Locke on Medicine

First published Mon Oct 14, 2024

While Locke is remembered for his numerous contributions to a wide range of fields—philosophy, political theory, economics, religious exegesis, education and psychology—and while he took on numerous roles in his career—academic, diplomat, secretary, tutor, advisor and civil servant—it is easy to forget that he was a trained and qualified professional. Locke spent a good part of his career—at least a decade—studying, training, writing, apprenticing and eventually practicing as a physician. He worked closely with a number of leading researchers on a range of contemporary medical, physiological and related subjects, taking hundred of notes, and authoring several extended reflections on medical matters. These writings cover a range of topics and perspectives, and illustrate Locke’s changing attitudes as his views evolved. None of Locke’s medical writings were published in his lifetime, but he played a significant role in the writing and publication of Thomas Sydenham’s Observationes Medicae (London 1676), a ground-breaking work of medical empiricism, having worked very closely with Sydenham for several years. Locke began to write his Essay concerning Human Understanding in 1671, when his collaboration with Sydenham was at its closest, and there are clear parallels between the two mens’ thinking.

While there is as yet no definitive account of Locke’s medical work, the topic has been of increasing interest to scholars over the last several decades. Kenneth Dewhurst produced numerous articles on Locke’s medical work drawing upon the recently acquired Lovelace collection of Locke manuscripts in the 1950s and 60s, culminating in his monograph John Locke: Physician and Philosopher (1963), contextualising the medical entries in Locke’s journals. Patrick Romanell’s Locke and Medicine (1984) began to draw out the connections between Locke’s medical work and his philosophical views. In a series of books and articles in the 1990s, Guy Meynell demonstrated the deep personal and professional connections between Locke and Sydenham. More recently, J. C. Walmsley has produced updated transcriptions of Locke’s key medical texts, and highlighted the close relationship between Locke’s medical work and the early versions of the Essay. Most recently Peter Anstey’s John Locke and Natural Philosophy (2011b) has presented a detailed and rounded view of Locke’s medical interests and their impact on his philosophical views (though his interpretation of the relationship between Locke and Sydenham, and Locke’s commitment to chymical theory, has drawn commentary in Walmsley 2012 and 2016).

Understanding the depth of Locke’s medical research, and the way that this research shaped his philosophical views, provides an insight into the deep structure of his epistemological and metaphysical outlook—both the underpinnings of his worldview, and his overall methodology. So while Locke’s work as a physician is not widely known, his medical outlook is arguably the bedrock on which he built the superstructure of his philosophy. This article traces Locke’s medical work through the earlier stages of career to identify how his commitments changed over time and demonstrate how his training as a physician shaped key philosophical principles in the early drafts of the Essay, thereby laying the foundations for his mature views.

(All citations of An Essay Concerning Human Understanding are indicated by “Locke 1690”, followed by the book, chapter, and section numbers. Page numbers referring to the Nidditch edition are also provided. Citations of Drafts A and B of the Essay are indicated by “Draft A or B”, and the section and page number from the Nidditch and Rogers edition.)

1. Locke’s Medical Studies at Oxford

In May 1652 Locke was elected to a Studentship at Christ Church, Oxford. Locke does not appear to have thought much of his education there. In his posthumous biography, Locke’s friend Jean Le Clerc described Locke’s early career in Oxford as one focussed less on learning, and more on epistolary entertainment:

Being thus discourag’d by the Method of studying that was then in Vogue, he diverted himself by writing to some Gentlemen, with whom he chose to hold Correspondence for the sake of their good Humour, their pleasant and agreeable Temper, rather than on the Account of their Learning; and he confess’d that he spent some Years in this manner. (Le Clerc 1713: 3–4)

On 14 February 1656 Locke received a Bachelor of Arts, and on the 29 June 1658, he obtained his Master of Arts. He then began to progress through the academic hierarchy, becoming a Lecturer in Greek in 1660, in Rhetoric in 1663, and Censor for Moral Philosophy in 1664. Locke’s tenure of the Studentship was life-long, dependent upon certain conditions. If he married, if he failed to take a degree when qualified to do so, or failed to take orders when of sufficient seniority, he would have to leave. However, four Faculty Studentships, divided between Law and Medicine, were exempt from ecclesiastical obligations. Once Locke had his M.A. he could study whatever he liked, and medicine might have provided a way to retain his position without becoming a clergyman. From roughly the time of graduating M.A. onwards, in addition to his academic duties, Locke undertook an extensive programme of reading and note-taking which immersed him deeply in the medical controversies of his day.

Much of the teaching at the time remained Galenic in origin and Locke read numerous thinkers in this tradition, like Glisson, Riverius, Fernel and Moebius. The core Galenic ontology was classical in origin and simple in explanatory structure. There were four elements: earth, air, fire and water, four primary qualities: hot, cold, wet and dry, four bodily humours: blood, black bile, yellow bile and phlegm, and the three spirits; natural, vital and animal. To cure a disease in the Galenic model was simple. If illness was due to some imbalance, the application of opposing qualities would return things to order. Put simply, “contraries may be cured and resisted by their contraries”. In addition, Locke began a systematic study of Daniel Sennert’s thought. Sennert was not an orthodox Galenist. He engaged in chemical experimentation and postulated corpuscles as constituent parts of larger objects, holding that each corpuscle was a compound of Aristotelean matter and form, and that the causal powers of the corpuscle were dependent on this form. Moreover, all the corpuscles in a body were arranged according to an overall form that structured the macroscopic body (Newman 1996: 573–6). So, despite his progressive outlook and modification of classical thinking, Sennert retained a fundamental belief in traditional explanatory categories. Locke took scores of notes from Sennert’s works, and even went so far as to adopt the structure of his Institutionum Medicinae (1611) for a pair of large medical notebooks in which he recorded observations from a wide range of writers over several decades.[1]

Locke also read several works by Anton Deusing, a polymath and medical eclectic. Deusing kept up to date with the latest developments in natural philosophy, reading Boyle, Descartes, and Harvey. But his approach was generally to accommodate new discoveries within a traditional framework. When studying the natural sciences he held that the Bible was the first point of reference, then the classical authors, where he favoured Aristotle in general, and Avicenna in medical matters. For Deusing, though experience and experiment play a role in the sciences, they should be balanced with the dictates of reason which were at least as important. He generally adopted the most conservative position consistent with the scientific discoveries of his time. Locke read and took notes from at least 5 of Deusing’s books, and created his own manuscript indexes of at least two of them. Locke was evidently immersed and clearly engaged with classical medical theory then dominant at the time, and some of the newer, more innovative, manifestations of its adherents.

At the time of Locke’s study, there was another major strand of medical thinking evolving in contrast to the Galenic tradition, which might be described as Paracelsian, or “chymical” medicine. Paracelsus (c. 1493–1541), a Swiss physician, alchemist, and philosopher, revolutionized medicine by advocating the use of chemicals and minerals in treatments, and laying the groundwork for modern pharmacology. “Chymists” rejected the matter and form of the scholastics, replacing it with the paradigm of “fermentation”. Here, organic phenomena such as the spontaneous generation of heat from straw-piles, or the creation of alcohol from hops and yeast were seen as pointers to an underlying dynamic and transformative modus operandi in nature.

