Material Constitution

First published Wed Feb 25, 2009; substantive revision Wed Jan 14, 2026

What is the relationship between a clay statue and the lump of clay from which it is formed? We might say that the lump constitutes the statue, but what is the relation of material constitution? Some insist that constitution is identity, on the grounds that distinct material objects cannot occupy the same place at the same time. Others argue that constitution is not identity, since the statue and the lump differ in important respects. Still others take cases like this to motivate revisionary views about persistence, identity, or existence.

This article presents some of the most famous puzzles of material constitution and evaluates some of the most important replies.

1. The Puzzles

Puzzles of material constitution played an important role in the development of Greek philosophy and continue to be a source of much debate today. Here, we introduce four of the most famous puzzles.

The Debtor’s Paradox. The ancient playwright Epicharmus tells of a poor but resourceful debtor. When approached for payment, the man responds with a riddle. If you add a pebble to a collection, you no longer have the same number. If you add a length to a cubit, you no longer have the same measure. In the same way, if you add a bit of matter to an existing portion, you no longer have the same entity. Since man is nothing more than a material object whose matter is constantly changing, we do not survive from one moment to the next. The debtor concludes that he is not the same person who took out the loan and cannot be held responsible for the payment. In response, the creditor strikes the riddler, who protests the abuse. The creditor expresses sympathy, but points out that he cannot be held responsible since he is no longer the same person who committed the assault. The scene is intended to be comedic, but the argument is no laughing matter. The man who incurred the debt was constituted by one portion of matter, M1, whereas the man who is approached for payment is constituted by a distinct portion, M2 (perhaps M2 consists of M1, together with some new matter). If constitution is identity, then the debtor’s reasoning is sound: the man approached for payment is not the one who incurred the debt. More generally, this reasoning suggests that material objects cannot survive the addition of any new parts. (Note: the claim that constitution is identity is distinct from the thesis of “composition as identity”—on the latter, see section 8 of the entry on identity.)

The Puzzle of Dion and Theon. The Stoic philosopher Chrysippus considers the case of Dion and Theon, where Dion is a normal human being and Theon is the part of Dion consisting of everything but his right foot. If the foot is removed, then Theon obviously survives the operation, for his parts remain completely unchanged. But, in that case, it seems as if Dion does not survive the operation, for otherwise we would have two people in the same place at the same time. Hence, Dion does not survive the loss of his foot. More generally, this reasoning would show that material objects cannot survive the loss of any parts. (A more recent version of the puzzle, due to Peter Geach, concerns Tibbles and Tib, where Tibbles is a cat and Tib consists of everything but Tibbles’s tail.)

The Ship of Theseus Puzzle. The ancient historian Plutarch describes the famous ship of Theseus whose parts were all gradually replaced over time. The resulting vessel was eventually displayed in Athens, where philosophers debated whether it was still the same ship. In the modern era, Thomas Hobbes imagined a scenario in which a custodian collects the original planks and puts them back in the original arrangement. In this version of the story, we are left with two seafaring vessels, one on display in Athens and one in possession of the custodian. But where is the original Ship of Theseus? Some will say that it is with the museum, since boats can survive the gradual replacement of parts. Others will say that it is with the custodian, since constructs can survive being taken apart and put back together. Both arguments seem compelling, but together they imply that the ship survives twice over. We get an equally odd result by working backwards. There are clearly two ships at the end of the story, but then both of those vessels would have to have been around at the beginning, for the reasons just given. So, at the beginning of the story, there were two ships of Theseus occupying the same place at the same time—one of which would go on to the museum and one of which would end up with the custodian.

The Puzzle of the Statue and the Clay. Various ancient philosophers, including Aristotle, pointed out that statues seem to differ in important respects from the portions of matter from which they are made. Suppose that a sculptor purchases a lump of clay on Monday which he names ‘Lump’. The artist then sculpts the clay into a statue on Tuesday, titling his work ‘David’. It is tempting to think that there is a single objet present in this case—David just is Lump. But, on reflection, the statue and the lump of clay appear to differ. The latter, for example, existed on Monday, while the former did not. Moreover, the lump could survive being squashed tomorrow, whereas the statue could not. This would imply the distinctness of David and Lump, since Leibniz’s Law requires identical objects to have all the same features.

These cases differ in detail, but raise a common problem. (Another famous puzzle—the problem of the many—raises significantly different issues and is dealt with in a separate entry.) We will focus on the case of the statue and the clay, and we will formulate the challenge as follows:

  1. David did not exist on Monday (but does exist on Tuesday).
  2. Lump did exist on Monday (and also exists on Tuesday).
  3. If (1) and (2), then David is not identical to Lump.
  4. [So] David is not identical to Lump.

The premises of the argument are plausible, but the conclusion implies the possibility of spatially coincident objects—something which we ordinarily take to be impossible (Wiggins 1968: 90). Moreover, the claim that the David is not identical to Lump seems to conflict with at least some of our ordinary judgements about this kind of case (Lewis 1986: 252). For example, it is natural to think that David is a lump of clay which has been formed into the shape of a man; this entails that David is a lump of clay. Assuming there is only one such lump present, it would follow that David is identical to Lump. Hence, there appears to be a tension in our ordinary ways of thinking about such cases. (For more more on the connection between constitution and ordinary language, see Pickel 2010, Almotahari 2014, and van Elswyk 2018; for a more detailed statement of the problem of material constitution, see Rea 1995, 1997.)

