Life

Open a textbook in biology and you’ll find definition of life. It might consist of a list of characteristics that apply to organisms, their parts, their interactions, or their history. Some definitions may go beyond mere descriptions, but provide more controversial theoretical commitments.

Like any basic concept, life is difficult to define. Most people avoid the issue. They may ignore marginal cases, accept fuzzy boundaries, or declare the whole issue beyond their scope. But many people believe their work requires a rigorous demarcation of life. So, a definition may be helpful in new scientific contexts, such as astrobiology, origins of life, or synthetic biology. As such, the nature of life continues to be debated.

This article focuses on the subject matter of biology: life. The first half of this article will focus on attempts to characterize life by both philosophers and scientists. The first section will describe alternative accounts of definitions. Two subsections will cover historical and contemporary definitions. Section 2 covers the recent countertrend in skepticism toward definitions of life. Because the various stakeholders have different goals, the second half will focus on those goals. Sections 3, 4, and 5 cover topics that may need a definition of life: artificial and synthetic life, the origin(s) of life, and the search for life in the Universe. Section 6 covers entities that are much larger or smaller than organisms. Finally, section 7 covers the role life takes in the context of society.

• 1. Definition(s)
  • 1.1 Definitions of Life from Antiquity to Darwin
  • 1.2 Contemporary Definitions of Life
• 2. Definitional Skepticism
• 3. Artificial and Synthetic Life
• 4. Origin(s) of Life
• 5. Search For Life
• 6. The Macro and the Micro Perspectives
• 7. Ethics, Law, and Politics
• 8. Conclusion
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

---

1. Definition(s)

Few things in biology have been more discussed than the definition of life. It is frustrating so little progress has been made on the topic in the face of so much research, theory, and debate. There are many reasons for this failure. Researchers disagree on the level of abstraction, what to include, or even the nature of definitions themselves. This section covers the nature and role of definitions in the context of life.

Philosophers often seek theoretical definitions (also called real, ideal or philosophical definitions). A complete theoretical definition will include individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions. Anything that has those will count as that concept. Theoretical definitions can be fragile as we can reject them with a single imagined counterexample. A classic case is the definition of “bachelors” as “unmarried males.” While it seems straightforward, non-bachelors fit this definition. Consider male dogs, baby boys, widowers, etc. Similarly, any definition of life will tend to exclude living cases or exclude non-living cases:

• Life is organized, but so are geological formations.
• Life processes energy, but so does fire.
• Life evolves using complex biochemistry, but so do prions.
• Life is self-sustaining, but parasites are not.
• Life is at thermodynamic disequilibrium, but so is much else.

Theoretical definitions are too rigid a standard. The real world is far too complex for limited criteria to decide every marginal case.

Non-philosophers are often quite frustrated by the back-and-forth that results from theoretical definitions. Some favor operational (or working) definitions. These definitions work in practice to narrow down the range of phenomena under consideration. This approach is often not considered a kind of definition by philosophers (see Gupta & Mackereth 2023). Operational definitions tend to be philosophically shallow. Consider NASA’s operational definition of life as “a self-sustaining chemical system capable of Darwinian evolution” (Joyce 1994). It might include viruses while excluding mules. The shallowness of an operational definition frustrates theorists, including working scientists.

There are several other conceptions of definition, as well. The nominal (also lexicographer or dictionary) definition is found by analyzing how people use a term. They follow the slow process of cultural acceptance. So, such definitions will not work to guide research on cutting edge or controversial issues.

There are also demonstrative or ostensive definitions. In such cases, we communicate concepts we can convey by sharing observations. “That is red” while pointing at a red block, for instance. Potter Stewart once defined pornography in this manner by saying “I know it when I see it” (Stewart 1964). That phrase has been key to understand this kind of definition ever since. Note that this so-called knowledge is spurious. An internalized cultural category may feel as natural as a natural kind. And people differ in terms of what they think an ostensive definition covers. “That is gavagai” may refer to the redness of a block, the hardness, or any other property in that general direction. With life, scientists disagree on its use even for objects on Earth, like viruses and prions. So ostensive definitions are not viable for understanding life.

Then there are stipulative definitions, which are terms introduced and defined by fiat. Euclidean geometry defines a circle as a round plane figure consisting of infinite points equidistant to a single other point. There are no possible counterexamples to this definition, given the axioms of Euclidean geometry. This approach provides little refuge in the real world. Consider an attempt to define swans as “white birds with long necks.” By stipulation, storks, great egrets, and many cranes would be swans, while Australia’s black swans would not. Such a quick and dirty definition seems to define the category out of hand and only works within accepted axioms or theories. Consider that we could stipulate life as “carbon-based reproducing entities.” Such a definition would rule out silicon-based life by fiat. But this only pushes the debate. It will not convince researchers find the stipulated definition unintuitive.

The 20th century saw some steps away from definitions toward alternative views of concepts. The most popular theories of concepts are prototypes, exemplars, and theories (Machery 2009). Prototype concepts are abstract features shared by most members of a category (Rosch & Mervis 1975; Rosch 1978; Hampton 1979, 2006; Smith 2002). The definitions of life in biology textbooks might be a prototype concept. So, too, are the property cluster natural kinds popular in philosophy of biology (Boyd 1991, 1999, 2010; Diguez 2013; Slater 2015). Exemplars are concepts built around similarity to a particular individual case (Medin & Schaffer 1978, Nosofsky 1986). Both prototypes and exemplar concepts rely on similarity to some paradigm case (Komatsu 1992). The paradigmatic cases for prototypes are an imagined ideal, while those of exemplars are real objects. For similarity-based concepts to work in scientific cases such as life, we need an account of which similarities matter, how much, and why.

In contrast to similarity-based concepts, theory concepts are more nebulous. Theory concepts are as diverse as scientific theories (Carey 1985, Murphy & Medin 1985, Gopnik & Meltzoff 1997). At the core, theory concepts rely on explanations for why the members of a category share certain properties. Some theories of life may include marginal cases of life, such as viruses, prions, or protocells, while others might not.

In sum, there are many potential approaches to definitions. Each kind of definition has different benefits, drawbacks, and standards of success. Many attempts to define life have focused on either operational and philosophical definitions. These two definitions are at cross-purposes. Operational definitions are quick and admit counterexamples. Philosophical definitions tend to be precise and theoretically laden. Some disagreements dissolve after clarifying and understanding the type of definition used. Less work has been done on life not as a definition, but as a concept, such as a paradigm or exemplar, although that is changing (Mariscal & Doolittle 2020).

1.1 Definitions of Life from Antiquity to Darwin

This subsection explores historical definitions of life. There are more in-depth treatments of the matter, to which an interested reader should turn (Bedau & Cleland 2010, Riskin 2015, Mix 2018). Approaches to this issue vary across historians, philosophers, and scientists. That disagreement warrants caution about any individual author’s approach.

We begin with the Greeks. In the Phaedrus, Timeaus, and Republic, Plato divided life into three parts: vegetable life, animal life, and rational life. All living creatures possessed the first in the form of nutrition and reproduction. Animals are also capable of sensation and locomotion. Humans have all three. Plato’s influence in Christian theology may be apparent in spirit if not in detail. In Christian theology, human life is not just rational. Human life is involved an eternal, spiritual soul and an internal, conscious life.

Plato’s student, Aristotle, had a different notion. For Aristotle, living things had an appropriate form, material, and goal-directedness (De Anima, 412a1–416b). Aristotle held life to be a form of self-motion, perpetuation, or self-alteration (Byers 2006). Unlike non-life, living beings have the capacity to resist internal and external perturbations. For Aristotle, that was the essential distinction, other features were accidental. This project for demarcating the essential from the accidental for life has persisted to this day.