A leading thinker in that tradition was then resident in Oxford—Thomas Willis, Sedleian Professor of Natural Philosophy. Some of Locke’s earliest medical notes after his M.A. come from Willis’s Diatribe duae medico-philosophicae (London 1659). Locke also attended Willis’s 1662 medical lectures, some of the notes deriving from his schoolfriend Richard Lower, who would shortly act as Willis’s assistant in the preparation of Cerebri Anatome (London 1664) (Willis’s c. 1662 lecture notes are printed in Dewhurst 1980). In Willis’s view, macroscopic objects were made up of tiny parts. However, each of these particles has its own separate chemical identity, over and above its purely mechanical attributes. There were five different types of body in Willis’s opinion: spirit, sulphur, salt, water and earth. A particle of spirit would always be very active and volatile, irrespective of its size and shape, while one of earth would be inert. Change occurred when particles of one type were joined to particles of another. Willis called this chymical process of particular re-arrangement, a “fermentation” (Frank 1980: 165–9).

Locke also studied the work of another major figure in this tradition. Joan Baptista van Helmont, reading his major work, Ortus Medicinae at least twice—the 1648 edition circa 1660–1661 and the 1652 edition at points between 1665 and 1667, using the book itself to make notes (Walmsley 2000: 370). Van Helmont believed that all matter was derived from water and that “ferments” impregnated different parts of water with “seeds” that transformed it into irreducibly different chymical elements by imposing an image or “idea” upon it. Helmont held that when elements truly reacted together, they were transmuted into an entirely new third substance sharing no properties with its antecedents. Helmont also believed that bodies contained “Archei”—quasi-spiritual entities that governed the operation of different organs (Pagel 1982). Disease occurred when a ferment, or “seminal principle” attempted to direct the matter of the body in some way other than that planned by the Archeus. Locke read several other authors in this tradition, including Kerger and Schookius.

As well as immersing himself in “chymical” theory, Locke embarked upon a practical course of “chymistry” taught by Peter Stahl. Stahl had been brought to England by Robert Boyle in 1659 and was the first person to publicly teach chemistry at Oxford (Meynell 1995). Anthony Wood famously recorded his impression of the young Locke’s contributions to the classes:

This John Lock was a man of turbulent spirit, clamorous and never contented. The club wrot and took notes from the mouth of their master, who sate at the upper end of a table, but the said J. Lock scorned to do it; so that while every man besides of the club were writing, he would be prating and troblesome. (Wood c. 1672 [1891–5: vol. I, 472]).

The extensive notes that Locke took in in a new commonplace book rather undercuts Wood’s unflattering portrait, and Locke would continue to record his own extensive on-going chymical experimentation in Oxford over the next several years (as detailed in Walmsley & Milton 1999).

Throughout this period and in parallel to these other medical traditions, Locke was also assiduously studied the mechanical philosophy. Locke had met Robert Boyle by 1660, who was by then an experienced experimenter at the outset of a publishing career that would establish him as the leading natural philosopher of his day. Locke read Boyle’s works as they were published, starting with the New Experiments Physico-Mechanical touching the Spring of Air (Oxford 1660), and continuing with Certain Physiological Essays (London 1661), The Style of the Scriptures (London 1661), The Usefulness of Experimental Natural Philosophy (Oxford 1663), and The Origine of Formes and Qualities (Oxford 1666). An exception was The Sceptical Chymist (London 1661), which was published in 1661, but not read by Locke until circa 1664–5 (Milton 1994: 37).

From 1660 to 1662, Locke also pursued a systematic examination Descartes’ work. He started with the Principles of Philosophy, then read the Discourse on Method, the Dioptrics and Meteors, the Meditations, some of the Objections and Replies and finally, the Passions of the Soul. Locke then read some of Gassendi’s Syntagma, and Spinoza’s re-construction of the Cartesian system, Renati des Cartes Principorum Philosophiae Pars I, and II, More Geometrico demonstratae in 1664 (this account drawn from Milton 1994: 37–9). Locke’s notes on the mechanical philosophy were generally confined to the natural philosophical matters of fact that might interest a physician-in-training. Locke’s reading of Descartes appears to have been the inspiration for two short notes in his commonplace books. In the first, “Vacuum”, Locke considered whether solidity requires a vacuum, or whether motion provides an explanation (Locke c. 1662a). In the second, “Elasticus Motus”, Locke speculates on the properties of motion (Locke c. 1662b [2001: 221–2]).

From 1660 to 1666 Locke became systematically and deeply immersed in the medical theories and controversies of his day, filling his notebooks with his reading and experimental findings. His interests were eclectic. While modern readers might most closely associate him with the mechanical philosophy, this was far from his sole interest in this period, as he engaged deeply with both the Galenic and Chymical medical traditions.

2. Locke on Physiology

In June 1664 Richard Lower wrote to Robert Boyle concerning some physiological problems he was then grappling with, specifically:

the reasons of the different colour of the blood of the veins and arteries; the one being florid and purple red, the other dark and blackish. (Boyle 2001: II, 288)

Galenic theory had supposed that the veins and arteries were entirely separate systems; the veins distributing nutritive blood containing natural spirits generated in the liver, the arteries distributing vital spirits generated in the heart. The only point of contact between the two systems was at the heart, where venous blood was supposed to pass directly from the right to the left ventricle, so that blood was available for the creation of the vital spirits. The air was supposed to cool the heat of the heart, and take away the waste products of the venous blood. Harvey’s discovery of the circulation of the blood had overturned this orthodoxy, raising questions about the nature of blood, its relationship to the air, and what role the heart and lungs played in this circulation. A full account of the impact of Harvey’s discovery is presented in Frank (1980).

When Lower recommenced his research on respiration and the blood in 1664, Locke worked with him. Locke made numerous notes on respiration, volatility and fermentation, focussing on experimental research and often citing Lower as a source. One such note outlined the key question:

Sanguis Bloud taken out of the veines and arteries of the same creature at the same time very much differs. that that comes out of an opend veine being the greatst part of it of a darke colour which they commonly call crassamentum nigrum with a florid red about the thicknesse of half a crowne on the top. that which comes out of an opend atrerie is all of that florid colour without any Crassamentum nigrum R.Lower. (Locke 1664–6 [2007: 462])

Locke then speculated about the possible cause:

Sanguis Bloud taken out of the artery of the lungs hath its crassamentum nigrum like that which comes out of the vains so that the red florid is made only in the left ventricle of the heart RL which perhaps is by the mixture of the aire with it which gives it volatilization & colour. (Locke 1664–6 [2007: 462])

Locke erroneously thought that the blood travelling from lungs to heart was identical to venous blood, leaving some role for the heart in its volatization. Locke then turned to the experimental evidence from Helmont:

Sal Volatile Helmont Blas humanum n.35.p.150.52 where he says that the aire makes that all the bloud transpires & becomes volatile, but being distild leaves a caput mortum But that he says n45 that the aier volatizing the sulphur of any concrete, all the alkali will become a volatile salt. Query How the aier may be soe applyd as to effect this whither by expressing to it or fermenting in it. JL. (Locke 1664–6 [2007: 462])

Locke then theorised about what it was in the air that made the blood volatile:

Sanguis Aer probably it is the nitrous salt in the aier that gives it this tincture & volatizes it, & the volatile part in circulation being either transmuted into nourishment of the part, the remaining bloud in the vains is lesse spirituosus & both in colour & consistence comes nearer a caput mortuum, & therefor is returnd by the vains to the lungues & heart to be new volatilizd & soe by sucession is made all volatile JL. v. Helmont Blas hum. n.35. p150. 52 Destill ana of the venall & arteriall bloud of an animall & try whether they will yeild different quantitys of Salt. JL. (Locke 1664–6 [2007: 463]).

