Appendix 4

An Epistemic Advantage of Drawing on Well-Supported Auxiliary Hypotheses

Suppose that hypothesis \(h_i\) does very poorly as compared to \(h_j\) on evidence \((c \cdot e)\) relative to the best supported (conjunction of) auxiliaries \(a\) — i.e. \(P[h_i \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (a \cdot d)] / P[h_j \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (a \cdot d)]\) is quite small, due to the very small size of the likelihood ratio \(P[e \mid h_i \cdot c \cdot (a \cdot d)] / P[e \mid h_j \cdot c \cdot (a \cdot d)]\). And suppose that for an alternative (conjunction of) auxiliaries, \(a_r\), hypothesis \(h_i\) does much better on the same evidence — i.e. the likelihood ratio \(P[e \mid h_i \cdot c \cdot (a_r \cdot d)] / P[e \mid h_j \cdot c \cdot (a \cdot d)]\) is much larger than 1. (Here \(h_j\) continues to draw on the best supported auxiliary, \(a\).) This situation clearly calls for testing \((h_i \cdot a_r)\), the conjunction of \(h_i\) with its assisting auxiliary \(a_r\), against \((h_j \cdot a)\), the conjunction of \(h_j\) with the best supported auxiliary \(a\). Via Rule RB we have, \[ \frac{P[(h_i \cdot a_r) \mid c \cdot e \cdot d]}{P[(h_j \cdot a) \mid c \cdot e \cdot d]} = \frac{P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a_r) \cdot c \cdot d]}{P[e \mid (h_j \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d]} \times \frac{P[(h_i \cdot a_r) \mid c \cdot d]}{P[(h_j \cdot a) \mid c \cdot d]}. \] This may apparently rehabilitate \(h_i\) by making the corresponding likelihood ratio, \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a_r) \cdot c \cdot d] / P[e \mid (h_j \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d]\), quite large. So, has bringing \(a_r\) to bear succeeded in overcoming the challenge to \(h_i\), even though \(a_r\) is evidentially inferior to \(a\) on the body of evidence \((c^* \cdot e^*)\) directly relevant to these auxiliaries?

Perhaps not at all. For, when we test \((h_i \cdot a_r)\) against \((h_j \cdot a)\), it is important to include the total body of evidence, including the evidence \((c^* \cdot e^*)\) that bears on \(a_r\) versus \(a\). Via several applications of Rule RB together with three reasonable suppositions about probabilistic independence, we obtain the following two results, where

for some very small value of \(\epsilon\).

Alternative Auxiliary Formula 1

Furthermore,

Alternative Auxiliary Formula 2

If \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d] > 0\), then

To see what these formulae tell us, let’s begin with AAF2, which may be a bit easier to comprehend than AAF1. To apply AAF2, we consider cases where the \(a\) based likelihood for the evidence according to \(h_i\) is non-zero, \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d] > 0.\)

Let us assume, as seems reasonable, that \(P[h_i \mid a_r \cdot c \cdot d]\) is more or less the same size as (or at least not much larger than) \(P[h_i \mid a \cdot c \cdot d]\). That is, let’s assume that auxiliary \(a_r\) doesn’t provide notably stronger evidence for \(h_i\) than does \(a\): \(P[h_i \mid a_r \cdot c \cdot d] \lessapprox P[h_i \mid a \cdot c \cdot d].\)

Now, suppose that auxiliary hypothesis \(a\) is very much more strongly supported by the body of evidence \((c^* \cdot e^*)\) than alternative hypothesis \(a_r\). So strongly that the comparative support value for \(P[a_r \mid (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d] / P[a \mid (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d] = \epsilon\) is small enough to neutralize whatever increase the auxiliary \(a_r\) might provide to the likelihood value \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a_r) \cdot c \cdot d]\) over the \(a\) based likelihood value \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d]\). That is, suppose that the evidence \((c^* \cdot e^*)\) is strong enough to make \[\frac{P[a_r \mid (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d]}{P[a \mid (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d]} = \; \epsilon \; \; \lessapprox \; \; \frac{P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d]}{P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a_r) \cdot c \cdot d]}. \]

Then, according to the Alternative Auxiliary Formula 2 we must have, \[ \frac{P[(h_i \cdot a_r) \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d]}{P[(h_j \cdot a) \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d]} \; \; \lessapprox \; \; \frac{P[h_i \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (a \cdot d)]}{P[h_j \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (a \cdot d)]}. \]

Thus, when \(h_i\) is already doing poorly as compared to \(h_j\) on evidence \((c \cdot e)\) relative to the best supported (conjunction of) auxiliaries \(a\) — i.e. when \(P[h_i \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (a \cdot d)] / P[h_j \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (a \cdot d)]\) is quite small — allying \(h_i\) with an “evidentially more congenial”, but less well-supported, auxiliary \(a_r\) will not usually be much help. The alliance of \(h_i\) with such an auxiliary \(a_r\) can only significantly improve its comparative support when \(\epsilon,\) the strength of the evidence against \(a_r\), is weak enough to permit \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a_r) \cdot c \cdot d] \times \epsilon\) to be significantly greater than \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d] > 0\).

When \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d] = 0\), Rule RB guarantees that the \(a\) based posterior probability of \(h_i\) must be 0: \(P[h_i \mid (c \cdot e) \cdot (a \cdot d)] = 0.\) In that case, the \(a_r\) based likelihood, \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a_r) \cdot c \cdot d] > 0\), supplies significant help to \(h_i\) by providing it a posterior probability greater than 0. However, due to the evidence against \(a_r\) as compared to \(a\), this posterior probability may still remain significantly smaller than the \(a\) based posterior probability of \(h_j\). Alternative Auxiliary Formula 1 shows precisely how these considerations apply.

Suppose that auxiliary hypothesis \(a\) is very much more strongly supported by the body of evidence \((c^* \cdot e^*)\) than alternative hypothesis \(a_r\). So strongly that the comparative support value for \(P[a_r \mid (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d] / P[a \mid (c^* \cdot e^*) \cdot d] = \epsilon\) is small enough to overwhelm whatever advantage the auxiliary \(a_r\) might provide to increase the likelihood value \(P[e \mid (h_i \cdot a_r) \cdot c \cdot d]\) over the value \(P[e \mid (h_j \cdot a) \cdot c \cdot d]\). That is, suppose that the evidence \((c^* \cdot e^*)\) is strong enough to make

Then, according to the AAF1 we must have,

Furthermore, if \(\epsilon\) is small enough that

Then AFF1 tells us that

Thus, strong evidence against alternative auxiliary hypothesis \(a_r\) as compared to \(a\) can result in strong evidence against \((h_i \cdot a_r)\) as compared to \((h_j \cdot a)\).