Centuries later, Descartes drew a different distinction. Descartes held there was a larger gap between animals and rational agents than between inanimate objects and animals. This was a turn away from medieval approaches, which had taken the gap between vegetables and animals to be broader. For Descartes, animals are analogous to complex clocks and lack the inner or spiritual life central to the human experience (Descartes 2010/1664). Descartes’ category of life neither mapped onto Greek conceptions nor current conceptual frameworks. Scholars who agreed with Descartes were dubbed ‘mechanists.’ Many regard mechanistic thought as continuous with current science, but this is anachronistic. Few current scientists accept the theoretical underpinning central to mechanistic thought.

There were many responses to Descartes throughout the next three centuries. ‘Vitalism,’ the collective label for these responses, was a heterogenous philosophical position. The only common feature was the adherents’ doubt of a mechanistic view of life. Vitalists took the defining features of life as any of immaterial causes, particular arrangements of matter, a special life fluid, a particular end goal, or even mental forces. Students sometimes learn about Friedrich Wöhler’s synthesis of urea from ammonium cyanate. A cartoon version of history has that event as the ultimate death knell of vitalism, though the view persisted for decades afterward. In that story, if biological chemicals can be produced from mere chemistry, then biology is also mere chemistry. Although this was an important step, history rarely has such pivotal moments. Many chemists already had accepted a mechanistic world view and some researchers continued to develop vitalist theories well into the 20th century (Bergson 1959, Driesch 1905/1914).

1.2 Contemporary Definitions of Life

The 20th century saw the mechanist/vitalist divide dissipate. But without a vitalistic understanding, giving an account that distinguishes life from non-life is more difficult. In the past century and a half, hundreds of scientists, philosophers, and others have tried their hand at defining life. Many were motivated by new science and technologies, such as artificial life, synthetic biology, origins of life, and astrobiology. Research in these areas complicate the issue by violating some of the traditional groupings of properties associated with life.

There are many books, articles, and workshops on the nature of life (Pályi et al. 2002, Popa 2004, Bedau & Cleland 2010).

There are perhaps thousands of competing definitions proposed across hundreds of articles. A true survey of that variety would be beyond the scope of this article and beyond your patience as a reader. Nevertheless, some broad categories have been proposed that might offer some insight into current contending definitions. Table 1 summarizes three of the most rigorous attempts this century to categorize definitions of life.

Each of these authors used different approaches to arrive at their categories. Popa 2004 and Trifonov 2011 attempted to reverse engineer the categories from dozens of definitions collected from many dozens of experts, while Malaterre and Chartier 2019 conducted a more extensive, text-mining approach across 30,000 scientific articles selected from journals that published pieces in biology. As one can see, there are areas of rough overlap, but each categorization scheme has its own unique categories as well.

Most of the definitions considered by these authors straddle some of these distinctions and are often ambiguous as to whether they are intended to be theoretical definitions, operational definitions, or something else.

Categorizing involves making choices and reasonable people can disagree about whether each belongs in one or more categories. It is best to see a category scheme (or meta-scheme) as the beginning of a conversation rather than the end. The takeaway from current understandings of the definition of life is that there is no consensus forthcoming. One concern is that these are summaries of attempts to define a category for which there is only loose agreement. Many scientists disagree as to the phenomena a definition of life is intended to unify. Some theories would include prions, viruses, and entities only hypothesized to exist in the origin of life. Others seek a theory that excludes them. Some might accept digital organisms as alive, others would deny this approach. Nor can we ignore the question, as conceptual equivocation has significant costs for research in both time and money (Trombley and Cottenie 2019). Given the diversity described above, one may wish to adopt a definitional pluralism: there are many ways to be alive. For some reason, that approach is not common in the literature.

2. Definitional Skepticism

One may see the previous section as a kind of conceptual tug o’ war. Perhaps that ought to lead us to be skeptical in some way of the project of defining life. In the presence of rampant disagreement between experts, there are several ‘moves’ available (e.g. Kelley 2024):

• Advocacy: find or create a view and advocate for it
• Next-best theory: find the theory that accounts for the ‘most’ phenomena that overlap across accounts (cf. Sterelny 1993, p. 83)
• Stipulate: define a new term of art
• Specify: divide the concept into distinct types and label them
• Polysemy: accept a concept that is vague and slippery among uses
• Skepticism: hold that we may never get an answer and move on with a lessened project (c.f. Cleland 2019).
• Eliminativism: disregard the concept of life altogether and reformulate the issue (e.g. Jabr 2013)

Most researchers agree there is a distinction between life and non-life. It is often understood as a difference in kind rather than one of degree. Furthermore, most accept that life is a natural kind, rather than a human concept. That said, a recent theme has been to express skepticism of life definitions as a goal. The literature on the definition of life is vast, repetitive, and utterly inconclusive. Philosophers disagree about the source of the lack of consensus. They cite unstated assumptions in either the definer’s approach or the question itself. Many scientists are less skeptical of the goal of defining life, albeit more resistant to engaging in the philosophical debate.

Some argue that any definition of life presumes a theory of life (Cleland and Chyba 2002, Benner 2010, Cleland 2019). Though unstated, this view is akin to the theory-theory of concepts, described in section 1. a common analogy is to early chemical theory. According to this analogy, early alchemists likened the alchemists’ Aqua regia (“royal water”) and Aqua fortis (“strong water”). Development of atomic theory revealed, Cleland argues, that the true nature of water was H₂O, while the other ‘waters’ were HNO₃ + 3 HCl and HNO₃, respectively. Cleland advocates avoiding definitions altogether, fearing they will blind us to new instances of life, and instead opts for tentative criteria, which she believes avoid the implicit dogma of even operational definitions.

Other authors have pointed out that the explanandum of life is itself up for debate (Tsokolov 2009, Mix 2020, Parke 2020). According to Emily Parke, some accept life as applying to individuals, whereas other definitions apply to collectives first (including entire planets) and individuals derivatively. Most believe life is some kind of entity rather than some kind of relation or process (but see Nicholson and Dupré 2018). Parke also points out that some definitions seek a material basis, perhaps limiting life’s substrate to the biochemistry we know on Earth, while others are functional. Sagan worried about biochemical definitions because they were prone to ‘Earth Chauvinism’ for privileging our own biochemistry (1970). Other authors take our biochemistry to be justified as universal (Pace 2001, Benner et al. 2004, but see Bains et al. 2024). Finally, Parke distinguishes between those that seek clean boundaries and those that accept the possibility of a continuum of ‘lifelikeness.’

Other authors have advocated a kind of quietism about definitions, maintaining that folk concepts need not match up with scientific ones (Machery 2011), any definitions would not change scientific practice (Szostak 2012), advocated a radical conceptual rethinking (Mariscal & Doolittle 2020), or even denied the distinction between life & non-life (Jabr 2013).

This last position of eliminativism could be expanded as it helps illustrate all other life skeptical positions. Cowie 2009 classifies eliminativist goals as either linguistic or ontological. Ontological eliminativists don’t believe the objects they are eliminating exist. We’re all eliminativists about something, perhaps ghosts or fairies. Linguistic/conceptual eliminativists, on the other hand are suspicious of theoretical terms or concepts, what Ramsey 2020 calls ‘category dissolution’ or ‘conceptual fragmentation.’ In essence, it’s not that there aren’t living things, it’s just that the category life is heterogeneous rather than a natural kind. According to Cowie, one can deny that anything matching our theoretical definition of life exists in the world while still accepting it as a useful fiction. One may also think scientific theories about life are fruitless or that the term is too vague and confused to be useful, without doubting life exists. If we accept any of these alternatives, we should perhaps avoid ever using the term ‘life’ in isolation and instead reference Metabolic Life and Evolutionary Life and all the other conceptions.

At play in these various forms of skepticism are several underlying assumptions. Among other disagreements, researchers disagree about what life is, whether it is a natural kind with an essence or a human construct; they disagree as to the purpose of defining life if it will not change scientific practice; and they disagree as to the features of life that are relevant and the ones that are mere consequences. When researchers hold unstated assumptions such as these, they are liable to mistake the source of their disagreement.