A nitrous salt in the air volatised the blood to provide nourishment for the body. Once the body consumed the volatile part of the blood, it was sent back to the lungs and heart to be volatised again to provide a continuous supply of bodily sustenance. Locke even suggested a test for this theory—ascertain whether the venous and arterial blood have different levels of salt to indicate different levels of volatility.

Locke’s studentship required him to submit a disputation on a medical topic, and this may have prompted his paper “Respirationis Usus”, written mid-1666. He opened his disputation with a direct attack on Galenic orthodoxy: “Would the primary purpose of respiration be to cool the blood? No” (Locke 1666a [2009: 15]). Locke was prepared to agree that “nature seems to work greatly to this effect, that that vestal fire of our life is cherished”, but did not think that the lungs cooled this internal flame:

would Nature not be a badly wasteful Matron if she aroused such great fires in us that it would be continually necessary for her to blow cold airs through us to prevent us from being burned up? (Locke 1666a [2009: 17])

Locke held that life and animation were constituted by “animal spirits”. These required volatisation and “ascension” by the air, then to be transported around the body in the blood to keep all parts alive:

For seeing that it is upon this that animal life hinges, that there should be a continuous and constant provision of animal spirits, that is, that the parts of the blood should be changed into a subtle and volatile material, which, when diffused everywhere throughout our arteries and nerves, imparts motion, feeling and heat to the body; which appears to be the fundamental reason and whole driving force of our life. (Locke 1666a [2009: 19])

Locke supported his theory with experimental results. He first noted that air was “indispensable in order to both ferment and volatize things” (Locke 1666a [2009: 19]). Locke next considered the specific processes at work, proposing a candidate for the active agent in the air:

If one can conjecture something in such obscurity, this sort of spirit has a highly volatile nitrous nature (not unskilled would be those who suspected they saw salt-peter), which seems to be the proper dissolver of sulphurous and inflammable bodies. (Locke 1666a [2009: 21])

These nitrous particles:

necessary to the conservation of our life and the volatility of our blood, we inhale and imbibe together with the air. Whence the little fire of our life is continuously inflamed in our heart. (Locke 1666a [2009: 21])

Locke had identified the end and means of the blood’s volatization and, consequently, the purpose of respiration, thereby overturning the Galenic view:

This volatization is caused by fermentation and a kind of burning in the heart. But no kindling of this kind, be it fermentation or whatever we are permitted to call it, takes place without air itself. We conclude therefore that the air effectively kindles the heart’s heat rather than cools it. (Locke 1666a [2009: 21])

Locke then sought to corroborate his theory, and refute Galenic cooling, with a wide variety of examples. Locke finally tackled potential objections to his theory by showing why, when circulation increases in exercise or fever, respiration must also increase: that the lungs should not be overwhelmed with blood, and that the blood should be fully impregnated with the aerial ferment, so that it is sufficiently nourishing for the body when it circulates (Locke 1666a [2009: 21–7]).

The September 1667 edition of the Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society of London printed “An Experiment of Signior Fracassati upon Bloud grown cold”. Blood at the top of a dish would be a florid red, in contrast to the blood below it. But once the florid layer was removed, the blood below would redden, showing that the air directly volatized the blood. This experiment prompted Locke to reconsider the theory he had proposed in “Respirationis usus”:

If the melancholy bloud exposed to the aer turns florid (v. phil transact p 493) it seemes to prove that the aire in breatheing mixes with the blood since the arteriall bloud in animals is much more florid then the venall. JL (Locke 1667 [2009: 8])

It was this result would reshape Lower’s thinking in his Tractatus de Corde concerning the location of the volatisation of the blood, placing it exclusively in the lungs directly from the air (Lower 1669), the first published account of the basic mechanisms of physiology and the respective roles of the heart, lungs, veins, arteries and respiration. Locke’s instant grasp of the importance and implications of the Fracassati experiment allowed him to put the final piece of the physiological puzzle in place. Locke had now formulated the basic elements, machinery and purpose of respiration, ahead of the appearance of Lower’s Tractatus. Had he published a short summary of his thinking on respiration before Lower’s book, it might have secured him a place in the history of medicine as a physiologist at the cutting-edge of contemporary research.

Two further points are notable—a reliance upon Helmontian, “chymical” theory, and a commensurate distance from the work of Boyle. Boyle in the New Experiments Physico-Mechanicall, Touching the Spring of the Air and its Effects thought it likely that the air took off fumes from the blood, and unlikely that the “chymical” supposition that there was a “vital Quintessence” in the air necessary for life (Boyle 1660: 273­–95). Locke thought the opposite.

3. Locke Early Theory of Disease

In addition to his work on respiration, Locke also wrote “Morbus”, a short reflection on the nature of disease. Where “Respirationis Usus” was implicitly premised on “chymical” theory, “Morbus” explicitly adopted an Helmontian ontology as part of an eclectic theory of disease. And where the disputation had tacitly rejected Boyle’s mechanical explanations, “Morbus” directly rejected some of the accounts Boyle gave for specific phenomena. The opening remarks gave the central thesis of his account:

I suppose another & more rationall theory of deseases might be establishd upon other principles, then those either of the Galenests or Paracelsians, for Considering that in the greate world some things are producd by seminall principles, & some other by bare mistion of the parts, to which might be added the circumstantiall assistances of heat & cold &c. (Locke 1666b [2000: 390–1])

Locke’s stated intent was to replace the dispute between the Paracelsians and the Galenists. But this was quickly belied by the substance of his account which broadly comprised Helmontian “seminal principles” tempered by Galenic “humours”. His intention was not to create a new ontology, but to adapt elements of these theories and determine their domains of applicability. That Locke was not invoking the mechanical hypothesis in positing “seminall principles” was clear when he defined this technical phrase:

by seminall principles or ferments I meane some small & subtile parcelles of matter which are apt to transmute far greater portions of matter into a new nature & new qualitys, which change could not be brought about by any other knowne means, soe that this change seems wholy to depend upon the operation or activity of this seminall principle, & not on the difference of the matter its self that is changd. (Locke 1666b [2000: 391])

Indeed, Locke adopted specifically Helmontian terms of art when indicating how these ferments worked:

How these small & insensible ferments, this potent Archeus works I confesse I cannot satisfactorily comprehend, though the effects are evident. (Locke 1666b [2000: 391])

This statement is unequivocal in its adherence to Helmontian ontology: Locke even used the central term of this theory, the “Archeus”. Accounting for his acceptance of Helmontian theory, Locke used the example that provided a paradigm for the rest of the theory, namely, the “seed”:

soe severall seeds set in the same plot of earth, change the moisture of the earth which is the common nourishment of them all into far different plants which, differ both in their qualitys & effects. (Locke 1666b [2000: 391])

Locke then stated that this power of creating different plants from qualitatively indistinguishable seeds “is not donne by bare streineing the nourishment through their pores”, an allusion to the mechanical explanations of both Descartes and Boyle. Locke gave an organic example, drawing on experimental results where plant seeds were placed in water:

the conversion of the same water into divers plants of different kindes as mint & marjorame &c, cannot be effectd by barely straineing it through the different pores of those plants, but must be wrought by some more powerfull way, then bare streineing is able to produce in soe simple & homogeneous a body. (Locke 1666b [2000: 391])

This is a reference to Boyle’s experiments on growing precisely these plants in water from The Sceptical Chymist (Boyle 1661: 110–11). Boyle had cited these examples as illustrations of mechanical explanations; Locke cited them to support an opposing Helmontian account.