Generally speaking, there are five potential replies to this argument. First, one could accept (4) and admit that David is not identical to Lump. We consider this idea in sections 2 and 3, when we discuss the constitution view of David Wiggins (1968) and the temporal parts theory of David Lewis (1976). Second, one could deny (1) by either rejecting the existence of David or by insisting that David existed on Monday. We examine these approaches in section 4, where we review the eliminativist views of Peter Unger (1979), Peter van Inwagen (1990), and Roderick Chisholm (1979). Third, one could deny (2) by either rejecting the existence of Lump (as the eliminativist does) or by claiming that Lump does not survive being shaped into a statue. We consider the second option in section 5, when we discuss the dominant kinds view of Michael Burke (1992). Fourth, one could deny (3) by rejecting the standard formulation of Leibniz’s Law. We consider this response in section 6, where we address the relative identity theory of Peter Geach (1967). Finally, one could claim that the debate is in some sense verbal or otherwise defective, so that the alleged puzzle is not worth our time. We examine this idea in section 7, when we look at the deflationist views of Rudolf Carnap (1950) and others. (Note: while our focus throughout will be on material objects like statues and lumps of clay, similar issues arise for other entities, including events, properties, and groups—see, for example, Pfeifer 1989, Shoemaker 2003, and Uzquiano 2004a.)

2. Coincident Objects

The most common reply to the puzzle of material constitution is to embrace the conclusion: David and Lump are numerically distinct, spatially coincident objects. This view is sometimes referred to as the constitution view since it holds that the statue is constituted by, but not identical to, the lump in question. As David Wiggins (1968: 91) puts it, the constituted object “consists in” and is “nothing over and above” the object from which it is made. (For more on the nature of constitution, see Wasserman 2004, Wilson 2007, and Kovac 2020.)

The constitution view is extremely popular, having been defended by Wiggins (1968, 2001), Simons (1985), Yablo (1987), Lowe (1995, 2003), Baker (1997, 2000), Thomson (1998), Shoemaker (1988, 1999), Fine (2000, 2003), Hawthorne (2006), Koslicki (2008), and many others. Indeed, the view is sometimes described as “the standard account” (Burke 1992). Why not join the crowd?

“Just try to walk through a wall,” quips the skeptic. “Two things can’t be in the same place at the same time!”

In response, the constitution theorist will point out that David and Lump—unlike you and the wall—share the same parts. That explains how they are able to share the same space. (Wiggins 1968) So too, the sharing of parts—what is sometimes called material coincidence—would explain how those objects share the same weight, shape, and so on. (Zimmerman 1995: 89, n.57)

Material coincidence may explain how spatial coincidence is possible, but what about material coincidence itself? On the face of it, the idea that two things can share the exact same parts is no more plausible than the claim that they can fit into the same region of space.

In response, the constitution theorist could simply insist that objects like David and Lump coincide this way. (Thomson 1983) However, this would require giving up on classical mereology, which takes wholes to be individuated by parts in the same way that sets are determined by members. Alternatively, some constitution theorists have claimed that David and Lump share many of the same parts without sharing all. For example, Baker (2000: 81) suggests that David’s nose is a part of David, but not a part of Lump. Others claim that coinciding objects share all the same material parts but differ in some non-material aspect. The most famous version of this idea goes back to Aristotle and his view that objects are compounds of matter and form (see Rea 1998, Koslicki 2008, and section 8 of the entry on Aristotle’s metaphysics; for a different way of developing this general strategy, see McDaniel 2001, Paul 2002, and Jago 2021).

Whether or not David and Lump share all the same parts, it is clear that they share many of the same properties. For example, both have the same weight, shape, coloring, and so on. Indeed, the two seem to be perfect duplicates, right down to their subatomic structure. But this raises a puzzle: how could duplicates of this kind differ with respect to their temporal properties, persistence conditions, and the like? After all, those differences must be grounded in more basic differences between the objects. But there doesn’t seem to be any such differences between Lump and David. (For versions of this worry, see Simons 1987: 225–6, Burke 1992, and Olson 2001. Note that this concern is sometimes put in terms of supervenience, but is better framed in terms of metaphysical explanation or grounding—see Bennett 2004.)

