The Philosophy of Mathematical Practice

First published Tue Apr 7, 2026

“Philosophy of Mathematical Practice” (PMP) refers to a broad cluster of approaches in the philosophy of mathematics. These approaches share a common focus on philosophical issues arising from actual mathematical practice. It is also characteristic of PMP to consider philosophical problems in the context of specific historical or current mathematical practices. While there have been attempts to more precisely define the notion of mathematical practice, all that needs to be understood by this, as a first approximation, is mathematics as practiced by mathematicians ranging from heuristic informal strategies to formalized developments.

Typically, approaches within PMP reject a-historical conceptions of mathematics and are open to interdisciplinary research. PMP has been characterized by an innovative focus on aspects of mathematics largely neglected in 20th-century analytic philosophy of mathematics. Foundational concerns and the problem of access to abstract mathematical entities, despite their importance, resulted in an impoverished approach to the philosophy of mathematics, which was often limited to the discussion of set theory and arithmetic. The questions philosophers of mathematical practice ask call for a dramatic extension of the domain of philosophical investigation as conceived in the previous tradition, as well for alternative perspectives on traditional problems. Examples of such questions are: Why do mathematicians prove the same theorem multiple times? Are there virtues of proofs other than correctness? What is mathematical explanation? What are the epistemic roles of visualization in mathematics? What are mathematical notations, and how do they function? What constitutes progress in mathematics, and how is it achieved? How does the use of computational tools influence mathematical practice? Not all these questions are new, and PMP recognizes its debt to certain aspects of investigation that had emerged from Lakatos’ (1976) approach to the philosophy of mathematics as well as to particular trends of investigations (such as Maddy 1997) within the more traditional analytic philosophy of mathematics.

PMP pushes the boundaries of the philosophy of mathematics by endorsing a broad conception of what areas of mathematics should be object of philosophical attention, extending the range of questions, and introducing new methodologies. Although the philosophy of mathematical practice is placed under the heading ‘the Future’ in the entry on philosophy of mathematics, it has dramatically increased in popularity in the past decades and has generated a remarkable amount of philosophical research. For instance, a considerable number of articles in PMP are included in the recent massive volume (of more than 3,000 pages) Handbook of the History and Philosophy of Mathematical Practice (Sriraman 2024). Moreover, some of the themes first canvassed within the philosophy of mathematical practice are becoming of more general interest. Indeed, in some cases, such as explanation in mathematics – a topic whose analysis was pioneered by philosophers of mathematical practice – the area has become one of the most widely discussed by analytic philosophers of mathematics.

1. Overview of Practice-Based Approaches to Mathematics

The central commitment of philosophers of mathematical practice is to tackle philosophical issues that arise by considering the inner workings of mathematics. This common core leaves plenty of leeway in choosing specific questions and deciding how to pursue them. In particular, the way in which mathematics is characterized, as well as the methodology adopted, shape radically different approaches within PMP. We survey such approaches below, highlighting the differences between them and more traditional approaches in the philosophy of mathematics.

We will describe different approaches to mathematics by specifying (1) what areas of mathematics are taken into consideration, (2) who are the mathematical subjects (some would say agents) under investigation and what kind of activities they are engaged in, and (3) the methodology adopted.

Our aim in this section is to provide a broad taxonomy that will be helpful in navigating between specific positions within PMP. However, the reader should not infer that the taxonomy is exhaustive and that all the positions in the taxonomy have been investigated to the same extent or have yielded the same amount of philosophical success.

Needless to say, the proposed taxonomy is not the only way of organizing the landscape created by philosophers of mathematical practice. For alternatives, we recommend the following surveys (Carter 2019b, 2024b; Giardino 2017; Hamami and Morris 2020; Mancosu 2008a; Rittberg 2019; Van Bendegem 2014).

1.1 Areas of Mathematics

It is notoriously difficult to define what mathematics is. Nonetheless, philosophers of mathematics usually share certain assumptions about the nature of mathematics. These assumptions include what domains should be investigated. 20th-century foundational approaches have mainly focused on arithmetic, set theory, and logic (and to a more limited extent on elementary geometry). Instead, PMP considers all areas of mathematics to be under its purview.

The oldest areas of mathematics are geometry and arithmetic, which originated from the everyday activities of measuring and counting. With time, more abstract areas developed, such as topology, abstract algebra, real and complex analysis, set theory, and category theory. Logic, as the study of reasoning, also originates in antiquity but became a mathematical theory only in the 19th century.