Locke then re-introduced the concept of “humours”, not as the cause of disease when qualities are imbalanced, but as a factor in susceptibility to the agency of ferments:

soe sanguine complexions are observd most easily to admit the seminall principles of the plague easily melancholy tempers more difficultly. & in all these seminall deseases the fault seems noe otherwise to be in the bloud & humors then as they are more or lesse disposd to receive & nourish this seminall principle. (Locke 1666b [2000: 392])

With this Galenic concept assimilated into his neo-Helmontian theory, Locke then considered non-seminal diseases, those maladies caused by a “bare mistion of parts”:

Other deseases I suppose may probably be conceivd to be producd by a bare mistion of two unfitt ingredient, as when acid & volatile salts are mixd, there presently is producd an ebullition, & then the two differing salts coagulate into a 3d substance far enough different from either of the ingredients. (Locke 1666b [2000: 392])

Locke here describes a “chymical” transmutation of two substances into an third from which its predecessors cannot be recovered. For Locke, even the most basic of inorganic interactions, Boyle’s strongest case for a mechanical explanation, were to be accounted for in terms of irreducibly “chymical” interactions, rather than the texture of mechanical parts.

At this point in his career Locke had a voracious interest in a wide range of medical matters, which extended into practical physiological and “chymical” experimentation. He was a medical eclectic, willing to countenance a wide range of contemporary explanations for medical, and by extension, natural, phenomena. Such catholic interests did not evidence a philosophically principled approach to medical matters. Readers of the Essay concerning Human Understanding will be very familiar with Locke’s account of the mechanical philosophy, and its most famous expression, the distinction between primary and secondary qualities. They will know that Locke and Boyle were close associates from the 1660s onwards, and will assume that Locke’s views derived directly from Boyle’s. A review of Locke’s early medical work shows this to be incorrect; at this early point in his career Locke was much more a “chymist” than a mechanist, deeply immersed in an Helmontian ontology at odds with Boyle’s mechanism. Locke and Boyle shared interests, and worked closely together, but Locke had an independent intellectual agenda which he pursued with vigour.

4. Locke and Sydenham

On 2 April 1668 the physician Thomas Sydenham sent Boyle a letter concerning the second edition of Thomae Sydenham Methodus Curandi Febres, Propriis Observationibus Superstructura. Boyle had been inspiration, and subsequently the dedicatee, of the first edition of 1666. In this letter, Sydenham sought permission to reprint the dedication, and updated Boyle with news of a mutual acquaintance:

I perceive my friend, Mr. Locke, hath troubled you with an account of my practice, as he hath done himself in visiting with me very many of my variolous patients especially. (Boyle 2001: IV, 55)

Locke had left Oxford in April 1667 to take up residence in London with his new patron, Anthony Ashley Cooper. Locke appears to have made Sydenham’s acquaintance shortly thereafter, and since Boyle knew both men, it is possible that he effected the introduction.

Roughly translated, the title of the book was “Thomas Sydenham’s method for the treatment of fevers based upon his own observations”. Sydenham believed that there was no way for people to determine the causes of illness: these “cannot be laid down” (Sydenham 1666 [1987: 59]). Consequently, “Aetiology is a difficult, and, perhaps, an inexplicable affair; and I choose to keep my hands clear of it” (Sydenham 1666 [1987: 103]). So, rather than engage in the construction of hypotheses about the constitution of the body or disease, the book presented only a minimal theoretical structure and avoided the theoretical disputes of competing medical factions. In this respect it differed radically from most medical literature of the time.

Sydenham believed that there were “species of fever” which acted in a constant and systematic way (Sydenham, 1666 [1987: 55]): “Nature here as elsewhere, moves in a regular and orderly manner” (Sydenham 1666 [1987: 103]). But he had no interest in speculating about the underlying cause of the different fevers:

if any one, I say, requires an answer upon all these points, I am ready to confess my ignorance. No one, that I know of, has hitherto gone far enough in such matters to flatter himself for having solved these problems of Nature. For my own part, I am not ambitious of the name of a Philosopher, and those who think themselves so, may, perhaps, consider me blameable on the score of my not having attempted to pierce these mysteries. (Sydenham 1666: [1987: 101])

Rather, than attempt to unravel these mysteries, Sydenham held we must first determine what type of fever it is that is afflicting a patient, and then find out what method of cure is best suited to removing this fever. The content of Sydenham’s book was the product of this exercise, executed by careful observation of patients and the effectiveness of treatment:

To some it may appear that the method which I adopt is based upon insecure foundations. I am, however, on my part, fully convinced, and I truly affirm, that it [is] altogether proved by a manifest experience. (Sydenham 1666 [1987: 9])

Sydenham rested his whole case in support of his methods upon the fact that he had seen such treatments being effective in a large number of cases:

To bring the discussion to an end at last, I allow myself to add that the general method already described embraces the treatment of all kinds of fevers as far as I have been able to make out by careful observation. (Sydenham 1666 [1987: 63–5])

Sydenham was adamant that his was the only way that progress would be made in the treatment of illness. For example, experience showed that a cooling treatment for smallpox was most successful. This was anathema to the established medical profession, who held that warming the patient would encourage the expulsion of the morbific matter and expedite the patient’s return to health. For them, a cooling of the patient was potentially fatal. Sydenham had essentially dismissed theorising as a basis of medical practice, and replaced it with what might be described as a robust clinical empiricism—undermining long-held contemporary medical theory and the integrity of the established medical profession.

The Methodus was, in essence, a record of Sydenham’s efforts to identify different species of disease and their most effective method of cure. Locke had read the book shortly after its publication, and had taken extensive notes on it. By 1668, Locke had made Sydenham’s acquaintance, and was evidently impressed with his new medical colleague and his approach to medicine. James Tyrrell would later relate how much of an impact Sydenham had on Locke (and his friend David Thomas):

He became obsessed with Dr Sydenham, next to whom Dr Lower was esteemed a dunce and was not even credited with common sense. Dr Thomas, the physician from Salisbury, was no less admiring … This obsession made Lord Shaftesbury often compare them to three fanatics who travelled to Rome; two of them saying that the third was the Holy Spirit. (Tyrrell 1718–19 [2021: 275])

Locke’s previous interest in medicine appears to have been largely academic. While he had undertaken some work in experimental chemistry and may have participated in some of Lower’s physiological experimentation, there is no record of his having treated an actual patient prior to meeting Sydenham. Now he was accompanying Sydenham on his rounds and would take on his own patients, making detailed notes on their individual case histories. Over the next several years, Locke would provide extensive support to Sydenham’s project.