One natural response involves appealing to a difference in kind (Wiggins 2001). Lump can survive being squashed or rolled into a ball, since Lump is a mere lump of clay. But David is a statue, and statues cannot survive these kinds of changes. This, however, only pushes back the explanatory challenge: how could intrinsic duplicates like Lump and David differ in kind? One option would be to appeal to relational differences. For example, Lynne Rudder Baker suggests that David—unlike Lump—is a statue because it is essentially related to an artworld—it is the sort of thing that critics admire, review, and discuss (Baker 2000: 35–46). The problem is that this seems to get things backwards, for it is natural to think that David is admired, reviewed, and discussed because it is a statue (rather than a mere lump of clay). A related idea is to explain the difference in kind by appealing to differences in historical facts (Burke 1992: 15). For example, one might say that Lump is a mere lump of clay because it was created by a claymaker whose intent was to create a lump, whereas David was created by a sculptor whose intent was to create a statue. One worry is that this line of response cannot be extended to every case of constitution. For example, Alan Gibbard (1975) imagines an artist who sculpts a statue in two pieces—bottom and top—and then joins them together, simultaneously creating a statue (‘Goliath’) and a new piece of clay (‘Lumpl’). Sometime later, the artist smashes the statue to bits, thereby destroying both the statue and the lump. The crucial feature of this case is that Lumpl and Goliath share their historical properties and appear to stand in the same relations to everything around them—both are created by the same person (at the same time), put on display in the same galleries, and so on. In short, Lumpl and Goliath share all their relational properties while still differing in kind, in which case the explanatory challenge remains unmet. (For further discussion of the grounding problem and alternative replies, see DeRosset 2011, Einheuser 2011, Sutton 2012, Saenz 2015, and Koslicki 2018.)

A final worry for the constitution view concerns arbitrariness or anthropic reasoning. (For different versions of this worry, see Sosa 1987, Sider 2001: 156–8, and Fairchild 2022.) The constitution view claims that it is possible for two material objects—like David and Lump—to be in the same place at the same time. But why stop at two? Consider the mereological sum of David’s fundament physical particles. Those particles existed long before David or Lump were created, so the sum would appear to be another object in addition to the statue and the lump. But why stop at three? Consider the instatue that coincides with David whenever that statue is indoors and then goes out of existence whenever David is taken outside (cf. Hirsch 1982: 32). There is also the tablestatue (that exists only when the statue is on a table), the litstatue (that exists only when the statue is in the light), the dinnerstatue (that exists only when the statue’s sculptor is eating dinner), and so on. Ernest Sosa (1987) refers to this multiplication of entities as “the explosion of reality”.

Defenders of the constitution view may try to run from the explosion and insist that there are only two (or three, or four) objects in the same place at the same time. But what could justify this exclusionary attitude? Granted, we do not normally concern ourselves with instatues, litstatues, and the rest. Ordinary English does not even have sortal terms for discussing these entities. But these are facts about our interests and linguistic decisions. Why should we think that there is a correspondence between the sortal terms in our language and the kinds of objects in the world? One way to explain this correspondence would be to claim that reality is determined, in some sense, by our conceptual scheme. But the constitution view is normally offered as an alternative to anti-realist views of this kind. Perhaps, then, the constitution theorist should accept Sosa’s explosion and say that our inattentiveness does not exclude things like instatues and litstatues from the realm of being? (Yablo 1987, Bennett 2004, Hawthorne 2006, Fairchild 2019, Dorr et al. 2022)? Perhaps. But this brings us very close to adopting the next view of material constitution. (For other replies to this worry, see Shoemaker 1988, Korman 2015: Chapters 7–8, and sections 2.5–2.6 of the entry on ordinary objects.)

3. Temporal Parts

According to the temporal parts theory (or four-dimensionalism), persistence through time is like extension in space (Quine 1953, Lewis 1976, Sider 2001). Objects extend through space by having different parts in different places; in the same way, objects persist through time by having different temporal parts at different times. A temporal part is a genuine part of something which overlaps every part of that entity during some period, but exists only during that period. In this respect, it is like one of the many road segments that make up an extended roadway. (For a more detailed statement of the view, see the entry on temporal parts.)

Consider now the case of State Route 9A, which runs from Peekskill, NY to the southern tip of Manhattan. As one drives south, this roadway eventually “turns into” the West Side Highway, which is wholly located within New York City. The two roads in this case are not the same, but they are partly identical, since the West Side Highway is a proper spatial part of the longer state route. According to the temporal parts theorist, something analogous is the case with Lump and David. In that scenario, the piece of clay exists for some period of time and is then “turned into” a statue, with the result that David is a proper temporal part of the longer-lived Lump.

One way to motivate this understanding of material constitution is to compare it with the constitution view.

The first problem for the constitution view was that it allowed for two material objects to be in the same place at the same time. The temporal parts theorist avoids this objection since he says that, whenever Lump and David exist, there is a single object that exactly occupies the relevant location—a temporal part that is shared by both David and Lump. Those two objects will be partly present at the same location, but this is no more problematic than two roads being partly present at the same place by sharing a common road segment.

The second problem for the constitution view was that it allowed for two objects to be composed of all the same parts. The temporal parts theorist avoids this problem as well, since he will say that Lump and David share some but not all of the same temporal parts. Those objects will have all the same parts whenever they both exist, but this is no more problematic than two roads sharing all the same parts where they overlap.

The third challenge for the constitution theorist was to ground the differences between coincident objects. The same challenge can be put to the friend of temporal parts: in virtue of what do David and Lump have different kind properties, persistence conditions, and the like? In response, one could point out that these objects share all of the same parts whenever they both exist, but that Lump, for example, exists at times that David does not. The four-dimensionalist will claim that this gives us a difference in temporal parts, which could help to explain the other differences in question (Wasserman 2002).