3. Artificial and Synthetic Life

The rest of this article will focus on uses of the various life concepts. The concept of life is central to several scientific and societal purposes. Several definitions described above originated among theorists working on these applied issues. This section focuses on artificial and synthetic life.

In principle, most contemporary scientists and philosophers believe life can be created. But researchers disagree as to how that would work. In functional approaches, recreating the formal organization of organisms may be enough. Complexly configured robots (“hardware”) or computer programs (“software”) might qualify. This view is known as Strong Artificial Life (Strong A-Life for short). Strong A-Life has received much of the same pushback as the Strong Artificial Intelligence approach before it (Sober 1991, Boden 1999, Brooks 2001). Those who reject Strong A-Life hold that functional approaches miss the essential features of biology. Epistemic objections hold that we lack the relevant biological knowledge to recreate it in a digital framework. Most of the objections to Strong A-Life have been ontological. Such objections hold that representations cannot be equivalent to what they represent or that life requires chemical embodiment. An ontological objection to Strong A-Life rules it impossible by fiat.

Weak A-Life approaches, on the other hand, don’t presume the ontological equivalence of structurally similar circuits and cells. Instead, proponents suggest the more modest goal of developing a deeper understanding of life as we know it by exploring the effects of various parameters in simulations, placing life in a broader context of possible biology (Langton 1989, 1995). For example, in the Terra program, software was pitted against other software for processing power (Ray 1993). Unexpected by the researchers at the time, software parasitism evolved: software would co-opt the reproductive processing of other software. Policing mechanisms also evolved, leading to an arms race between free-riders and the software trying to stop them.

Whether one accepts the strong or weak interpretation of A-Life, these in silico approaches are cheaper than equivalent work done in real organisms. They also offer possibilities that are not available in ordinary biology, such as programming alternative parameters to take the place of laws of nature and exploring relationships across deep time and space.

Another approach worth highlighting is that of synthetic life (“wetware”). Synthetic life can also address some questions of A-Life, while allowing for a finer grain of realism. Synthetic life approaches have explored creating self-replication (Lincoln & Joyce 2009), minimal genomes (Koonin 2000, Hutchinson et al. 2016), chemical evolution (Gromski et al. 2020), synthetic living machines or ‘xenobots’ (Raman 2024), a ‘xenobiology’ with different genetic bases (Aparicio 2025), and other projects. Artificial intelligence approaches have catalyzed this research, producing what some researchers call a looming deluge (Groff-Vindman et al. 2025). Not all synthetic biology is in the business of investigating life as it could be, as not all computer programming is A-Life. Still, the tools developed by both can be illuminating. By exploring possibilities, scientists can discover hidden relationships, revealing which aspects of life are more or less plausible than expected.

4. Origin(s) of Life

The nature of life is inextricable from its origin. Ancient and modern thinkers accepted that life often arose spontaneously from non-life. Two centuries of experiments and debates overturned this view. Louis Pasteur’s abiogenesis experiments illustrated that life does not typically come from non-life. That insight, however, made Life’s origin one of the biggest and most important puzzles in science.

Darwin said little about the problem. His one speculation came in a letter to his friend Joseph Hooker. Darwin confided that he imagined life originating in “some warm little pond” (see Other Internet Resources below; and Peretó et al. 2009). Work on the subject was sparse until the 1920s. In the interbellum period,Alexander Oparin and J.B.S. Haldane separately proposed hypotheses for life’s origin (Haldane 1929; Oparin 2010/1936). As a graduate student in the 1950s, Stanley Miller tested the proposal, discovering dozens of amino acids in the mixture (1953). Since then, the field of origins-of-life studies has expanded dramatically.

Our earliest reliable records of this planet, some 3.5 billion years ago, contain evidence of microbial fossils. These include shapes distinct of current prokaryotes, as well as carbon-ratios distinctive to life as we know it (Schopf 1993, Schopf et al. 2017). Analyses have pushed our confidence in life’s earlier origin further back(Rodriguez et al. 2024). In short, as soon as Earth was not molten, it was filled with life (Pearce et al. 2018, Lineweaver 2020). How life started and why it started so quickly remains one of the most pressing open questions in science.

There are many open philosophical issues in origins of life research. The origin of life sounds like one question, but it is not. Origins-of-life researchers may research how life could have originated, how it did originate (Scharf et al. 2015, Mariscal et al. 2019). They may focus on historical adequacy, natural explanations, or similarity to life as-we-know-it (Malaterre et al. 2022). Some steps in the process could have been chancy, others could have been contingent, still others could have been the only way life ever originates anywhere in the Universe.

There are several broad approaches to investigating the origin of life. “Bottom-Up” approaches begin with pre-biotic chemistry and explore how it could withstand stressors in order for lifelike entities to form and evolve. At present, there are many unsolved problems, most notably that most energetically favorable interactions would consume the proto-life forms involved. Scientists have attempted to ease the problem by relaxing assumptions: perhaps the environment provided our first boundaries (Koonin 2009), or perhaps it provided proto-genetic material (Mathis et al. 2017), all of this could have occurred in a viscous solvent instead of a cell (He et al. 2017), or on a surface (Wächtershäuser 1988), or using a variety of entities that eventually became encapsulated (Eigen & Schuster 1977). Nevertheless, the gulf between the pre-biotic chemistry and the simplest life forms is still huge and any number of explanations only account for a tiny portion of the conceptual distance.

Another approach, “Top-Down,” uses current taxa to infer the nature and timing of the origin of life on Earth. To do so, we take current examples of life on Earth and trace their ancestry, by comparing the nearly hundred shared genes associated with biological translation (Koonin 2011). All life shares a last universal common ancestor, “LUCA” for short. There may have been several origins of life, but our evidence is insufficient to distinguish this scenario from a single origin. Nevertheless, at least one origin in Earth’s pre-biotic conditions led to the existence of LUCA. This is an important constraint upon theorizing about the origin of life. LUCA was but one creature in a larger population and existed long after the origin of the first organism. There are also a variety of concerns with respect to LUCA: whether it was simple or complex (Mariscal & Doolittle 2015); whether it had a membrane that resembled any of the current membranes (Koonin 2011); whether the genes it contained were ancestors of our own genes or subsequently acquired (Doolittle & Brown 1994, Woese & Fox 1977; Woese 1998); whether its genome was made of DNA (Forterre 2006a), whether its metabolism was a niche for other microbes or (Moody et al. 2024); and where and when it lived.

The gap between Top-Down and Bottom-Up approaches is huge. There were untold generations passed between pre-biotic chemistry and LUCA. We may never be able to solve Life’s origin, but each step brings us closer to understanding the trajectory.

5. Search For Life

Even the most pessimistic analyses of the likelihood of life suggests life on Earth is not unique (Frank & Sullivan 2016). Many scientists take that as a good reason to search for life elsewhere in the Universe. The current search for life elsewhere focuses on two extremes: chemical byproducts of life and technological signals of intelligent life. The biology of alien populations might be interesting, but they are hard to study from a distance. Thus, we search for biosignatures that might identify life from a great distance. We’ll take each in turn.

Biosignatures, as the name implies, are markers of life. Chemical biosignatures are compounds rarely produced by mere chemistry. Biosignatures imply a material conception of life, likely in the form of biochemistry, metabolism, or thermodynamics. There have been many attempts to detect biosignatures, most often on Mars. These approaches include experiments done on planetary surfaces, observations from Earth or low-earth orbit, and study of meteors and other debris from nearby planetary bodies.

Satellite or telescope observations of other planets have been used to search for gasses outside of thermodynamic equilibrium. Methane has been sporadically detected on Mars since 2004 (Formisano et al. 2004, Webster et al. 2018) with an accompanying claim of formaldehyde detection (Peplow 2005). The James Webb Space Telescope can image exoplanets at resolutions allowing the detection of gas biomarkers in the atmospheres of exoplanets (Loeb & Maoz 2013, Seager et al. 2025). Exoplanets will continue to be a source of attention, as putative biosignatures continue to be debated (e.g. Madhusudhan et al. 2025). A biosignature is a negative proof: one must rule out all abiotic possibilities. As such, it will always remain open whether we have not considered every potential reaction and circumstance that allows non-living processes to produce molecules typical of life (Malaterre et al. 2023).