The second edition of the Methodus contained an extended section on the treatment of the plague where Sydenham re-emphasised his critique of academic medicine and its preference for theoretical speculation over effective practice:

I have ever held that any accession whatever to the art of healing, even if it went no further than the cutting of corns or the curing of toothaches, was of far higher value than all the knowledge of fine points and all the pomp of subtle speculations; matters which are as useful to the physician in driving away diseases as music is to masons in laying bricks. (Sydenham 1668 [1987: 215])

For Sydenham, you don’t need to know the cause of the disease, you simply need to find out what cures it:

the questions as to how we can cure diseases, whilst we know nothing of their causes, gives us no trouble. It is not by the knowledge of causes but by that of methods at once suitable and approved by experience that the cure of the majority of diseases is accomplished. (Sydenham 1668 [1987: 177])

Regarding his recommendation of venesection as a treatment for the plague, he relied upon a close examination of the disease itself, rather than theories about it:

Within a short period I had seen several cases; and it was with no small surprise that I discovered that this fever simulated the character and nature of the fever that I had … so successfully treated. This enabled me to prefer my own experience to any theoretical precepts. (Sydenham 1668 [1987: 205])

Observation and effectiveness were the touchstones of medical practice.

In addition to this new section, the book also presented a poem of fulsome praise for Sydenham’s approach to medicine signed “J. LOCK A. M. ex Aede Christi Oxon”, attributing to Sydenham an “equally amazing skill and success” and stating that Sydenham’s prescription of venesection had brought the plague under control:

Who would believe in Plague subdued at last, mastered by our Art and now bereft of all its ancient threats? After deaths in thousands, with graves heaped up with the dead, the dreaded scourge lies conquered by a little wound. (Sydenham 1668 [1987: 227–8])

Earlier physicians had been hampered by the obscurity of the disease’s aetiology: “The Physician ponders the Fever’s cause and course, the darkness of flames and burning without light”. Sydenham took another path:

SYDENHAM, at last, opposing both Fever and the Schools, both fever probed and treatment understood. Not for him, fires of occult corruption or those “humours” that breed fevers … Not for him those squabbles whose heat exceeds the fires. (Sydenham 1668 [1987: 228])

Locke had quickly assimilated the essential elements of Sydenham’s therapeutics. Further, as G. G. Meynell (1993) has argued, Locke was the likely source of a set of references to authors who agreed with Sydenham’s regimen for the plague.

In the summer of 1669, Sydenham contemplated a new work based upon his continued observations on smallpox. Stylometric analysis demonstrates that the manuscript Epistolary Dedication to Shaftesbury, and Preface, both in Locke’s hand, but both written in the first person from Sydenham’s perspective, were jointly authored by both Locke and Sydenham (Burrows & Anstey 2013). Locke was here helping to compose a justification for Sydenham’s approach to the treatment of the disease, and defend him against the censures of the contemporary medical profession. Around the same time Locke also drafted two extended medical essays, “Anatomia” in 1668 on the limited utility of anatomy for medicine, and “De Arte Medica” in 1669 on the practice of medicine more generally. Both are in Locke’s hand, and stylometric analysis confirms Locke as their sole author (Anstey & Burrows 2009), but both were apparently written to defend Sydenham’s medical methodology. Indeed, “Anatomia” begins with an interpolated sentence in Sydenham’s hand written in the first person, framing the essay as part of a larger treatise.

This larger treatise might also have been the reason that Sydenham’s projected work on Smallpox did not appear. Sydenham was reformulating his views on disease, supposing that each year had its own epidemic “constitution” (Bates 1975: Part II, 61–140). He set about a more comprehensive treatment of disease over several years from 1667 to 1674 and assembled his extended clinical observations in a large vellum-bound manuscript collection of essays entitled Medical Observations (Royal College of Physicians MS 572 (Sydenham 1667–74 [1991])). The early essays begin with different disease species, their symptoms and most effective method of cure, but as the manuscript continues, diseases are grouped together into constitutions. Indeed, Sydenham’s essay “Small Pox of the years 1667 & 1668” represented the first example of such a constitution (Sydenham 1667–74 [1991: 68–98]). There are approximately fifty separable essays in the Medical Observations written over 60 folio leaves (Sydenham 1667–74 [1991: 8–9]). Locke was intimately involved in the production of this manuscript, writing out ten of these essays in the manuscript in his own hand, comprising roughly one sixth of the text of the manuscript as a whole. Elsewhere in the manuscript he read and corrected Sydenham’s work, as Sydenham likewise corrected his. Amongst Locke’s papers in the Bodleian Library, there are numerous manuscripts copies of Sydenham’s essays from the “Medical Observations”. Seven are rough, corrected copies, which Locke had evidently made at Sydenham’s dictation. In addition Locke made fair copies of thirty four of the essays from the “Medical Observations”, the last, “Epidemicall diseases of the yeare 1670”, copied in the spring of 1671 (Sydenham 1667–74 [1991: 150–60]).

Combined with the text of the Methodus, the manuscript “Medical Observations” formed the basis of Sydenham’s 1676 Observationes Medicae, a hugely influential work which would eventually secure Sydenham’s reputation, become a standard medical textbook and a landmark in therapeutics. Sydenham heaped praise on Locke in the preface to the Observationes, stating that he

agrees with me as to the method that I am speaking of; a man who, in the acuteness of his intellect, in the steadiness of his judgement, in the simplicity (and by simplicity I mean excellence) of his manners, has, amongst the present generation, few equals and no superiors. This praise I may confidently attach to the name of JOHN LOCKE. (Sydenham 1676 [1848: vol. I, 6])

It is difficult overstate the proximity and intimacy of the working relationship between Locke and Sydenham in this period. From 1667 to 1671, Locke worked day-by-day, side-by-side with a radical medical empiricist who believed that you could not speculate about what existed beyond the symptoms of a disease, so you should instead create its natural history based solely on what you can observe. Locke acted as Sydenham’s amanuensis and his apologist in this period, and played a long-standing, direct, personal, practical and justificative role in the writing and publication of one of modern medicine’s foundational texts.

5. Locke on the Practice of Medicine

This “obsession” with Sydenham had a significant impact on Locke’s views about the practice of medicine. In Oxford he had worked closely with Lower on physiology and described an eclectic theory of disease based on contemporary medical theory. The essays “Anatomia” and “De Arte Medica” presented substantially different views.

“Anatomia” concerns the utility of anatomical knowledge in the practice of medicine. Excepting gross anatomy for surgeons, Locke thought anatomy of little use to the practising physician because

it is certainly some thing more subtile & fine then what our senses can take cognisance of that is the cause of the disease, they are the invisible & insensible spirits that governe preserve & disorder the aeconomie of the body. (Locke 1668 [2014: fo. 35v])

Locke now evinced an insuperable pessimism about human ability to penetrate into natural causes:

it is certaine & beyond controversy that nature perform all her operations in the body by parts soe minute. & insensible that I thinke noe body will ever hope or pretend even by the assistance of glasses or any other invention to come to a sight of them. (Locke 1668 [2014: fo. 31r])

Consequently, there is no way to determine the causes of disease:

and to tell us what organicall texture or what kinde of ferment (for whether it be donne by one or both of these ways is yet a question & like to be soe alway notwithstanding all the endeavours of the most accurate dissections) separates any part of the juices in any of the viscera, or tell us of what figures the particles of those juices are or if this could be donne (which yet is never like to be) would it at all contribute to the cure of the diseases. (Locke 1668 [2014: fo. 31r-v])