The last worry for the constitution view was that it postulated a mysterious connection between the sortal terms of our language and the kinds of objects in the world. The temporal parts theorist avoids this worry as well. On the standard four-dimensionalist picture, persisting objects are ultimately composed of instantaneous temporal parts and, for any collection of these parts, there is a further object they compose (Quine 1960: 171). For example, there is an object consisting of all and only the temporal parts of David when that statue is indoors. This would be what we earlier called an “instatue”. There is also an object composed of all and only the temporal parts of David when that statue is in the light. This is what we earlier called a “litstatue”. In this way, the temporal parts theorist finds a place for all the objects introduced earlier, and thereby avoids an implausible correlation between the sortal terms of our language and the kinds of objects in the world. (Of course, some people think that this solution is worse than the problem—see, for example, Markosian 1998: 228, Elder 2008: 440, and Korman 2015: Chapter 4.)

Unfortunately, the temporal parts solution cannot be extended to Gibbard’s case of Lumpl and Goliath since those objects exist at all of the same times and therefore share all the same temporal parts. If sameness of parts means sameness of object, it would follow that Lumpl is identical to Goliath. This, however, is problematic, since those objects seem to differ in their modal properties. Lumpl, for example, could survive beings squashed, whereas Goliath could not.

One reply to this worry is suggested by David Lewis (1971, 1986), who defends a counterpart theory of modality. According to Lewis, ordinary objects like Goliath exist in only one possible world, but have counterparts at other worlds that serve as truth-makers for de re modal claims. Crucially, whether or not something counts as a counterpart of Goliath (for example) will depend on what respects of similarity are at issue. Since the name ‘Goliath’ is associated with the kind statue, a sentence like “Goliath could survive being squashed” will normally be true (relative to a context) just in case Goliath has some statue-counterparts that survive squashing (i.e., some counterparts that survive squashing as statues). Presumably, there are no such counterparts, so that sentence will express a falsehood. Meanwhile, the name ‘Lumpl’ is associated with the kind lump of clay, so a sentence like “Lumpl could survive being squashed” will be true just in case Lumpl has a lump-counterpart that survives being squashed. Presumably, there are some such objects at other worlds, so that sentence will express a truth. Moreover, this will be the case even if the temporal parts theorist is correct and a single object is picked out by both ‘Lumpl’ and ‘Goliath’. The key point is that the phrase ‘could survive being squashed’ expresses different properties when combined with these names, so Leibniz’s Law has no application. (For more on counterpart theory, see section 8 of the entry on David Lewis’s metaphysics. For a somewhat related idea, see Gallois 1998. For a very different approach, see Wallace 2019.)

One worry for this response is that it cannot account for apparent non-modal differences between Lumpl and Goliath. For example, Kit Fine (2003) argues that Lumpl, but not Goliath, might be well-made, and that Goliath, but not Lumpl, might be Romanesque. Since these are not modal ascriptions, counterpart theory has no application. As a result, it is unclear what the temporal parts theorist is to say about these differences. (For more on this issue, see the exchange between Fine 2006, Frances 2006, and King 2006; see also Almotahari 2014.)

4. Eliminativism

The simplest way of avoiding the puzzles of material constitution is to deny the existence of some of the objects that give rise to those problems. For example, if one claims that there are no such things as statues and lumps of clay, then there is no threat of having a statue and a lump of clay in the same place at the same time.

This kind of eliminativism is often associated with Peter Unger (1979), who once defended the thesis of mereological nihilism. Nihilism is the view that there are there are no composite objects—only atoms exist. On this view, there may be quarks or electrons, but there are are no statues, animals or other macroscopic objects composed of those particles. Since the nihilist denies the existence of statues in general, he will deny the existence of the particular statue, David. Hence, he will reject the very first premise of the original argument for coincident objects. (Note that Unger’s use of ‘nihilism’ differs slightly from how it used in the subsequent literature. On this point, see van Inwagen 1990: 73. This view also differs from the nihilistic picture on which there are no individuals at the fundamental level of reality. On the latter view, see O’Leary-Hawthorne and Cortens 1995, Dasgupta 2009, and Turner 2011.)

The nihilist makes two main claims, both of which can be challenged. First, there is the negative thesis that there are no composite objects and no statues in particular. The most common reaction to this is an incredulous stare—for many, the existence of composite objects is a Moorean fact, more certain than any premise which could be used to argue against it. The nihilist may reply that we can make sense of our statue-talk by paraphrasing it into claims about simples. For example, instead of saying that there is a statue on the table, we can say that there are some simples arranged “statuewise” on top of some other simples arranged “tablewise”. (For more on this paraphrasing strategy, see van Inwagen 1990: Chapter 10. For worries, see O’Leary-Hawthorne and Michael 1996, Uzquiano 2004b, and McGrath 2005.) This brings us to the nihilist’s positive thesis that there are material simples. This claim can also be challenged. After all, it was once thought that chemical atoms were fundamental particles, until the discovery of protons and neutrons. So too, it was thought that protons and neutrons were mereological simples, until the discovery of quarks. One might think that this process could go on forever, in which case our world would be gunky (i.e., it would have no simples as proper parts). The problem is that this possibility is inconsistent with nihilism, which requires a material world to include material simples (Sider 1993, Zimmerman 1996, Schaffer 2003).