By contrast, there have been scarce attempts to detect chemical life while on the surface of another planet. In 1975, NASA sent the Viking landers to Mars, tasked with a variety of scientific experiments including some that were purported to detect life if it was present. One, the Labeled Release Experiment, did, but its results were inconsistent with the other on-board experiments, so the result was deemed inconclusive (Levin & Straat 1976, Ezell & Ezell 1984). The current Perseverence rover on Mars is able to assess certain biosignatures and upcoming missions by NASA, the Chinese National Space Administration, and the Japanese Aerospace Exploration Agency all seek to determine whether Mars has evidence of past or current life.

It is not obvious that life on Mars would be a separate origin than life on Earth, as the two planets exchange tons of rocks each year and it is at least theoretically possible that life could have formed on one planet and been subsequently transferred to the other (McKay 2010). Since Mars is a smaller body than Earth, it coalesced before Earth and thus it is conceivable that life might have formed there first, although this is a marginal view in the astrobiology community. Meteorites from Mars and other planetary bodies have also been the source of purported biosignatures. The Martian meteorite ALH84001 was instrumental in forming the science of astrobiology in 1996, after NASA scientists discovered bacteria-like structures (McKay et al. 1996). Subsequent meteorites have also garnered scientific interest (e.g. White et al. 2014).

The other major attempt to search for life, that of searching for intelligence, more readily captures the imagination. A famous instance is Percival Lowell’s drawings of Martian canals in the 1890s. Influenced by the mid-1800s observations of apparent channels crisscrossing Mars, Lowell drew a series of canals based on his observations. Science fiction soon picked up the observation and conjectured a dying civilization, hoping to squeeze water out of the last bits of remaining ice in the Martian poles (Wells 1898).

The early 20th century saw increased interest in detecting radio signals from Outer Space. This interest accelerated after the launch of Sputnik in 1957. SETI research has not been publicly funded since 1994, but private and public donors, as well as academic and lay researchers have kept the program going since. There are many technical challenges to the search: space is unimaginably huge, signals are weak, possibilities of interstellar communication are myriad, and our searches can only cover an insignificant portion of the task. Still, there is continued interest in discovering technosignatures and increasingly precise ways of theorizing and observing them (Haqq-Misra 2024).

More controversially, many dozens of messages have been sent into Outer Space since 1974. A few have been in the form of physical objects aboard spacecraft, but most have been radio signals aimed at promising stars or star clusters. sometimes called Active SETI or METI (Messaging Extraterrestrial Intelligence). Although the practice continues due to its low cost and relative ease, many philosophers, scientists, and policy experts have come out against the practice due to the risk of broadcasting our presence to potentially hostile forces on behalf of future generations that cannot consent (Smith 2020).

6. The Macro and the Micro Perspectives

Scientists are more concerned about philosophical questions when they become aware of scientific limitations or their conceptual choices. Scientists who study deep time, deep space, abstract issues, or questions of ethics are often aware of the philosophical choices that influence their research. Every step from identifying research questions to interpretation of data to application is fraught (Douglas 2000). This section goes through other scientific contexts in which a concept of life is relevant below and above the organism level.

There are several biological entities for which it is an open question as to whether they are alive. Viruses, for example, are units of genetic material encased in a protein coat. It is unknown whether all viruses share common ancestor (Koonin et al. 2006, Moreira and López Garcia 2009). We also do not know how they originated, be it escaped transposable elements, reduced cells, or some ancestral third option (Forterre 2006b). The status of viruses as living is mired with controversy, with some people holding virons to be alive, others believing them not to be, and a third camp has them as living only in the context of an infected cell, but a mere ‘seed’ otherwise (Forterre 2010).

There are other entities in the “twilight zone of microbiology.” These include transposable elements, viroids, unculturable (but existing) microbes, organisms in vegetative states, and prions (Postgate 1999). The problems facing each of these are similar: they have some, but not all properties associated with life. For example, prions are protein products of life that can fold other prions in a way that allows for cumulative evolution (Li et al. 2010). They are rarely included in the category ‘life’ due to their inactivity in most settings and rather simple nature.

If there is a twilight zone of microbiology, there is also a twilight zone of ecology. Organisms form populations, species, lineages, clades, and ecosystems. The status of each of these is an open question, but they have many of the same features associated with life as described above. Perhaps the strongest case can be made for eusocial insects, such as some ants, bees, wasps, and termites. In several species, there are rigid distinctions between the castes that reproduce and those that do not, with many of the latter serving the role of caring for the young (Hölldobler & Wilson 2009). One might note that entities above the organism level are as a rule less integrated and connected than the organisms that comprise them. From the perspective of every item in the biological hierarchy, its parts are much more homogenous than it is. Our cells seem much more integrated and self-contained than our bodies. So, too, are individual insects more self-contained than the colonies to which they belong.

Most controversial has been the case of Gaia. Gaia is a term from Greek mythology; she is a personification of the planet Earth. In 1979, James Lovelock, revived the concept in his book, Gaia: A New Look at Life on Earth. In his view, the Earth-wide set of interlocking ecosystems could be viewed as a single entity. One insight of Lovelock’s was already mentioned in the previous section: planet-wide interactions are the scale that matters in detecting life elsewhere. Lovelock’s book sparked controversy centered around the plausibility of his model of the Earth as a self-regulating homeostatic system. In the view of many at the time, it was an inaccurate description: Earth could not evolve in principle, and the subsequent ontological move of granting Earth the status of life was unmotivated (Doolittle 1981). Recent attempts to revitalize the notion of Gaia on a more theoretic footing involve both abiotic and biotic regulatory mechanisms and natural selection acting at the level of clades (Lenton et al. 2018, Doolittle 2025). Regardless of current attempts at a theoretical justification, the thought of Earth as a living entity motivated many in the environmental movement and the idea remains a common reference.

7. Ethics, Law, and Politics

The term ‘life’ is important outside of science. Often, the focus is the beginning or end of individual lives. The start of an individual life has been the source of contraception and abortion discussions (Noonan 1967, Dellapenna 1978). The end of individual lives was also a heated debate in the 20th century as new technologies were able to keep human bodies alive long after they would have died in nature (DeGrazia 2016). It remains controversial in cases of euthanasia, or voluntary death to relieve pain and suffering.

We should begin by distinguishing between life and other phenomena that are often conflated with it. In public discourse, the existence of life is often conflated with its value. But we can distinguish between life and sentience, personhood, and moral considerability. It’s unclear how much metaphysical, epistemic, or moral weight the category of life has independent of other properties. Although many people seem to imply that life brings with it a kind of moral considerability, practice belies this. Most humans don’t mind killing bacteria for the sake of cleanliness and many eat or wear the flesh of animals. So, in many discussions, life is only valuable when it is the vehicle for other nebulous properties that confer value like sentience, personhood, moral considerability, or even immaterial souls.

Attributing moral worth to non-living entities is still a minority view in environmental or comparative philosophy (but see Leopold 1949, Basl 2019). Thus, a starting position might be that life is a prerequisite for sentience and sentience is a prerequisite for moral considerability (Birch 2024). Attribution of life relies on a concept of life, which means both are contested.

If any living entities have a distinct moral or ontological status, most philosophers accept that humans are among them (Rolston 1975, Goodpaster 1978). In these contexts, it matters when individual humans come into being and acquire such a status in their own right, be it conception, birth, or some time period in between. Unfortunately, developmental biology does not provide an uncontroversial starting point for when ‘life’ begins (Maienschein 2014). Still, policy makers and medical practitioners draw lines with respect to the possibility of self-sustained life, sentience, or other features. There is still a pro-life/pro-choice split in cultural politics, which is somewhat lessened in European countries (Corbella 2020). When broken down into issues, most people are pro-choice with respect to cases of birth defects, women’s health, or cases of rape. Still, only about 15 percent of respondents are consistently pro-life across all scenarios (Osborne et al. 2022). There are equivalent, but less tendentious analogues in the contexts of euthanasia, the death penalty, war, and the prevention of death and disease. In these debates, both ethical and metaphysical commitments matter.