Geometry has been considered the paradigm of rigorous mathematics for about two millennia, from Euclid’s time all the way to the end of the 18th century. While the historical development is complicated, there is no denying that in the 19th century arithmetic and algebra became more central to foundational concerns, for instance in the works of Gauss, Bolzano, Dedekind, and Frege.

Indeed, foundational approaches have mostly concentrated on arithmetic because they take it to be representative or more fundamental. Frege’s logicism is a prime example of this – the primary aim of Frege’s logicism is to reduce arithmetic (not all mathematics!) to logic.

Moreover, 20th-century analytical philosophy of mathematics has almost exclusively focused on general epistemological and ontological questions that by and large could be framed in terms of set theory. This has led to reducing philosophical discussions about mathematics to philosophical discussions about sets (what are they? How can we have access to them?), thus neglecting the specificities of different branches of mathematics. Jeremy Avigad is explicit about the negative effect that this had on the philosophy of mathematics:

The problem is that set-theoretic idealisation idealises too much. Mathematical thought is messy. When we dig beneath the neatly composed surface we find a great buzzing, blooming confusion of ideas, and we have a lot to learn about how mathematics channels these wellsprings of creativity into rigorous scientific discourse. But that requires doing hard work and getting our hands dirty. And so the call of the sirens is pleasant and enticing: mathematics is set theory! Just tell us a really good story about abstract objects, and the secrets of the Universe will be unlocked. This siren song has held the philosophy of mathematics in thrall, leaving it to drift into the rocky shores. (2018a, 6)

Philosophers of mathematical practice tend to get their hands dirty with all sorts of different mathematics. They recognize that mathematics is not monolithic but multiform. The common thought is that focusing on a few areas such as arithmetic and set theory results in a lost opportunity for philosophical analyses of mathematics.

For example, it is evident that in order to pursue an epistemological analysis of visualization and diagrammatic reasoning, we cannot avoid considering geometry and topology – and indeed we cannot avoid considering other areas of mathematics as well (e.g., analysis (Carter 2010) and algebra (De Toffoli 2017)). Moreover, in order to study whether computational technology can enhance mathematical understanding, it is helpful to look into combinatorics and related areas (Avigad 2022). What is more, these themes and many other themes, like mathematical explanation and mathematical understanding, are transversal, and it would be artificial to restrict them to specific mathematical areas.

1.2 Subjects Doing Mathematics

Philosophers of mathematics engaged in foundationalist projects often conceive of mathematics as a collection of theories that can be expressed in specific formal systems. This conception gives little if no role to the diachronic nature of mathematics as well as to the subjects doing mathematics. While acknowledging the importance of the synchronic analysis of mathematics for certain goals, philosophers of mathematical practice give, when appropriate, special attention to the history of mathematics and to how specific features (cognitive or otherwise) of the subjects engaged in mathematical activity might affect the development and constitution of mathematics. To emphasize the activity in which the mathematicians engage in, some prefer to speak of agents (Ferreirós 2020; Hamami 2024).

By considering mathematics as a static body of truths rather than a discipline in evolution, philosophers of mathematics engaged in foundational projects have by and large paid very little attention to the history of mathematics, contenting themselves with some references to the arithmetization of analysis (and its role in the development of logic and set theory) and the development of non-Euclidean geometries in the 19th century (as a prelude to an understanding of Hilbert’s approach to axiomatics). After all, the project is to provide solid foundations for current, rigorous mathematics, rather than engaging in historical exegesis. To be sure, there are exceptions, and we can mention, by way of example, two cases pre-dating the 1970s. On the philosophical side, one could mention the work by Cavaillès (1938), which was driven by foundational concerns and yet displayed a fine attention to historical nuance. On the mathematical side, one can mention Robinson’s (1966) interest in the historical debates concerning Leibnizian infinitesimals as a way to provide a perspective on the importance of non-standard analysis. Of course, things have much improved in the last fifty years with detailed studies of, among others, Dedekind, Frege, Cantor, and Hilbert. Still, the majority of efforts in the foundationalist tradition do not need to concern themselves with the historical aspects of the discipline and squarely focus on modern mathematics.

Moreover, focusing on general worries about the nature of abstract objects and our access to them has, by and large, led philosophers of mathematics to put at the center of their epistemological inquiries highly idealized subjects in isolation. A common assumption is that epistemic access worries only arise with respect to the axioms of a theory and what follows from what is taken to be epistemically unproblematic as if the underlying subjects were logically omniscient subjects.