A second version of eliminativism is associated with Peter van Inwagen (1990), who defends the view that living things are the only composite objects. This view is closely related to nihilism, but has one notable advantage—it allows for the existence of human persons. For example, in the case of Dion and Theon, van Inwagen will say that Dion exists at the beginning of the story, since the activity of the relevant simples constitutes a life (the life of Dion). But van Inwagen will deny that Theon exists, for the activity of the relevant simples only constitutes a part of Dion’s life at that time. The activity of those same simples constitutes a life after Dion’s right foot is removed, at which point the simples come to compose Dion. More generally, van Inwagen denies what he calls “the doctrine of arbitrary undetached parts”:

The Doctrine of Arbitrary Undetached Parts (DAUP): For every material object m, time t, and regions r1 and r2, if m occupies r1 at t and r2 is a sub-region of r1, then there is a part of m that occupies r2 at t. (cf. van Inwagen 1981: 123)

(For more on DAUP and material constitution, see Olson 1995, Parsons 2004, and Carmichael 2022.)

Van Inwagen’s version of eliminativism is subject to the same objections raised against nihilism, but it also faces problems of its own. Here is one. There are borderline cases where it is vague whether or not the activity of some simples constitutes a life (consider, for example, the question of when, exactly, a person’s life comes to an end). But, if it is vague whether the activity of some simples constitutes a life then, according to van Inwagen, it is vague how many objects exist. However, it cannot be vague how many objects exist, since cardinality claims can be made in a part of language where nothing is vague. Suppose that there are exactly one-million simples and that it is vague whether or not the activity of those simples constitutes a life. Now consider the numerical sentence that asserts the existence of (at least) one-million and one objects. (A numerical sentence is a first-order sentence asserting the existence of some objects. For example, the numerical sentence that there exist at least two objects is: ∃x∃y(x ≠ y).) If van Inwagen is correct, then it is indeterminate whether or not the relevant numerical sentence is true, in which case one of the constituent expressions—‘∃’, ‘x’, ‘y’, ‘~’, ‘=’—must be vague. Yet philosophers have claimed that the terms of first-order logic do not admit of borderline cases. (For a more detailed presentation of this argument, see Lewis 1986: 212–213, Sider 2001: 120–132, and section 2.2 of the entry on ordinary objects. For potential replies, see van Inwagen 1990: Chapter 19, Hirsch 2002, and Koslicki 2003.)

A third version of eliminativism is often associated with Roderick Chisholm (1973), who defends the doctrine of mereological essentialism: for any x and y, if x is a part of y then, necessarily, y exists only if x is a part of y. This doctrine is an “eliminativist” view insofar as it denies the existence of mereologically ductile objects. For example, in the Ship of Theseus case it is natural to think that there is a ship which survives the replacement of at least some of its parts. The essentialist’s response to the paradox is to deny this apparent truism. In the same way, the Debtor’s Paradox and the Puzzle of Deon and Theon only arise on the assumption that human persons can gain and lose parts. The essentialist solves these puzzles by rejecting this assumption. The Puzzle of the Statue and the Clay remains problematic, however, for that example only involves a change in shape. In order to respond to this puzzle, the essentialist can endorse a related principle: for any xs and for any y, if the xs compose y then, necessarily, the xs exist only if they compose y. This thesis says that the whole is essential to the parts, so that whenever you have the same constituents, you have the same whole. The defender of this thesis will say that, in our earlier case, Lump exists on both Monday and Tuesday, for the same clay parts are present on both days. The same is true of David. The parts that compose David on Tuesday are present on Monday, in which case the first premise of the earlier argument is false—David did exist on Monday (just not as a statue). In that case, the defender of mereological essentialism is free to identify David and Lump and thereby avoid any commitment to coincident objects.

Viewed from one perspective, the essentialist’s picture seems intuitive. When one rearranges the dining room furniture, one does not bring new furniture into existence—one simply brings existing furniture into a new arrangement. In the same way, sculpting some clay provides a new form, but does not create a new object. Viewed from another perspective, however, this picture seems completely absurd, for it implies that if we annihilate a single particle of David, the entire statue will be destroyed. More frightening still, if we annihilate a single particle from your body, then you will no longer exist. The mereological essentialist may reply that, if we were to annihilate a particle from David, there would still be a statue left in its place—call it David*. David* would not be identical to David, but it would be very similar. For example, it would have roughly the same mass, shape, and location. In Chisholm’s terminology, this would be a “statue-successor” of David, and the existence of this successor provides a loose sense in which “the statue” survives. Here is a second worry for the essentialist, focusing on the idea that the whole is essential to the parts. Imagine that the artist who sculpted David becomes dissatisfied with her work and squashes the statue while preserving all the bits of clay. If the whole is essential to the parts, then it would follow that David (the thing that was previously composed of those parts) still exists. But this seems absurd—statues cannot survive being squashed. We get an equally absurd result in the opposite direction. David’s parts existed prior to the sculpting, so David itself existed at that time. But how could a statue exist before it was sculpted? The eliminativist might reply that the thing which is currently a statue existed prior to the sculpting, but that it was not then a statue. In this sense, at least, we can say that the statue did not exist prior to sculpting. Similarly, the thing which is currently a statue may survive being squashed, but it will no longer be a statue at that point. In that sense, the statue will not survive the squashing. (For more on this paraphrasing strategy, see Chisholm 1976: Chapter 3. A related move is made by so-called phasalists who take ordinary sortals like ‘statue’ and ‘lump of clay’ to be phase sortals akin to ‘child’ and ‘teenager’. See, e.g., Schwartz 2009, Biro 2018, and Mooney 2023.)