Questions of life are often raised by new technologies. In the abortion discussion above, for example, new techniques to end pregnancies, from birth control to abortion procedures, as well as new medical technologies facilitating premature deliveries made the topic more contentious. Current bioethics research in artificial wombs complicates many of the traditional issues with abortion (Kendal 2025). Even if a fetus were able to be brought to term artificially, the process would still require a medical treatment and genetic parenthood, not to mention the costs of childrearing and questions of gestational choice (Charles 2024).

Other technological innovations also raise questions about life. One such area is that of transhumanism (c.f. More and Vita-More 2013). Transhumanism is the movement aimed toward the use of technology for the human enhancement of social, psychological, and physical lives. These can range from prosthetics to implants or from pharmaceuticals to mental ‘uploading.’ There are bioconservatives, who argue against transhumanism for practical, moral, or aesthetic reasons. There are also posthumanists, who look forward to a world in which humans are replaced or eliminated by subsequent artificial intelligence. The debate over whether such posthumans might be ‘alive’ is similar in structure to the artificial life discussion in section 3. Bioconservatives also argue against this view. Among the topics in these debates are whether a particular technology counts as therapy or enhancement, whether the risks of alteration outweigh the benefits, whether certain goals of transhumanism are even possible, and which alterations will affect the moral or ontological status of the people that receive them.

That life is a source of ethical, legal, and political controversy is to be expected. It is beyond the scope of this article to adjudicate these debates. Still, advocates ought to be aware of the deep vagueness and disagreement about life within philosophy and biology. There is minimal consensus with respect to what life is, what an individual living organism is, when individual lives begin or end, and what features of life ground moral considerability. One ought not appeal to biology as a ground for their moral views, lest they wish their views to be vague and inconclusive.

8. Conclusion

Although the conceptual terrain of life concepts is well covered, there is no accepted view of it. Given the disciplinary backgrounds, explanatory values, and theoretical commitments of the stakeholders involved, this is unlikely to change. Still, a wide range of practices rely on competing conceptions of life. As described above, these include artificial life, origins-of-life research, the search for life, and ethics, and politics.

Future scientific discoveries or inventions may break this impasse.. Consider the development of atomic theory, as discussed in section 2. Atomic theory created new divisions that scientists accepted as more real than the categories of the ancients or alchemists. With this conceptual fragmentation, scientists discarded old categories and accepted new ones. One can imagine something similar happening in the case of life. Many discoveries might show a clear cluster of how complex, lifelike entities can form from prebiotic chemistry. These could win over the majority of the scientific and philosophical community (e.g. Weber 2007, 2010).

Conversely, scientific communities could simply decide based on shared values or explanatory goals. The example of death may be illustrative. After decades of debate, physicians did not make a decision, not a discovery. Physicians concluded the irreversibility of death was the most important property for their purposes. They adopted the concept of whole-brain death as their operational criterion (DeGrazia 2016). The facts on the ground did not change, but the shared understanding did.

Finally, life could be accepted as a polysemous concept with each definitional cluster applying to a subset of the whole. These might include biochemical life, evolutionary life, metabolic life, etc. Researchers may rely on context, accept miscommunication, or stipulate the kind of life they mean. The example of planets, discussed in Brusse 2016 may help make this point. There was always a huge diversity within the category planet, which included the Sun and Moon until the Renaissance. In the early 1800s, asteroids were discovered. At first, they were considered planets. They were demoted to ‘minor’ planets a few decades later, then simply ‘asteroids’ after the 1950s. Pluto was discovered in 1930, recognized as the smallest planet by the 1970s. Then, from 1992 until 2006, many objects similar to Pluto were discovered. Finally, astronomers redefined the term ‘planet.’ Now a scientific ‘planet’ covers two distinct, but interesting categories: typical planets and dwarf planets. Similarly, perhaps some of the categories described in section 1.2 will form the basis of accepted sub-categories of life.

It is still an open question as to how long the current situation will persist. We may be days or decades away from a discovery or decision that forces a scientific reckoning. For now, the debate continues.