By contrast, since philosophers of mathematical practice address a number of epistemological issues that are in many cases unrelated to the foundations of mathematics or to the problem of access, they tend to be more inclusive both in terms of the historical practices considered and of who are the subjects engaged in mathematics.

In the introduction to the volume The Philosophy of Mathematical Practice, Paolo Mancosu explains:

The authors in this collection believe that the single-minded focus on the problem of ‘access’ has reduced the epistemology of mathematics to a torso. They believe that the epistemology of mathematics needs to be extended well beyond its present confines to address epistemological issues having to do with fruitfulness, evidence, visualization, diagrammatic reasoning, understanding, explanation, and other aspects of mathematical epistemology which are orthogonal to the problem of access to ‘abstract objects.’ (2008b, 1–2)

The volume contains several contributions devoted to the topics listed above and treated for the most part using a methodology of conceptual analysis. We will return in Section 3 to some of the areas listed in the above quote but for the moment we would like to point out that broadening the confines of the epistemology of mathematics has led to an analysis of historical mathematical practices such as, for instance, Euclidean geometry (as developed in Euclid’s Elements and not only in a contemporary axiomatic framework).

In addition, the extension of the range of the epistemology of mathematics has led to changes in the underlying assumptions concerning the subjects practicing mathematics, which has, in some cases, brought about fruitful interactions also with cognitive psychology and mainstream epistemology. For instance, in the study of notations and diagrammatic reasoning, it is crucial to assume that those who do mathematics are subjects sharing broad features of our human cognitive architecture. This is a natural and uncontroversial assumption, but one that is not necessarily needed if the only epistemological problems about mathematics, as conceived in the traditional analytical approach, are linked to the problem of access to abstract objects. It is thus unsurprising that philosophers of mathematical practice working on these issues have engaged with studies on mathematical cognition (Giaquinto 2007; Schlimm 2018).

Other examples of the interaction between cognitive psychology and PMP include the application of the theory of embodied cognition to mathematics. One early work in this direction is Lakoff and Núñez 2000; more recent studies are Giardino 2018; Pantsar 2019b.

Interactions between PMP and mainstream epistemology include discussions on epistemic defeaters (Easwaran 2015) and fallibility (De Toffoli 2021a; Dove 2003; Easwaran 2009). Moreover, themes of social epistemology are also being investigated within PMP. Mathematicians rely on each other (and at times on machines) to check the correctness of their putative proofs. They also commonly rely on results without proving them for themselves. Focusing on the social dimension of mathematics has shown that themes that are gaining traction in social epistemology could be fruitfully applied to the philosophy of mathematics, and scholars working in PMP have been especially sensitive to incorporating these developments. These themes include group knowledge and justification (Habgood-Coote and Tanswell 2021), testimony (Geist, Löwe, and Van Kerkhove 2010; Andersen, Andersen, and Sørensen 2021), trust (De Toffoli and Tanswell 2025), epistemic exclusions (Rittberg 2023), epistemic injustice (Rittberg, Tanswell, and Van Bendegem 2020; Hunsicker and Rittberg 2022), and the epistemic significance of disagreement (Aberdein 2023; De Toffoli and Fontanari 2023; Kant 2025).

Mainstream philosophy of action has also been put into service in the study of mathematical practice. In particular, in (Hamami and Morris 2023, 2024), the authors propose an account of mathematical understanding inspired by Bratman’s (1987) classic account of planning and practical reasons. But the focus on agents has also brought contributions in the area of social ontology, which are surveyed in a Special Issue of Topoi edited by Cantù and Testa (2023).

Summarizing the above, we can say that, in addition to contributions that address problems of mathematical practice with a more traditional methodology of conceptual analysis, a more detailed attention to mathematical practice and the subjects practicing it has led several scholars engaged in PMP to take into account the cognitive architecture of the subjects and the social dimension of the epistemic activities in which mathematicians are engaged in, at times in consonance with parallel developments in mainstream analytic philosophy.

1.3 Methodology

Although most results within PMP deploy traditional philosophical methodology, they tend to endorse a bottom-up rather than a top-down approach. In other words, they tend to draw philosophical conclusions by basing them on the detailed analysis of case studies rather than on general principles. In addition, focusing on mathematical practice provides solutions specific to mathematics to general epistemological problems, such as the problem of access to abstract objects, that might not generalize across the board (Panza 2024).