5. Dominant Kinds

In the previous section, we examined various ways of resisting the first premise of our argument—the claim that David did not exist on Monday. Let us now turn to the suggestion that Lump did exist on Monday. Eliminativists like Unger and van Inwagen will reject this premise, since they deny the existence of objects like Lump. But there are other accounts that reject this premise as well. One such theory is the dominant kind view of Michael Burke (1994, 1997a, 1997b).

Burke begins with the assumption that there is a single object present on Tuesday. For the moment, call this object “Rex”. Burke assumes that Rex is both a lump of clay and a statue. This is a perfectly natural assumption, but it is also problematic. As we have seen, kinds are associated with different persistence conditions. For example, unlike the kind statue, the kind lump of clay is associated with the property of being able to survive squashing. Now consider the following principle: for any object o and kind K, if o is a K, then o has the persistence conditions associated with K (Burke 1994: 598). Since Rex is both a lump of clay and a statue, this principle tells us that it is able to survive squashing and that it is not. Burke concludes that the proposed principle is false—it is possible for an object to be a K without having the persistence conditions associated with that kind. In particular, Burke claims that an object only has the persistence conditions associated with its dominant kind. For Burke, a dominant kind is one which “entails possession of the widest range of properties” (Burke 1994: 607). For example, if something is a lump of clay, it must have certain physical properties, whereas a statue must have both physical and aesthetic properties. In this sense, statue entails a wider range of properties than lump of clay. For that reason, Rex has the persistence conditions associated with the kind statue. Rex, in other words, is just David. What about Lump? In the original story, the name ‘Lump’ was introduced for the lump of clay that exists on Monday. At that point there was no statue, so Lump’s dominant kind was simply lump of clay. Let us now introduce the name ‘Lump*’ for the lump that exists on Tuesday. The lump of clay that exists on Tuesday is also a statue (Lump* is David, i.e., Rex), so Lump*’s dominant kind is statue. Hence, Lump ≠ Lump*. On Burke’s view, the process of sculpting a lump of clay into a statue destroys one object (a mere lump of clay) and replaces it with another (a statue). The resulting entity is also a lump of clay, but it is numerically distinct from the lump of clay with which we began.

The dominant kinds view has several advantages over the eliminativist accounts. Most notably, it recognizes the existence of ordinary objects like statues and lumps of clay, while also allowing for those objects to gain and lose parts. However, some of the objections raised in previous sections also apply to Burke’s account. For example, the anthropic objection from section 2 can be raised against the dominant kinds view (Sider 2001: 165). The view also faces problems of its own.

First, there is the objection from commonsense. According to Burke, sculptors can destroy lumps of clay by doing nothing more than reshaping them in accordance with certain artistic intentions. In fact, given certain theories of what constitutes an artwork, the sculptor doesn’t even have to do that much. Suppose that an artist takes a liking to a particular rock and titles it Rocky, inviting art critics to admire his new work. If this is all it takes to create an artpiece, then that is all it takes to destroy a rock. After all, the rock at the beginning of the story has piece of rock as its dominant kind, whereas the rock at the end has piece of art as its dominant kind. Hence, the latter rock is numerically distinct from the former. This seems absurd. Burke replies by appealing to ambiguity (1994: 596–7). According to him, ‘the rock’ could denote the rock (a singular object) or the rocky stuff (the matter that constitutes that object). On the first reading, the rock from the beginning of the story is not the same but, on the second reading, it is (since there is the same matter throughout). Burke suggests that this is enough to satisfy the demands of commonsense. (For more on mass terms and the distinction between stuff and things, see the entry on the metaphysics of mass expressions.)

A second problem concerns Burke’s account of dominance. He claims that one kind dominates another just in case it entails a wider range of properties. This seems to get the current case correct, for there is a natural sense in which statue entails a wider range of properties than lump of clay. But now consider the case of a performance artist who poses his own body to form a statue. Here, the relevant object is both a person and a statue. The kind statue entails having certain aesthetic properties, but does not entail having any mental properties. Meanwhile, the kind person arguably entails having certain mental properties, but does not entail having any aesthetic ones. But, in that case, neither kind dominates the other, so Burke’s account seems incomplete. (For further discussion of this worry, see Rea 2000.)

A final problem is that the dominant kinds view cannot be extended to all cases of constitution. For example, in the Ship of Theseus story, we seem to have two ships in the same place at the same time. Since there is a single kind at issue, Burke’s account does not apply. (For further examples of this kind, see Fine 2000.)