Bibliography

• Aparicio, Alberto, 2025, “Accept No Limits: Biocontainment and the Construction of a Safer Space for Experimentation in Xenobiology as a Legacy of Asilomar,” BioSocieties, 20(1): 49–72.
• Aristotle, De Anima (selections), in M.A. Bedau & C.E. Cleland (eds.), The Nature of Life: Classical and Contemporary Perspectives from Philosophy and Science, New York: Cambridge University Press, 2010, pp. 9–14.
• Bains, William, Petkowski, Janusz J. and Seager, Sara, 2024, “Alternative Solvents for Life: Framework for Evaluation, Current Status, and Future Research,” Astrobiology, 24(12): 1231–1256.
• Basl, John, 2019, The Death of the Ethic of Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Bedau, Mark A., and Carol E. Cleland (eds.), 2010, The Nature of Life: Classical and Contemporary Perspectives from Philosophy and Science, New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Benner, Steven Albert, 2010, “Defining life,” Astrobiology, 10(10): 1021–1030. doi:10.1089/ast.2010.0524
• Bergson, Henri, 1907 [1959], L’évolution créatrice, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
• Birch, Jonathan, 2024, The Edge of Sentience: Risk and Precaution in Humans, Other Animals, and AI, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Boden, Margaret Ann, 1999, “Is metabolism necessary?” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 50(2): 231–248. doi: 10.1093/bjps/50.2.231
• Boyd, Richard, 1991, “Realism, Anti-Foundationalism and the Enthusiasm for Natural Kinds,” Philosophical Studies, 61(1–2): 127–148.
• –––, 1999, “Homeostasis, species, and higher taxa,” in R. Wilson (ed.), Species: New Interdisciplinary Essays, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, pp. 141–185.
• –––, 2010, “Homeostasis, Higher Taxa, and Monophyly,” Philosophy of Science, 77(5): 686–701.
• Brooks, Rodney, 2001, “The relationship between matter and life,” Nature, 409(6818): 409–411
• Brusse, Carl, 2016, “Planets, pluralism, and conceptual lineage,” Studies in History and Philosophy of Science Part B: Studies in History and Philosophy of Modern Physics, 53: 93–106.
• Byers, Sarah, 2006, “Life as ‘Self-Motion’: Descartes and ‘the Aristotelians’ on the Soul as the Life of the Body,” The Review of Metaphysics, 59(3): 723–755.
• Carey, Susan E., 1985, Conceptual Change in Childhood, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• –––, 1988, “Conceptual differences between children and adults,” Mind & Language, 3: 167–181.
• Charles, Sonya, 2024, “At What Price? Abortion versus Artificial Womb,” IJFAB: International Journal of Feminist Approaches to Bioethics, 17(2): 123–141.
• Cleland, Carol E., 2019, The Quest for a Universal Theory of Life: Searching for Life as we Don’t Know It (Vol. 11), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Cleland, Carol E. and Christopher F. Chyba, 2002, “Defining ‘life,’” Origins of Life and Evolution of the Biosphere, 32(40): 387–393.
• Corbella, Mercedes, 2020, “Globally, seven in ten adults favor allowing abortion,” IPSOS, published online 17 August 2020.
• Cowie, Fiona, 2009, “Why isn’t Stich an Eliminativist?” in D. Murphy and M. Bishop (eds.), Stich: And his Critics, Chichester: Blackwell Publishing, pp. 74–100.
• DeGrazia, David, “The Definition of Death,”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2017 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/spr2017/entries/death-definition/>.
• Dellapenna, Joseph W., 1978, “The History of Abortion: Technology, Morality, and Law.” University of Pittsburgh Law Review, 40: 359–428.
• Descartes, René, 1664 [2010], “Treatise on Man,” in M.A. Bedau and C.E. Cleland (eds.), The Nature of Life: Classical and Contemporary Perspectives from Philosophy and Science, New York, N.Y.: Cambridge University Press, pp. 15–20; original translation by J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff, and D. Murdoch, The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press; original work published in 1664.
• Diguez, Antonio, 2013, “Life as a homeostatic property cluster,” Biological Theory, 7(2): 180–186.
• Doolittle, W. Ford, 1981, “Is Nature Really Motherly?” CoEvolution Quarterly, 29: 58–63.
• –––, 2025, “Darwinizing Gaia: Conceptual Approaches,” Philosophical Transactions B, 380(1931): 20240089.
• Doolittle, W. Ford and James R. Brown, 1994, “Tempo, Mode, the Progenote, and the Universal Root,” Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences, 91(15): 6721–6728.
• Douglas, Heather, 2000, “Inductive Risk and Values in Science,” Philosophy of science, 67(4): 559–579.
• Driesch, Hans, 1905 [1914], The History & Theory of Vitalism, C.K. Ogden (trans.), London: Macmillan and Co., Limited.
• Eigen, Manfred and Peter Schuster, 1977, “A Principle of Natural Self-Organization,” Naturwissenschaften, 63(11): 541–565.
• Ezell, Edward Clinton and Linda Neuman Ezell, 1984, On Mars: Exploration of the Red Planet, 1958–1978 (NASA History Series: Volume 4212), Washington, DC: National Aeronautics and Space Administration.
• Fields, Chris and Levin, Michael, 2025, “Life, its Origin, and its Distribution: A Perspective from the Conway-Kochen Theorem and the Free Energy Principle,” Communicative & Integrative Biology, 18(1): 2466017.
• Formisano, Vittorio, Sushil Atreya, Thérèse Encrenaz, Nikolai Ignatiev, and Marco Giuranna, 2004, “Detection of methane in the atmosphere of Mars,” Science, 306(5702): 1758–1761.
• Forterre, Patrick, 2006a, “Three RNA cells for ribosomal lineages and three DNA viruses to replicate their genomes: a hypothesis for the origin of cellular domain,” Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences, 103(10): 3669–3674.
• –––, 2006b, “The origin of viruses and their possible roles in major evolutionary transitions,” Virus Research, 117(1): 5–16.
• –––, 2010, “Defining Life: the Virus Viewpoint,” Origins of Life and Evolution of Biospheres, 40(2): 151–160.
• Frank, Adam and Woody T. Sullivan III, 2016, “A new empirical constraint on the prevalence of technological species in the universe,” Astrobiology, 16(5): 359–362.
• Goodpaster, Kenneth E., 1978, “On being morally considerable,” The Journal of Philosophy, 75(6): 308–325.
• Gopnik, Alison, and Andrew N. Meltzoff, 1997, Words, Thoughts, and Theories, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Groff-Vindman, Cindy S., Trump, Benjamin D., Cummings, Christopher L., Smith, Madison, Titus, Alexander J., Oye, Ken, Prado, Valentina, Turmus, Eyup, & Linkov, Igor, 2025, “The Convergence of AI and Synthetic Biology: the Looming Deluge,” NPJ Biomedical Innovations, 2(1): 20.
• Gromski, Piotr S., Granda, Jaroslaw M. and Cronin, Leroy, 2020, “Universal chemical synthesis and discovery with ‘the chemputer,’” Trends in Chemistry, 2(1): 4–12.
• Gupta, Anil and Mackereth, Stephen“Definitions,”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2023 Edition), E.N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/fall2023/entries/definitions/>.
• Haldane, John Burdon Sanderson, 1929, “The Origin of Life,” Rationalist Annual, 148: 3–10.
• Hampton, James A., 1979, “Polymorphous concepts in semantic memory,” Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior, 18: 441–461.
• –––, 2006, “Concepts as prototypes,” in B.H. Ross (ed.), The Psychology of Learning and Motivation: Advances in Research and Theory (Volume 46), New York: Academic Press, pp. 79–113.
• Haqq-Misra, Jacob, 2024, “Technosignatures and Astrobiology,” in Oxford Research Encyclopedia of Planetary Science, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acrefore/9780190647926.013.275
• He, Christine, Isaac Gállego, Brandon Laughlin, Martha A. Grover, and Nicholas V. Hud, 2017, “A Viscous Solvent Enables Information Transfer from Gene-Length Nucleic Acids in a Model Prebiotic Replication Cycle,” Nature Chemistry, 9(4): 318–324.
• Hölldobler, Bert and Wilson, Edward O., 2009, The Superorganism: the Beauty, Elegance, and Strangeness of Insect Societies, New York: W.W. Norton & Company.
• Hutchison, Clyde A., Ray-Yuan Chuang, Vladimir N. Noskov, Nacyra Assad-Garcia, Thomas J. Deerinck, Mark H. Ellisman, John Gill, Krishna Kannan, Bogumil J. Karas, Li Ma, James F. Pelletier, Zhi-Qing Qi, R. Alexander Richter, Elizabeth A. Strychalski, Lijie Sun, Yo Suzuki, Billyana Tsvetanova, Kim S. Wise, Hamilton O. Smith, John I. Glass, Chuck Merryman, Daniel G. Gibson, J. Craig Venter, 2016, “Design and synthesis of a minimal bacterial genome,” Science, 351(6280). doi:10.1126/science.aad6253