Locke alludes to both mechanical “textures” and Helmontian “ferments”, supposing we will never be able to determine which is operative. Instead Locke urged physicians to use clinical experience, rather than speculative theory:

how regulate his dose, to mix his simples & to prescribe all in a due method, all this is only from history & the advantage of a diligent observation of these diseases, of their begining progresse & ways of cure. (Locke 1668 [2014: fo. 31v])

To illustrate his point, Locke turned to the example of respiration, a subject on which he had recently been undertaking cutting edge research with his colleague Richard Lower. He now presented a very different perspective:

whether respiration serve to coole the bloud, or give vent to its vapours, or to adde a ferment to it, or to pound & mix its minute particles or whether any thing else is in dispute amongst the learned from whose controversys about it are like to arise rather more doubts then any cleare determination of the point & all that anatomy has donne in this case as well as severall others is but to offer new conjectures & fresh matter for endlesse disputations. (Locke 1668 [2014: fo. 33v])

What he had previously been deeply engaged upon only a few years prior, he now deemed largely pointless, again rejecting a range of theoretical explanations: Galenic cooling, Helmontian ferments or mechanical “pounding & mixing”. We cannot understand nature’s operations, so these attempted explanations are otiose. Such a change of attitude might explain why, according to Tyrrell, Locke now regarded Lower as a “dunce”.

Locke was now insistent that we cannot penetrate into nature’s causation, and, as such, attempted theoretical explanations are meaningless:

Ther is some thing therefor in the body & the juices too curious & fine for us to discerne which performes the offices in the severall parts governs the health & produces the various motions in the body … Therefor this hidden δημιουργὸς[2] was soe much out of the reach of the senses yea & apprehension of the ancients that not knowing what to conceive it they went above the clouds for a name cald it φυσίν ἀνάλογον τῷ τῶν ἀστρῶν στοιχείῳ,[3] an expression however, obscure & insignificant more like to give us a usefull notion of the thing, then the anatomist to shew us this archeus by which name Helmont has as clearely & intelligibly explaind it to us as Aristotle by his description. (Locke 1668 [2014: fo. 36v])

Where Locke had previously endorsed the “archeus” as an explanation of disease, he now dismissed it as “obscure and unintelligible”. It is notable that this dismissal of both Aristotle’s “δημιουργὸς” and Helmont’s “archeus” is grounded upon both concepts being “out of the reach of the senses” and therefore the “apprehension”. This presupposes a substantive empiricism as the grounding of meaningful explanation—if a concept is not derived from the senses, it is “obscure & insignificant” and cannot have meaning. Further, it places such concepts “out of the reach” of our apprehension, meaning they cannot “intelligibly” explain anything.

“De Arte Medica” took a broader view of the practice of medicine, but the basic outline of the critique was identical:

Learned men of former ages imploid a great part of their time & thoughts in searching out the hidden causes of distempers, were curious in imagining the secret workemanship of nature & the severall unperceptible tooles wherwith she wrought, & puting all these phansies togeather fashioned to them selves systems & hypotheses. (Locke 1669 [2014: fo. 49r])

But this is all lost labour, because we will never be able to know the causes of disease:

it being perhaps noe absurdity to thinke that this great & curious fabrique of the world the workemanship of the almighty cannot be perfectly comprehended by any understandg but his that made it. (Locke 1669 [2014: fo. 53r])

God’s work in nature is simply beyond human comprehension. Locke consequently endorsed an empirical, rather than theoretical, approach to medicine

the begining & improvemt, of useful arts, & the assistances of human life, have all sprung from industry & observacon true knowled grew first in the world, by experience & rationall operations & had this method beene continued & all mens thoughts beene imploid to adde their owne tryalls to the observation of others noe question physick as well as many other arts, had been in a far better condition then now it is. (Locke 1669 [2014: fo. 52r])

These medical essays present a new approach to medicine, based upon a new set of premises. First, Locke places a significant emphasis upon the evidence of the senses—theories not based in sensory evidence are dismissed as meaningless. Second, Locke sets very strict limits on the scope of human knowledge, holding that we will simply never be able to penetrate into nature’s operations, because no-one but God can fully understand God’s creation. Consequently, third, speculation about the unobservable causes of disease are at best wasted and at worst both meaningless and misleading. This rules out both classical medical theorising and more recent innovations like the chymical theories of Helmont. So, fourth, physicians should focus on the “history” and observation of diseases, “their begining progresse & ways of cure”. Locke here expands on Sydenham’s precepts to more rigorously explain and defend them, and in doing so, moves away from his earlier approach to medicine. (In contrast, Anstey 2011a and 2011b supposes that Locke remained a “chymical” physician for the entirety of his career, but also promoted Sydenham as a proxy for Locke’s own innovations in medicine. This is debated in Walmsley 2012, Anstey 2015, and Walmsley 2016.)

6. Locke’s Methodology in the Essay concerning Human Understanding

Locke began to write the Essay in the summer of 1671, no more than a few weeks after Sydenham wrote “Epidemicall diseases of the year 1670” in his “Medical Observations”, which Locke later made his own manuscript copy of. The first still extant draft of the Essay, now known as Draft A, shared the same basic philosophical outlook as Locke evinced in “Anatomia” and “De Arte Medica”, namely (1) we have no knowledge of nature’s unobservable causes, (2) we cannot therefore resolve disputes about such causes and consequently (3) we should rely solely upon experience as the foundation of natural philosophical knowledge.

Locke begins his account in robustly empiricist fashion “I imagin that all knowledg is founded on and ultimately derives it self from sense” (Draft A, §1, 1), noting that

the clearest best & most certain knowledg that man kinde can possibly have of things existing without him is but Experience, which is noe thing but the Exercise & observation of his senses about particular objects. (Draft A, §33, 62–63)

But he re-iterated the strict limits he set in “Anatomia” regarding the reach of the senses. Knowledge of cause and effect pertained only to the observable level:

I can have noe other certein undoubted knowledg of the constant connection of assigned causes & effects then what I have by my senses. which too is but a grosse kinde of knowledg is noe more then this, that I see when I apply fire to gold it melts it. (Draft A, §15, 30)

We have this “grosse kind of knowledg” because we have “noe knowledg of the modus operandi, the way how these effects are produced” (Draft A, §15, 31). Our senses have a limited ability to provide such knowledge:

because these alterations being made by particles soe small & minute that they come not within the observation of my senses I cannot get knowledg how they operate, but only am informd by my senses that the alterations are indeed made from whence by the by we may take a litle light how much in the information of our understandings we are beholding to our senses. (Draft A, §15, 31)

This meant that we had no way of determining which of several theoretical descriptions were correct. Propositions

which being concerning matters out of the reach of our senses are capable neither of Observation nor consequently Testimony

were of two sorts: firstly concerning the spiritual world and secondly,

Concerning the existence, modifications & manner of operation of insensible materiall things. (Draft A, §38, 65)

Locke gave examples of what he had in mind:

Natural spirits in animals. The forme soule or Effluviums of a load stone whereby it draws iron. (Draft A, §38, 65)

Natural spirits were the Galenic explanation of how creatures were nourished and grew and “formes” were Aristotelean. The reference to the “soule” of a lodestone likely refers to Gilbert’s De Magnete. The reference to “Effluviums” may hint at mechanical explanations often employed by Boyle. These possible explanations were used indifferently. Being “out of the reach of our senses” they were “capable neither of Observation nor consequently Testimony”. Locke alluded to mechanical explanations in Draft A, but only to illustrate our lack of knowledge of causes:

For had we but senses that could discover to us the particles of water their figure site motion &c when it is fluid. And also the different postures of those very particles, or the addition or seperation of some particles &c when the water was frozen i.e hardend, we should as well know the very modus or way whereby cold produces hardness & consistency in water, as we doe the way how a joyner puts several peices of wood togeather to make a box or table which by tenants nails & pins we well enough perceive how it hangs togeather. And the motions of an animal would be as intelligible to us as those of a watch. (Draft A, §15, 31)

Yet he then continued:

But our senses faileing us in the discovery of those fine & insensible particles our understandings are unavoidably in the darke. (Draft A, §15, 31)

At this point in the development of his philosophical career, Locke did not endorse the mechanical philosophy, as he was committed to the more fundamental view that knowledge is bounded by sensation and human senses are unable to penetrate into the operations of nature. Mechanism was thus as much an unknowable explanation as Aristotelian “formes” or magnetic “soules”. These were views that Locke developed and elaborated over the several previous years in close collaboration with Sydenham. There was thus no endorsement of the corpuscular philosophy, and no argument for a distinction between primary and secondary qualities.

Another manuscript draft of the Essay, now referred to as Draft B, written shortly after Draft A, reiterated the same basic philosophical precepts. Locke remained committed to the view that human capability placed strict limits on what we could know since we have

but some few superficial Ideas of things discoverd to us only by Sensation or Reflection. we have noe knowledg beyond that much lesse of the essence of things being destitute of facultys to atteine it. (Draft B, §94, 211)

Consequently,

when soever we would proceed beyond those simple Ideas we have from Sensation & reflection (which we can in our whole extent of knowledg & imagination only extend enlarge repeat & joyn togeather) & peirce farther into the nature of things we fall presently into darknesse & obscurity. perplexedness & difficultys & can discover noe thing farther but our owne shortsightednesse & ignorance. (Draft B, §94, 211–12)

But in this draft Locke developed a significant iteration in his views about unobservable phenomena. Locke based his discussion of natural causation in Draft B largely upon the work produced in Draft A and most of the text on this subject in sections 137 and 139 were copied from the previous text. Section 138, however, was entirely new to Draft B. This section, entitled “The efficacy of causes can be imagind to be noething but motion”, advanced a new consideration:

though in the effects we dayly see produced in the world we perceive or know very little of the ways whereby their causes operate yet I thinke I may venture to say we can hardly conceive their efficacy to consist in any thing but motion. (Draft B, §138, 256)

This was a sweeping assertion: Locke was saying that all natural events could only be conceived of as effects of the motion of bodies. Locke went on to explain his reasoning in section 150, during a discussion of the “power” of one thing to effect another:

efficacy or action how ever various & the effects almost infinite we can I thinke conceive in Intellectuall agents to be noething else but modes of thinkeing in Corporeall noething else but modifications of motion, I say I thinke we cannot conceive to be any other but these two for what ever sort of action besides these produces any effect I confesse my self to have noe notion nor Idea of & soe are as far from my thoughts apprehension & knowledge & as much in the darke to me as the Ideas of colours to a blinde man or the apprehension of ten senses are to me. (Draft B, §150, 262)

Locke asserted that he had an idea of corporeal efficacy in the case of moving and impacting bodies—he could see how motion and impact caused change in the natural work. Moreover, he asserted that that this was the only idea he had of how natural causes work. This would then mark a significant contrast between an Aristotelean “δημιουργὸς”, or an Helmontian “Archeus”, and a mechanical explanation. In the case of the former two, we “reach beyond the senses” to posit these entities of which we have no ideas grounded in sensation, where in the latter, we refer to processes we have actual experience of. So while Locke continued to maintain that our senses would never allow us to penetrate into nature’s operations, we can now “intelligibly” describe them in mechanical terms, since we have ideas of mechanical interactions. This line of argument, that mechanical explanations were more intelligible than their contemporary counterparts, was one that Boyle had and would advance in a number of publications (see Anstey 2019), and one that Locke now began to evince.

For Locke, then it appears that to meaningfully talk and think about processes at the unobservable level, we can only employ ideas from everyday experience. Thus, in so far as the mechanical hypothesis was the only theory that relied upon the central idea of the motion and impact of bodies, and given Locke’s stated belief that motion was the only idea by which we can conceive/imagine corporeal causation, mechanism was the only conceivable theory available to us. For Locke, it was the only conceivable theory, full stop. This then, was the fundamental basis for Locke’s limited endorsement of the mechanical philosophy—it was an “intelligible”, meaningful description of the unobservable realm, where other theories relied upon explanations with no tangible grounding in experience.

Locke would reiterate the same basic principles in the published Essay. As he had suggested in “De Arte Medica”, we can’t know how bodies work, because God’s creation was beyond our comprehension:

There is not so contemptible a Plant or Animal, that does not confound the most inlarged Understanding. Though the familiar use of Things about us, take off our Wonder; yet it cures not our Ignorance. When we come to examine the Stones, we tread on; or the Iron, we daily handle, we presently find, we know not their Make; and can give no reason, of the different Qualities we find in them, ’Tis evident the internal constitution whereon the Properties depend, is unknown to us … The Workmanship of the All-wise, and Powerful God, in the great Fabrick of the Universe, and every part thereof, further exceeds the Capacity and Comprehension of the most inquisitive and intelligent Man. (Locke 1690: III.vi.9 [1975: 444])

Consequently, the only way to understand the world was to undertake the same sort of careful and diligent observation of the world that a doctor would undertake of a patient—that is, through natural history:

In the Knowledge of Bodies, we must be content to glean, what we can, from particular Experiments: since we cannot from a Discovery of their real Essences, grasp at a time whole Sheaves; and in bundles comprehend the Nature and Properties of whole Species together. Where our Enquiry is concerning Co-existence, or Repugnancy to co-exist, which by Contemplation of our Ideas, we cannot discover; there Experience, Observation, and natural History, must give us by our Senses, and by retail, an insight into corporeal Substances. (Locke 1690: IV.xii.12 [1975: 647])

Similarly, Locke’s recommendation of the mechanism was couched in terms of its intelligibility in describing the unobservable world, given our limited faculties:

I have here instanced in the corpuscularian Hypothesis, as that which is thought to go farthest in an intelligible Explication of the Qualities of Bodies; and I fear the Weakness of humane Understanding is scarce able to substitute another, which will afford us a fuller and clearer discovery of the necessary Connexion, and Co-existence, of the Powers, which are to be observed united in several sorts of them. (Locke 1690: IV.iii.16 [1975: 547–8])

But because this recommendation was based on what we can apprehend, Locke considered it perfectly possible that there are other modes of natural operation, but these are likely inconceivable to us and we are unlikley to ever understand how nature operates. Locke went on:

This at least is certain, that, whichever Hypothesis be clearest and truest, (for of that it is not my business to determine,) our Knowledge concerning corporeal Substances will be very little advanced by any of them, till we are made to see what Qualities and Powers of Bodies have a necessary Connexion or Repugnancy one with another; which in the present State of Philosophy I think we know but to a very small degree: and I doubt whether, with those Faculties we have, we shall ever be able to carry our general Knowledge (I say not particular Experience) in this part much further. Experience is that which in this part we must depend on. (Locke 1690: IV.iii.16 [1975: 548])

Given the limited state of our faculties, experience is what we must more generally rely upon. Locke’s endorsement of the corpuscularian philosophy was a function of our cognitive and sensory faculties. Locke was well aware that there were numerous difficulties that the corpuscularian theory could not well account for—the cohesion of matter, or the relation of idea of secondary qualities to their primary quality causes, for example. But these were just examples of the wider weakness of human understanding and the limited recommendation he could make of any natural philosophical theory about unobservable phenonema.