6. Relative Identity

In the previous two sections, we discussed various ways of challenging the first two premises of the argument for coincident objects. Let us now turn our attention to the third: If David did not exist on Monday and Lump did exist on Monday, then David is not identical to Lump. This claim follows from Leibniz’s Law which says that, for any x and y, if x is identical to y, then x and y share all of the same properties. So, denying this principle is one way of resisting the third premise.

The denial of Leibniz’s Law is sometimes associated with Peter Geach (1962, 1967), who defends a view called the relative identity theory. Geach’s central thesis is that there is no relation of absolute identity—sameness is always relative to a kind. Thus, we can say that David is the same statue as Lump and we can say that David is the same lump of clay as Lump, but it makes no sense to ask if David is the same as Lump simpliciter. The consequent of the third premise is therefore nonsense, like saying ‘David is not taller than’. More generally, Geach rejects the standard formulation of Leibniz’s Law as incomplete, since it includes a non-relativized identity predicate.

Geach makes many interesting claims about the behavior of relative identity relations. For example, he claims that it is possible for a to be the same K as b, but not the same K*, where ‘K’ and ‘K*’ are sortal terms denoting different kinds. Take, for example, the Debtor’s Paradox. In that case, we have an earlier portion of matter, M1, and a later portion of matter M2. According to Geach, M1 is not the same portion of matter as M2, but it is the same person. In this way, he is able to allow for persistence through change in parts. (For further details, see the entry on relative identity; for other versions of relativism, see Myro 1985 and Gallois 1998.)

The relative identity theorist denies the standard formulation of Leibniz’s Law, but there is significant pressure to accept some version of that principle since it seems to capture a central feature of identity. An obvious suggestion would be to say that, for any x and y, if x is the same K as y, then x and y share all of the same properties (where ‘K’ denotes some kind). If Geach’s relative identity relations do not conform to this law, one might worry that they are not identity relations at all. And here we have a potential problem. Take the case of David and Lump. As we have seen, some philosophers want to say that David is both a statue and a lump of clay (it is not a mere lump of clay, since it is also a statue, but it is still a lump). Since there is only one lump of clay on Tuesday, David must be the same lump of clay as Lump. But then, by the relativized version of Leibniz’s Law, David and Lump must share all of the same properties. Again, this seems incorrect. In response, the relative identity theorist might appeal to another component of Geach’s view. Geach suggests that proper names are always associated with kinds. For example, ‘David’ is associated with the kind statue and ‘Lump’ is associated with the kind lump of clay. Taking a cue from the counterpart theorist (section 3), the relative identity theorist could claim that this association creates opaque contexts when ascribing certain properties. Consider the following statements:

  1. Lump existed on Monday.
  2. David existed on Monday.

The relative identity theorist could say that (1) is true if and only if there was a lump of clay on Monday which is the same lump of clay as Lump. (2), on the other hand, is true just in case there was statue on Monday which is the same statue as David. Given these truth conditions, (1) is true and (2) is false, for there was a lump of clay on Monday (the same one as Lump), but no statue. More importantly, on this analysis the predicates in (1) and (2) express different properties, in which case the relativized version of Leibniz’s Law has no application. So, one cannot move from (1) and the negation of (2) to the conclusion that Lump and David are distinct lumps of clay.

A second worry for Geach is that it seems as if the relative identity theory cannot solve all the puzzles with which we began. Take, once again, the Ship of Theseus. In that case, we have the original ship of Theseus (A), the museum’s ship (B), and the custodian’s ship (C). The problem is that B seems to be the same ship as A, which seems to be the same ship as C. If the same ship as relation is transitive, we get the absurd conclusion that B is the same ship as C. The relative identity theorist might deny transitivity, but this would give us another reason to suspect that relativized identity relations are not identity relations at all (Gupta 1980).

A third and final worry for Geach concerns the denial of absolute identity. As many commentators have pointed out, this seems to carry important implications for logic, semantics, and set theory. To take just one example, consider the set theorist’s axiom of extensionality: for any sets A and B, if A and B have the same members, then A is the same set as B. Let A be David’s unit set and B be Lump’s. Is A the same set as B? The relativist must reject this question as ill-formed. It makes no sense to ask whether x and y are the same members, since this requires a notion of absolute identity (intuitively, ‘member’ does not denote a genuine kind, so ‘same member as’ does not express a relative identity relation). As a result, the relative identity theorist must deny extensionality, which throws set theory into jeopardy (Hawthorne 2004).

7. Deflationism

Imagine a debate between two friends over whether or not boats are ships. One party points to a rowboat and says, “That boat is a ship. After all, a ship is a vessel that floats on water and the rowboat is obviously such a vessel.” The second party disagrees: “A ship is a sufficiently large vessel that floats on water and the rowboat is not sufficiently large. So, the boat is not a ship.” Clearly, there is something defective about this debate. First, there are two candidate meanings for ‘ship’—namely a vessel that floats on water and a sufficiently large vessel that floats on water. Second, neither of these candidate meanings is more “natural” than the other—unlike ‘water’ or ‘electron’, the predicate ‘ship’ does not correspond to a natural kind in the world. Third, the two parties to the debate agree on all of the “non-ship facts”—in particular, they agree that the rowboat is a vessel, that it floats on water, and that it is relatively small in size. Given these points, it is tempting to say that the two parties agree on all of the facts and that their dispute is merely verbal. Note that this conclusion is consistent with the view that one of the parties is mistaken. For example, if the meanings of our terms are determined, in part, by the broader community, then the first party to the debate is presumably mistaken, since most English-speakers don’t use ‘ship’ in this way. Still, there is a sense in which the debate is verbal since there is another possible language (“English*”) that (a) employs a different, equally natural meaning for ‘ship’, (b) is adequate for describing all of the facts, and (c) is such that the first party’s statement would be true in that language. Thus, we might say that the real dispute between the two parties is over whether or not English is English*.