• Jabr, Ferris, 2013, “Why Life Does Not Really Exist,” Scientific American, published 02 December 2013 [Jabr 2013 available online
• Joyce, Gerard F., 1994, forward, in D. W. Deamer, G. R. Fleischaker (eds.), Origins of Life: the Central Concepts, Boston: Jones & Bartlett, pp. xi–xii.
• Kelley, David, 2024, “Philosophy Moves,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 102(3): 537–550.
• Kendal, E., 2025, Science Fiction and the Ethics of Artificial Wombs: Reproductive Futures, London: Bloomsbury Publishing.
• Komatsu, Lloyd K., 1992, “Recent Views of Conceptual Structure,” Psychological Bulletin, 112: 500–526.
• Koonin, Eugene V., 2000, “How Many Genes can Make a Cell: the Minimal-Gene-Set Concept,” Annual Review of Genomics and Human Genetics, 1(1): 99–116.
• –––, 2009, “On the Origin of Cells and Viruses: Primordial Virus World Scenario,” Annals of the New York Academy of Sciences, 1178(1): 47–64.
• –––, 2011, The Logic of Chance: the Nature and Origin of Biological Evolution, New Jersey: FT press.
• Koonin, Eugene V., Tatiana G. Senkevich, and Valerian V. Dolja, 2006, “The Ancient Virus World and Evolution of cells,” Biology Direct, 1(1): 1–27.
• Langton, Christopher G., 1989, “Artificial life,” in C.G. Langton (ed.), Artificial life (Santa Fe Institute Studies in the Sciences of Complexity: Proceedings Volume IV), Redwood City, Calif.: Addison-Wesley, pp. 1–47.
• –––, 1995, Artificial Life: An Overview, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Lenton, Timothy M., Stuart J. Daines, James G. Dyke, Arwen E. Nicholson, David M. Wilkinson, and Hywel T.P. Williams, 2018, “Selection for Gaia Across Multiple Scales,” Trends in Ecology & Evolution, 33(8): 633–645.
• Leopold, Aldo, 1949, A Sand County Almanac, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Levin, Gilbert V. and Patricia Ann Straat, 1976, “Viking labeled release biology experiment: interim results,” Science, 194(4271): 1322–1329.
• Li, Jiali, Shawn Browning, Sukhvir P. Mahal, Anja M. Oelschlegel, and Charles Weissmann, 2010, “Darwinian evolution of prions in cell culture,” Science, 327(5967): 869–872.
• Lincoln, Tracey A. and Joyce, Gerald F., 2009, “Self-sustained replication of an RNA enzyme,” Science, 323(5918): 1229–1232.
• Lineweaver, Charley H., 2020, “What Do the DPANN Archaea and the CPR Bacteria Tell Us about the Last Universal Common Ancestors?” in J. Seckbach and H. Stan-Lotter (eds.), Extremophiles as Astrobiological Models, London: Wiley, pp.359–367.
• Loeb, Abraham and Dan Maoz, 2013, “Detecting Biomarkers in Habitable-Zone Earths Transiting White Dwarfs,” Monthly Notices of the Royal Astronomical Society: Letters, 432(1): L11–L15.
• Lovelock, James E., 2000, Gaia: A New Look at Life on Earth, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Machery, Edouard, 2009, Doing without Concepts, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• –––, 2011, “Why I Stopped Worrying About the Definition of Life… and Why you Should as Well,” Synthese, 185(1): 145–164. doi: 10.1007/s11229-011-9880-1
• Madhusudhan, Nikku, Constantinou, Savvas, Holmberg, Måns, Sarkar, Subhajit, Piette, Anjali A., & Moses, Julianne I., 2025, “New Constraints on DMS and DMDS in the Atmosphere of K2–18 b from JWST MIRI,” The Astrophysical Journal Letters, 983(2): L40.
• Maienschein, Jane, 2014, Embryos Under the Microscope, Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
• Malaterre, Christophe and Jean-François Chartier, 2019, “Beyond Categorical Definitions of Life: a Data-Driven Approach to Assessing Lifeness,” Synthese, 198: 4543–4572.
• Malaterre, Christoph, Jeancolas, Cyrille, & Nghe, Philippe, 2022, “The Origin of Life: What is the Question?” Astrobiology, 22(7): 851–862.
• Malaterre, Christoph, Ten Kate, Inge Loes, Baqué, Mickael, Debaille, Vinciane, Grenfell, John Lee, Javaux, Emmanuelle J., Khawaja, N., Klenner, F. Lara, Y.J, McMahon, Sean, and Moore, K., 2023, “Is there Such a Thing as a Biosignature?” Astrobiology, 23(11): 1213–1227.
• Mariscal, Carlos, Ana Barahona, Nathanael Aubert-Kato, Arsev Umur Aydinoglu, Stuart Bartlett, María Luz Cárdenas, Kuhan Chandru, Carol E. Cleland, Benjamin T. Cocanougher, Nathaniel Comfort, and Athel Cornish-Bowden, 2019, “Hidden concepts in the history and philosophy of origins-of-life studies: A workshop report,” Origins of Life and Evolution of Biospheres, 49(3): 111–145.
• Mariscal, Carlos and W. Ford Doolittle, 2015, “Eukaryotes first: how could that be?” Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society B (Biological Sciences), 370(1678): 20140322.
• –––, 2020, “Life and Life Only: a Radical Alternative to Life Definitionism,” Synthese, 197(7): 2975–2989.
• Mathis, Cole, Tanmoy Bhattacharya, and Sara Imari Walker, 2017, “The Emergence of Life as a First-Order Phase Transition,” Astrobiology, 17(3): 266–276.
• McKay, David S., Everett K. Gibson, Kathie L. Thomas-Keprta, Hojatollah Vali, Christopher S. Romanek, Simon J. Clemett, Xavier D.F. Chillier, Claude R. Maechling, and Richard N. Zare, 1996, “Search for past life on Mars: possible relic biogenic activity in Martian meteorite ALH84001,” Science, 273(5277): 924–930.
• Medin, Douglas L. and Marguerite M. Schaffer, 1978, “Context Theory of Classification Learning,” Psychological Review, 85(3): 207–238.
• Miller, Stanley L., 1953, “A Production of Amino Acids Under Possible Primitive Earth Conditions,” Science, 117(3046): 528–529.
• Mix, Lucas John, 2018, Life Concepts from Aristotle to Darwin: On Vegetable Souls, New York: Springer.
• –––, 2020, “Three Lives and Astrobiology,” in K.C. Smith and C. Mariscal (eds.) Social and Conceptual Issues in Astrobiology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 57–78.
• Moody, Edmund R.R., Álvarez-Carretero, Sandra, Mahendrarajah, Tara A., Clark, James W., Betts, Holly C., Dombrowski, Nina, Szántho, Lénárd L., Boyle, R.A., Daines, S., Chen, X., and Lane, Nick, 2024, “The Nature of the Last Universal Common Ancestor and its Impact on the Early Earth System,” Nature Ecology & Evolution, 8(9): 1654–1666.
• More, Max and Natasha Vita-More, (eds.), 2013, The Transhumanist Reader: Classical and Contemporary Essays on the Science, Technology, and Philosophy of the Human Future, London: John Wiley & Sons.
• Moreira, David and Purificación López-García, 2009, “Ten reasons to exclude viruses from the tree of life,” Nature Reviews Microbiology, 7(4): 306–311.
• Murphy, Gregory L., and Douglas L. Medin, 1985, “The Role of Theories in Conceptual Coherence,” Psychological Review, 92(3): 289–316.
• Nicholson, Daniel J. and Dupré, John, 2018, Everything Flows: Towards a Processual Philosophy of Biology, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Noonan John T. Jr., 1967, “Abortion and the Catholic Church: A Summary History,” National Law Forum, 12: 85–131.
• Nosofsky, Robert M., 1986, “Attention, similarity, and the identification categorization relationship,” Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition, 115(1): 39–57.
• Oparin, Aleksandr Ivanovich, 1961, Life: Its Nature, Origin and Development, New York: Academic Press.
• –––, 1936 [2010], “The Nature of Life,” in M.A. Bedau and C.E. Cleland, The Nature of Life: Classical and Contemporary Perspectives from Philosophy and Science, New York: Cambridge University Press; this translation by Ann Synge was first published in A. I. Oparin, Life: Its nature, origin, and development, New York: Academic Press, 1964, pp. 1–37.
• Pace, Norman R., 2001, “The Universal Nature of Biochemistry,” Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences, 98(3): 805–808.
• Pályi, Gyula, Claudia Zucchi, and Luciano Caglioti, (eds.), 2002, Fundamentals of Life, Paris: Elsevier.
• Parke, Emily C., 2020, “Dimensions of Life Definitions,” in K.C. Smith & C. Mariscal (eds.), Social and Conceptual Issues in Astrobiology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 79–90.
• Pearce, Ben K.D., Andrew S. Tupper, Ralph E. Pudritz, and Paul G. Higgs, 2018, “Constraining the time interval for the origin of life on Earth,” Astrobiology, 18(3): 343–364.