The difference between these approaches can be clearly appreciated by looking at works on mathematical explanation (see Section 3.3 for more details). Top-down approaches were typical of the earlier analytic tradition (even when motivated by the desire to include more attention to mathematical practice) and offered general characterizations of mathematical explanation. Influential proposals are Steiner’s (1978) account of explanation in terms of a “characteristic property” and Kitcher’s (1981) unificationist account. While important in having brought the attention of philosophers to mathematical explanation, these proposals have been criticized by scholars looking at detailed case studies from the practice of mathematics, thus adopting a bottom-up approach. See, for example, Hafner and Mancosu 2005, 2008 for specific criticisms of Steiner and Kitcher, respectively, and Mancosu, Poggiolesi, and Pincock 2023 for a comprehensive overview of this area.

Different methodologies within PMP can also be identified by locating them along the spectrum between normative and descriptive analyses of mathematical practice. Consider, for example, epistemology. A purely normative analysis articulating norms governing mathematical justification and knowledge will float free from actual practice – for instance, it won’t be a problem if it leads to the skeptical conclusion that we do not know much mathematics after all. However, when the normative analysis integrates a descriptive component, the norms are taken to be at least partially successfully implemented in practice. For example, some scholars have spelled out norms for proofs with an eye toward what gets accepted in practice. See Tymoczko 1979 for a by-now classic analysis. For more recent proposals, see Easwaran 2009, where it is suggested that proofs should be “transferable”, and De Toffoli 2021a, where it is argued that proofs should be “shareable.”

While traditional efforts in 20th-century mainstream philosophy of mathematics are almost entirely on the normative side, philosophers of mathematical practice tend to inform their normative assessments with a descriptive component. This integration comes in degrees. The more extreme branches of PMP tend to abandon the normative analysis altogether by focusing almost exclusively on a descriptive endeavor, which can, for example, consist of a detailed account of specific episodes in the history of mathematics or in sociological descriptions of how particular mathematical communities are regulated. The different positions along the normative/descriptive dimension are also related by how the term practice is understood, to which we turn in the next section.

This discussion leads us to a more general observation. One problem in the area of PMP is to navigate the porous boundary between aspects of mathematical practice that can be the object of investigation on the part of different sciences and the aspects that are more properly classified as belonging to PMP. The reason why the boundary is porous is that mathematical practice can be studied from a variety of perspectives which include historical, sociological, educational, ethnomathematical, cultural, linguistic, semiotic, biological, and cognitive approaches (see, for example, Van Bendegem 2014). While in our opinion these approaches are to be considered in principle separate from the philosophy of mathematical practice, specific results emerging from these disciplines, as we have pointed out above, might provide important elements of reflection or evidence for philosophical claims in PMP. However, we must point out that more radical approaches to PMP call for a closer symbiosis with one or more of the areas just mentioned.

In the remaining part of the entry, we will refer to these different fields sparingly, but this does not imply that we downplay their potential, and in some cases actual, relevance to PMP, if only as catalysts for philosophical reflection. Among the studies we have in mind, let us mention:

  1. History of mathematics. Chemla 2012 and Ferreirós and Gray 2006 are two significant examples, but in this area there is simply an embarrassment of riches. It is fair to say that while the history of mathematics has provided the material for many case studies in PMP, it is also the case that developments in PMP are influencing many historians of mathematics to pay more attention to certain issues (historical studies of diagrammatic reasoning are perhaps the primary example of this interaction).
  2. Studies about the social dimension of mathematics. See Bloor 1976; Restivo 1985 and the survey paper Barany and Kremakova 2024. For an attempt to bring this direction of studies into PMP, see Löwe and Müller 2008; Jean Paul Van Bendegem and Van Kerkhove 2007.
  3. Cognitive psychology. See Butterworth 1999; Dehaene 1999; Kosslyn 1994, with Giaquinto 2007 as the best example of inclusion of issues of cognitive psychology into PMP (see also Mancosu, Jørgensen, and Pedersen 2005 and Giaquinto 2020 for an overview).
  4. Ethnomathematics. See Everett and Madora 2012 with François and Van Bendegem 2007 as examples of interactions of ethnomathematics and mathematical education with PMP.
  5. Evolutionary biology. See Dehaene and Brannon 2011 and Lorenzi, Perrino, and Vallortigara 2021 for animal and developmental psychology, and Pantsar 2023, 2019a for some recent work related to PMP.
  6. Semiotics. Peirce is here the founding figure, see Carter 2014; see Gastaldi 2024; Wagner 2017; Waszek 2024 for applications to PMP.
  7. Cultural approaches. Wilder 1981 can be seen as antecedent with recent work by Larvor 2016a for some connections to PMP.
  8. Linguistic approaches. See, for instance, the analysis of instructions and imperatives in mathematical texts carried out in Tanswell and Inglis 2024.
  9. Mathematics education. See Hamami and Morris 2020 and Weber and Inglis 2024 for two overviews from mathematics educators and philosophers of mathematical practice. See also the Special Issue of the Journal of Mathematical Behavior edited by De Toffoli, Inglis, Hamami, and Mejia-Ramos (forthcoming).

