Supplement to Relevance Logic

The Logic S

Here is a Hilbert-style axiomatisation of the logic \(\mathbf{S}\) (for “syllogism”).

Our language contains propositional variables, parentheses and one connective: implication.

Axiom Scheme Axiom Name
1. \((B\rightarrow C) \rightarrow((A\rightarrow B) \rightarrow(A\rightarrow C))\) Prefixing
2. \((A\rightarrow B) \rightarrow((B\rightarrow C) \rightarrow(A\rightarrow C))\) Suffixing
Rule Name
1. \(A \rightarrow B, B \rightarrow C \vdash A \rightarrow C\) Transitivity
2. \(A \rightarrow B \vdash(B \rightarrow C) \rightarrow(A \rightarrow C)\) Rule Suffixing
3. \(B \rightarrow C \vdash(A \rightarrow B) \rightarrow(A \rightarrow C)\) Rule Prefixing

The logic T-W is \(\mathbf{S}\) with the addition of the identity axiom \((A\rightarrow A)\). Martin’s theorem is that no instance of the identity axiom is a theorem of \(\mathbf{S}\). It is a corollary of Martin’s theorem that in T-W if both \(A\rightarrow B\) and \(B\rightarrow A\) are provable, then \(A\) and \(B\) are the same formula (see Anderson, Belnap, and Dunn (1992) §66).

Copyright © 2020 by
Edwin Mares <Edwin.Mares@vuw.ac.nz>

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