• Peplow, Mark, 2005, “Formaldehyde claim inflames Martian debate,” Nature, published online 25 February 2005. doi:10.1038/news050221-15
• Peretó, Juli, Jeffrey L. Bada, and Antonio Lazcano, 2009, “Charles Darwin and the origin of life,” Origins of Life and Evolution of Biospheres, 39(5): 395–406.
• Plato, Phaedrus, in Plato: Complete Works, J. Cooper and D. Hutchinson (eds.), Indianapolis: Hackett, 1997.
• –––, The Republic, in Plato: Complete Works, J. Cooper and D. Hutchinson (eds.), Indianapolis: Hackett, 1997.
• –––, Timeaus, in Plato: Complete Works, J. Cooper and D. Hutchinson (eds.), Indianapolis: Hackett, 1997.
• Popa, Radu, 2004, Between Necessity and Probability: Searching for the Definition and Origin of Life, New York: Springer.
• Postgate, John, 2000, “The Twilight Zones of Microbiology,” Microbiology Today, 27: 162–163.
• Raman, Ritu, 2024, “Biofabrication of Living Actuators,” Annual Review of Biomedical Engineering, 26(1): 223–245.
• Ramsey, William, “Eliminative Materialism,” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2020 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.),URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2020/entries/materialism-eliminative/>.
• Ray, Thomas S., 1993, “An evolutionary approach to synthetic biology: Zen and the art of creating life,” Artificial Life, 1(1/2): 179–209.
• Rolston III, H., 2017, “Is there an Ecological Ethic?” in M. Wachs (ed.), Ethics in Planning, London: Routledge, pp. 299–317.
• Rosch, Eleanor, and Mervis, C. B., 1975, “Family resemblance: Studies in the internal structure of categories,” Cognitive Psychology, 7: 573–605.
• Rosch, Eleanor, 1978, “Principles of Categorization,” in E. Rosch and B.B. Lloyd (eds.), Cognition and Categorization, Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum, pp. 27–48.
• Riskin, Jessica, 2016, The Restless Clock: A History of the Centuries-Long Argument Over what Makes Living Things Tick, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Sagan, Carl, 1970, “Life,” Encyclopedia Britannica, Chicago: Encyclopædia Britannica Incorporated, pp. 1083–1083A.
• Scharf, Caleb, Nathaniel Virgo, H. James Cleaves III, Masashi Aono, Nathanael Aubert-Kato, Arsev Aydinoglu, Ana Barahona, Laura M. Barge, Steven A. Benner, Martin Biehl, Ramon Brasser, Christopher J. Butch, Kuhan Chandru, Leroy Cronin, Sabastian Danielache, Jakob Fischer, John Hernlund, Piet Hut, Takashi Ikegami, Jun Kimura, Kensei Kobayashi, Carlos Mariscal, Shawn McGlynn, Brice Menard, Norman Packard, Robert Pascal, Juli Pereto, Sudha Rajamani, Lana Sinapayen, Eric Smith, Christopher Switzer, Ken Takai, Feng Tian, Yuichiro Ueno, Mary Voytek, Olaf Witkowski, and Hikaru Yabuta, 2015, “A Strategy for Origins of Life Research,” Astrobiology, 15(12): 1031–1042.
• Schopf, J. William, 1993, “Microfossils of the Early Archean Apex chert: new evidence of the antiquity of life,” Science, 260(5108): 640–646.
• Schopf, J. William, Kouki Kitajima, Michael J. Spicuzza, Anatoliy B. Kudryavtsev, and John W. Valley, 2018, “SIMS analyses of the oldest known assemblage of microfossils document their taxon-correlated carbon isotope compositions,” Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences, 115(1): 53–58.
• Schulze-Makuch, Dirk, Huade Guan, Louis N. Irwin, E Vega, 2002, “Redefining life: An ecological, thermodynamic, and bioinformatic approach,” in G. Pályi, C. Zucchi, L. Caglioti (eds.), Fundamentals of Life, New York: Elsevier, pp. 169–179.
• Seager, Sara, Welbanks, Luis, Ellerbroek, Lucas, Bains, William, & Petkowski, Janusz J., 2025, “Prospects for Detecting Signs of Life on Exoplanets in the JWST Era,” Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences, 122(39): e2416188122.
• Slater, Matthew H., 2015, “Natural Kindness,” The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 66(2): 375–411.
• Smith, J. David, 2002, “Exemplar Theory’s Predicted Typicality Gradient can be Tested and Disconfirmed,” Psychological Science, 13(5): 437–442.
• Smith, Harrison B., & Mathis, Cole, 2023, “Life Detection in a Universe of False Positives: Can the Fatal Flaws of Exoplanet Biosignatures be Overcome Absent a Theory of Life?” BioEssays, 45(12): 2300050.
• Smith, Kelly C., 2020, “METI or REGRETTI,” in K.C. Smith and C. Mariscal (eds.), Social and Conceptual Issues in Astrobiology, Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 209–235.
• Sober, Elliott, 1991, “Learning from Functionalism: prospects for strong artificial life,” in C.G. Langton, C. Taylor, J.D. Farmer, and S. Rasmussen (eds.), Artificial life II (Santa Fe Institute Studies in the Sciences of Complexity: Proceedings Volume X), Redwood City, CA: Addison-Wesley, pp. 749–765.
• Sterelny, Kim, 1993, “Categories, Categorisation and Development: Introspective Knowledge is No Threat to Functionalism,” Behavioral and Brain Sciences, 16(1): 81–83.
• Stewart, Potter, 1964, “Jacobellis vs. Ohio,” 378 U.S. 184, 197.
• Szostak, Jack W., 2012, “Attempts to Define Life Do Not Help to Understand the Origin of Life.” Journal of Biomolecular Structure & Dynamics, 29(4): 599–600. doi: 10.1080/073911012010524998
• Trifonov, Edward N., 2011, “Vocabulary of definitions of life suggests a definition.” Journal of Biomolecular Structure and Dynamics, 29(2): 259–266
• Trombley, Carolyn A. and Karl Cottenie, 2019, “Quantifying the scientific cost of ambiguous terminology in community ecology,” Philosophical Topics, 47(1): 203–218.
• Tsokolov, Serhiy A., 2009, “Why Is the Definition of Life So Elusive? Epistemological Considerations,” Astrobiology, 9(4): 401–412. doi:10.1089/ast.2007.0201
• Wächtershäuser, Günter, 1988, “Before Enzymes and templates: Theory of Surface Metabolism,” Microbiological Reviews, 52(4): 452–484.
• Weber, Bruce H., 2007, “Emergence of life,” Zygon, 42: 837–856.
• –––, 2010, “What is Life? Defining Life in the Context of Emergent Complexity,” Origins of Life and Evolution of Biospheres, 40: 221–229.
• Webster, Christopher R., Paul R. Mahaffy, Sushil K. Atreya, John E. Moores, Gregory J. Flesch, Charles Malespin, Christopher P. McKay, German Martinez, G., Christina L. Smith, Javier Martin-Torres, Javier Gomez-Elvira, Maria-Paz Zorzano, Michael H. Wong, Melissa G. Trainer, Andrew Steele, Doug Archer Jr., Brad Sutter, Patrice J. Coll, Caroline Freissinet, Pierre-Yves Meslin, Raina V. Gough, Christopher H. House, Alexander Pavlov, Jennifer L. Eigenbrode, Daniel P. Glavin, John C. Pearson, Didier Keymeulen, Lance E. Christensen, Susanne P. Schwenzer, Rafael Navarro-Gonzalez, Jorge Pla-García, Scot C.R. Rafkin, Álvaro Vicente-Retortillo, Henrik Kahanpää, Daniel Viudez-Moreiras, Michael D. Smith, Ari-Matti Harri, Maria Genzer, Donald M. Hassler, Mark Lemmon, Joy Crisp, Stanley P. Sander, Richard W. Zurek, Ashwin R. Vasavada, 2018, “Background Levels of Methane in Mars’ Atmosphere Show Strong Seasonal Variations,” Science, 360(6393): 1093–1096.
• Wells, Herbert George, 1898, The War of the Worlds. London: William Heinemann.
• White, Lauren M., Everett K. Gibson, Kathie L. Thomas-Keprta, Simon J. Clemett, and David S. McKay, 2014, “Putative Indigenous Carbon-Bearing Alteration Features in Martian Meteorite Yamato 000593,” Astrobiology, 14(2): 170–181.
• Woese, Carl R. and George E. Fox, 1977, “The Concept of Cellular Evolution,” Journal of Molecular Evolution, 10(1): 1–6.
• Woese, Carl R., 1998, “The Universal Ancestor,” Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences, 95(12): 6854–6859.

Academic Tools

	How to cite this entry.
	Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
	Look up topics and thinkers related to this entry at the Internet Philosophy Ontology Project (InPhO).
	Enhanced bibliography for this entry at PhilPapers, with links to its database.

Other Internet Resources

• Weber, Bruce, “Life”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2021 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/fall2021/entries/life/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy — see the version history.]
• Darwin, C., Letter to J. D. Hooker, 01 February 1871, Letter no. 7471, Darwin Correspondence Project.

Related Entries

abortion, ethics of | death | death: definition of | definitions | end of life, aging and | life: meaning of