We should also add that analytic philosophy of mathematics has also been faced with similar boundary issues. If Frege’s warning in the Grundlagen that psychology could not contribute anything to the foundations of mathematics became for a long time the standard position, the reliance of analytic philosophy on linguistic analyses created a porous boundary between linguistics and analytic philosophy of mathematics (consider for instance the study of number words in linguistics and their use in making various ontological claims about the nature of numbers in philosophy of mathematics, see Moltmann 2013).

1.4 Practice: Product or Process?

We surveyed how different approaches within PMP can be distinguished by 1) what areas of mathematics are considered, 2) who are the subjects doing mathematics taken to be and what this doing is taken to consists in, and 3) the adopted methodology.

These approaches can be seen to derive from different understandings of the term ‘practice’ in ‘philosophy of mathematical practice.’ This term suffers from a typical process/product ambiguity. Practice can either refer to the process or activity of doing mathematics, or to the product of such process. Some of the major differences among philosophers of mathematical practice have to do with this same ambiguity.

It is crucial to note, however, that the product/process ambiguity does not give rise to a dichotomy, but rather to a spectrum. We saw that different methodologies within PMP can be located in various positions along the normative/descriptive methodological dimension – similarly, they can be located in various positions along the product/process dimension. While foundational efforts and studies on mathematical platonism will be at the product end of the product/process dimension, studies within PMP will occupy intermediate positions. Still, many of them will be closer to the product than the process end of the spectrum.

For instance, the contributors of some of the most influential edited volumes and Special Issues in the field (Mancosu 2005, 2008b; Mumma and Panza 2012) zoom in on the precipitate of mathematical activity, i.e., the product: explanations, diagrammatic inferences, etc.

This approach can be contrasted with more traditional approaches in the philosophy of mathematics since the products on which philosophers of mathematical practice have been focusing are more heterogeneous compared to the products analyzed by traditional philosophers of mathematics. This is because it is the precipitate of a wider range of mathematical activities, including historical ones.

Moreover, focusing mainly on the product does not mean that the activity or the subjects engaged in it are entirely ignored. For instance, when looking at diagrammatic reasoning in Euclid, Manders (2008) refers to the ‘discipline of control’ specific to the community of geometers involved. Still, the focus is on the arguments themselves, not the activity.

A similar, intermediate position that works at the intersection of the process and the product is that found in Philip Kitcher’s Millian analysis of mathematics. In The Nature of Mathematical Knowledge (1984), Kitcher defines a mathematical practice in terms of five elements: 1) the language adopted, intended as the “vehicle for the performance of mathematical operations as well as its reporting on those operations,” 2) the metamathematical views, such as goals and values, 3) the sets of accepted statements, 4) the methods of reasoning, and 5) the questions (ibid. p. 163). Kitcher mainly focuses on the products of the mathematical activity but keeps in mind the specific origin of these products.

Even studies applying the techniques of social epistemology to the philosophy of mathematics often focus on the product. For example, it is by analyzing specific proofs, such as proofs that require large-scale collaborations like the one for the classification theorem for finite simple groups, that new epistemological evaluations are developed (Habgood-Coote and Tanswell 2021; Steingart 2012).

By contrast, other philosophers of mathematical practice are better understood as located towards the process end of the product/process dimension. They focus on the process and the subjects carrying out the process, conceiving of mathematics as formed by many practices. For example, Van Bendegem and Van Kerkhove (2005, 534) characterize mathematical practices in a way that puts the community of mathematicians at the core. The other aspects of mathematical practices are, according to their view, a research program, a formal language, proof methods, concepts, argumentative methods, and proof strategies. Ferreirós (2016) offers yet another proposal, one that is inspired by Kitcher’s. He suggests revising Kitcher’s characterization of mathematical practice by emphasizing the active role of the practitioners, whom he prefers to call ‘agents,’ and by stressing the co-existence of different mathematical and proto-mathematical practices interacting with each other. Of course, the use of the singular noun ‘mathematical practice’ in other authors in no way carries the implication that mathematics is a monolithic activity, in the same way in which speaking of the nature of physical experiment is compatible with the position that physical experiments are heterogeneous.

