [1969, 141], 1952c [1970, 225]).

The “socially significant counterpart” (Lewis 1955a, 90–91) of the law of objectivity then is the dictate of respect for other persons as creatures whose feelings and enjoyment have the same poignant factuality for them, as ours do for us, and as creatures who, like ourselves, find it imperative to govern themselves in the light of their knowledge, by decisions which they themselves reach, by reference to their cognition and by reference to values discovered by them, and to constrain present feelings and inclinations accordingly, The first part is a Law of Compassion, of caring in some general way, about other sentient beings, and, minimally, doing them no useless harm, and the second a Law of Moral Equality or equal respect or for ourselves and others as autonomous agents (Lewis 1955a, 91). Politically, the second leads Lewis (1948 [1969, 155]) to the endorsement of equality before the law, freedom of thought, expression, publication, peaceful assembly and individual liberty generally–something like the greatest liberty for each compatible with a like liberty for all under a workable system of law.

Respect for the autonomy of others implies respect for their pursuit of their own good. The problem, nonetheless, remains of reconciling the imperatives of prudence and justice in practice, of reconciling the good for oneself with the good for others in our self-directed, principled, thinking and doing. What aids us is that, through language and civilization, humans remember as a species and not merely as individuals. What we are justified in thinking thereby is that human achievement and social progress require autonomous, self-criticizing and self-governing individuals, and that individual achievement and realization of cherished goods require membership in a social order of individuals co-operating in the pursuit of values cherished in common. The contrast between individual prudence and social justice seems fundamental, Lewis (1952c [1970, 214]) concludes, perhaps rather optimistically, only by forgetting this, and “only short term” thinking makes it seem otherwise.

Bibliography

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