7. Locke on Hypotheses

In “De Arte Medica” Locke noted a natural predeliction to formulate hypotheses:

mans understanding, which not contenting its self to observe the operation of nature & the event of things, is very inquisitive after their cause & very restlesse & unquiet till in those things wch it is conversant about, it has framed to its self some hypothesis & laid a foundation whereon to establish all its reasonings. (Locke 1669 [2014: fo. 50r])

These motivations might provide an explanation for the creation of hypotheses, but it would not make them any more useful:

supposeing v.g. that too much acidity in the bloud or other juices caused the gout a fever or epilepsie what indication would this give a practicall physitian in the cure of either of these diseases tis true twill presently be suggested he must mortifie this acidity … he that shall proceed in such grounds as these may indeed constitute fine doctrines & lay plausible hypotheses but will not have much to brag of his cures. for the alterations that both our food & physick receives in our mouths stomachs guts glandules &c are soe many & soe unintelligible to us before they come to the places we designe them, that they are quite another thing then we imagine & worke not as we phansie but as nature pleases. (Locke 1669 [2014: fo. 37v])

Locke’s wariness of hypotheses extended into the published Essay. Book IV, Chapter 12, Section 12 was titled “In the study of nature we must beware of hypotheses and wrong principles”, and lamented:

He that shall consider, how little general Maxims, precarious Principles, and Hypotheses laid down at Pleasure, have promoted true Knowledge, or helped to satisfy the Enquiries of rational Men after real Improvements; How little, I say, the setting out at that end, has for many Ages together advanced Men’s Progress, towards the Knowledge of natural Philosophy, will think, we have Reason to thank those, who in this latter Age have taken another Course, and have trod out to us, though not an easier way to learned Ignorance, yet a surer way to profitable Knowledge. (Locke 1690: IV.xii.12 [1975: 647])

This was hardly a ringing endorsement of hypotheses as a means to knowledge, though the next section on “The true use of hypotheses” did concede that they could be useful despite our general ignorance about nature’s modes of operation:

Hypotheses, if they are well made, are at least great helps to the Memory, and often direct us to new discoveries. But my Meaning is, that we should not take up any one too hastily, (which the Mind, that would always penetrate into the Causes of Things, and have Principles to rest on, is very apt to do,) till we have very well examined Particulars, and made several Experiments, in that thing which we would explain by our Hypothesis, and see whether it will agree to them all. (Locke 1690: IV.xii.13 [1975: 648])

It is notable that Locke’s diagnosis of the human predeliction to formulate hypotheses is identical to that he had advanced decades earlier in “De Arte Medica” when working with Sydenham.

Locke did note that analogy could be helpful in formulating helpful hypotheses, titling Book IV, Chapter xvi, Section 12 “In things which sense cannot discover, analogy is the great rule of probability”, concluding that:

This sort of Probability, which is the best conduct of rational Experiments, and the rise of Hypothesis, has also its Use and Influence; and a wary Reasoning from Analogy leads us often into the discovery of Truths, and useful Productions, which would otherwise lie concealed. (Locke 1690: IV.xvi.12 [1975: 666–7])

Hypothesis, then, can play a role for Locke, despite our natural inclination to jump to conclusions and place too much emphasis on our own suppositions. But Locke was always clear that analogy and hypothesis were supposition, and while they might produce helpful outcomes, they might equally lead to error. In one of the last sections of the “Conduct of the Understanding” written between 1690 and 1704, Locke noted that

Analogy is of great use to the Mind in many Cases, especially in natural Philosophy, and that part of it chiefly which consists in happy and successful Experiments. But here we must take care that we keep ourselves within that wherein the Analogy consists. For Example, the acid Oyl of Vitriol is found to be good in such as case, therefore the Spirit of Niter or Vinegar may be us’d in the like case. If the good Effect of it be owing wholly to the Acidity of it, the trial may be justified; but if there be something else besides the Acidity in the Oil of Vitriol, which produces the good we desire in the case, we mistake that for Analogy, which is not, and suffer our Understanding to be misguided by a wrong supposition of Analogy where there is none. (Locke 1690–1704: 115)

These were the same sorts of considerations that informed Locke’s wariness about hypotheses in “De Arte Medica”. We simply can’t be sure about what’s going on at the unobservable level, so while we can formulate hypotheses, and would be wise to use analogy to do so, nature’s impenetrable operations might frustrate us still. That a hypothesis discovers some new truth does not seem to confer any special status for Locke—hypotheses work in some cases, but don’t in others, and there is little sense in Locke’s remarks that any success might confer some additional insight into the unobservable operations of nature, or that these operations are discernible through this success. This serves to illustrate the essentially pre-Newtonian cast of the Essay, begun in 1671, and in large part completed before the Principia was published in 1687. Placing Locke’s remarks within the context of his medical work illuminates Locke’s motivations and meaning in his writings on natural philosophy and his approach to the philosophy of science in the Essay.

8. Locke on Human Understanding

More generally, Locke’s entire method in his study of human understanding was framed by the same basic precepts that underpinned his medical thinking. When describing how he would undertake his enquiry into the “original, certainty, and extent of human knowledge, together with the grounds and degrees of belief, opinion, and assent”, he first stated what he would refrain from attempting:

I shall not at present meddle with the Physical Consideration of the Mind; or trouble myself to examine wherein its Essence consists; or by what Motions of our Spirits, or Alterations of our Bodies, we come to have any Sensation by our Organs, or any Ideas in our Understandings; and whether those Ideas do in their Formation, any, or all of them, depend on Matter, or no. These are Speculations, which, however curious and entertaining, I shall decline, as lying out of my Way, in the Design I am now upon. (Locke 1690: I.i.2 [1975: 43])

Instead, Locke would confine himself to observing and cataloguing the faculties of the understanding to understand their capability and reach:

It shall suffice to my present Purpose, to consider the discerning Faculties of a Man, as they are employ’d about the Objects, which they have to do with: and I shall imagine I have not wholly misimploy’d myself in the Thoughts I shall have on this Occasion, if, in this Historical, plain Method, I can give any Account of the Ways, whereby our Understandings come to attain those Notions of Things we have. (Locke 1690: I.i.2 [1975: 44])

Locke’s method in philosophy was to pursue a natural history of the understanding without speculation about its unobservable structure, much as Sydenham’s method in medicine was a natural history of disease with a similar disregard for speculation about aetiology. Locke began his natural history of the understanding in 1671 after having worked side-by-side with Sydenham for the 4 years immediately prior. Locke’s key assumptions about the world—that God made it essentially unknowable, and that natural history is the only reliable method to useful knowledge—were derived directly from his work with Sydenham. Locke’s philosophical work was, in key respects, the application of Sydenham’s medical methodology writ large.

Bibliography

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Other Internet Resources

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