Some philosophers have suggested that the debate over material constitution is defective in much the same way. There is no genuine dispute between Lewis and Unger, for example, over whether or not statues exist. Both parties agree on all of the relevant non-linguistic facts—e.g., that there are simples arranged statuewise. Moreover, both parties agree that there are two possible languages (“Lewis-English” and “Unger-English”) where the sentence “Statues exist” would come out true in one and false in the other. So the only disagreement is about whether English is Lewis-English or Unger-English. In other words, the debate is merely verbal. This kind of deflationism is often associated with Rudolf Carnap (1950), Hilary Putnam (1987) and, more recently, Eli Hirsch (2002, 2011). The issues raised by deflationism are extremely complicated; here, we will limit ourselves to a few initial observations. (For further discussion, see Chalmers, Manley, and Wasserman 2009, Hirsch 2011, and Thomasson 2015.)

In the imagined dispute, we know exactly what the disputed term is (‘ship’) and exactly what the relevant meanings are (a vessel that floats on water and a sufficiently large vessel that floats on water). In the actual dispute between Lewis and Unger, matters are less clear. One might suspect that the disputed term is ‘statue’, but it turns out to be fairly difficult to specify the relevant candidate meanings. For example, we might say that, in Lewis-English, ‘statue’ simply means a collection of simples arranged statuewise. Whether or not that is a plausible interpretation of what Lewis means depends in part on the meaning of ‘collection’ (Sider 2009: 388–90). In any case, it is even more difficult to specify an appropriate candidate meaning for ‘statue’ in Unger-English. More importantly, even if we are able to specify the relevant meanings, we will not have shown that the dispute is verbal, since the disagreement can be stated without using the word ‘statue’ (or any non-logical predicate, for that matter). Consider a world that contains one-million simples arranged statuewise and nothing else disjoint from these atoms. And consider the numerical sentence (see section 4 above) which asserts the existence of at least one-million and one things. Lewis and Unger will disagree over the truth of that sentence. But that sentence contains only logical vocabulary. Hence, if the two parties are really talking past each other, they must assign different meanings to their logical constants.

The most plausible suggestion is that Lewis and Unger assign (or, at least, intend to assign) different meanings to the existential quantifier, ‘∃’, as well as quantificational phrases like ‘there are’, ‘there is’, and ‘some’. This is where deflationists have focused their attention. Putnam, for example, writes that “[T]he logical primitives themselves, and in particular the notions of object and existence, have a multitude of different uses rather than one absolute ‘meaning’ ” (1987: 71). This thesis—that there are many meanings for the existential quantifier that are equally natural and adequate for describing all the facts—is often referred to as “the doctrine of quantifier variance” (Hirsch 2002). What exactly are the candidate meanings in question? Once again, matters are not so clear. Lewis could, of course, simply interpret Unger to be using a restricted quantifier that ranges only over simples. On that interpretation, Unger speaks truthfully when he says “Statues do not exist”, since there are no statues among the simples. The problem with this interpretation is that it seems manifestly implausible, given that Unger will insist that his quantifiers are to be understood as unrestricted. Even more worrying is the question of how Unger is supposed to interpret Lewis. He cannot, for example, say that Lewis is using a less restrictive quantifier, for that would be to say that there are things (that Lewis’s quantifier ranges over) that do not exist (by Unger’s own lights). Unger could, perhaps, take a more holistic approach and interpret Lewis’s assertion to mean there are some simples arranged statuewise. More generally, Unger could interpret Lewis by replacing singular quantifiers over composites with plural quantifiers over simples, and by replacing each predicate of composites with an irreducibly plural predicate of simples. Once again, we should expect protest—Lewis will reject the proposed translation and insist that he is using singular quantification.

These initial observations bring out one disanalogy between the ontological debate and paradigm verbal disputes. In the earlier argument over whether or not boats are ships, the proposed translations are friendly, since the first party will admit that he uses ‘ship’ to mean a vessel that floats on water and the second will grant that he uses ‘ship’ to mean a sufficiently large vessel that floats on water. Given this disambiguation, the dispute will evaporate. The deflationist’s proposals are instead hostile, for neither Lewis nor Unger will accept the deflationist interpretation (Sider 2009: section 5). This does not mean that the ontologists’ debate is non-verbal, but it does mean that the issues involved are more complicated than those in paradigm verbal disputes. (For further concerns about quantifier variance, see the exchange between Dorr 2014, Warren 2015, 2021, and Sider 2023.)

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