For some researchers, especially those influenced by sociological and ethnographic considerations, the notion of mathematical practice (even intended in the plural) is too narrow. They are even further towards the process end of the product/process dimensions – and they also tend to be positioned towards the descriptive end of the normative/descriptive methodological dimension. They aim to replace the notion of mathematical practice with the more general concept of mathematical culture (Larvor 2016a; Selin 2000).

2. Above and Beyond Traditional Philosophy of Mathematics

In this section, we list the main motivations that led to the development of practice-based approaches in the philosophy of mathematics.

By the mid-20th century, many philosophers of mathematics seemed to have reached a consensus. Mathematics was seen as a science that yields objective and a priori knowledge. Arithmetic and logic (including set theory) were considered to be paradigmatic domains of mathematics. The main philosophical questions revolved around the possibility of mathematical knowledge, the nature of mathematical objects, and the several positions on the foundations of mathematics (usually represented by formalism, intuitionism and logicism). This philosophical outlook emerged from research on the foundations of mathematics in the late 19th century, especially from the work of Frege and Hilbert. Because of its popularity, it has been referred to as “mainstream philosophy of mathematics,” or, because of the central role of foundational questions, as “foundationalism” (see Horsten 2019).

As noted above, the development of the philosophy of mathematical practice involved a broadening of the underlying conception of mathematics. Interestingly, this was pursued at the same time from within the foundationalist tradition in the philosophy of mathematics (e.g., by Kitcher (1984) and Maddy (1990, 1997, 2011) and from without (e.g., by philosophers like Lakatos (1976), Tymoczko (1979), and mathematicians like Davis and Hersh (1999)). In both cases, this broadening was presented as being in stark opposition to mainstream approaches in the philosophy of mathematics. The relation to analogous developments in the philosophy of science is worth noting. A practical turn in the philosophy of science occurred in the wake of Thomas Kuhn’s groundbreaking The Structure of Scientific Revolutions (1962) – see Soler et al. (2014).

In this section, we present some of the main considerations that played in favor of extending the range of philosophical studies about mathematics. We end by distinguishing two camps into which philosophers of mathematical practice can be divided: an ecumenical one that emphasizes the continuity and complementarity with foundational projects and an anti-foundational one.

2.1 Pressures on Foundationalist Programs

Part of the impetus to explore new directions in the philosophy of mathematics came from what was perceived as a failure of the main schools in the foundations of mathematics, namely logicism, formalism, and intuitionism (see the entry on philosophy of mathematics). All three schools ran into difficulties that some have perceived as insurmountable.

In brief, Frege’s attempt to reduce arithmetic and analysis to logic was halted by Russell’s Paradox – and Russell’s own version of logicism had to accept principles (the Axiom of Infinity and the Axiom of Reducibility) that could hardly be considered logical. Hilbert’s program found an impasse in Gödel’s Incompleteness Theorems, which showed some principled limitations to what could be proved in formal systems. Brouwer’s intuitionism rejected widely used mathematical principles, such as the law of excluded middle, and could therefore not become a viable account of generally accepted mathematics. This is not to say that new versions of Fregeanism (neo-logicism), modified versions of Hilbert’s program, and varieties of constructive mathematics are not still viable possibilities, but only that the original foundational schools did encounter significant impasses.

This might also be the place to point out that the development of foundationalist positions often demands a deep understanding of important aspects of mathematical practice. Just to give one example, how different areas of mathematics are affected by foundational restrictions (say, what can be rescued of classical analysis when your principles are restricted to set-existence axioms limited in various ways such as in reverse mathematics (Simpson 2009; Stillwell 2018) is a type of foundational investigation that requires intimate knowledge of mathematical practice. Of course, proponents of PMP would go on to point out that one cannot limit attention to only these aspects of the mathematical activity.

2.2 Overly General Questions

Another reason that motivated PMP approaches is that beyond foundational issues, traditional philosophy of mathematics in the 20th century has focused almost exclusively on very general ontological, semantical, and epistemological questions that did not require extensive attention to mathematics.

While the three main schools in the foundations of mathematics were looking inward, since they were concerned with securing mathematical knowledge, analytic philosophy of mathematics also explored the role and indispensability of mathematics in empirical sciences in order to address general questions about the existence of abstract objects, their nature, and our knowledge thereof.

In particular, various articles by Quine (1948, 1951) and two articles by Paul Benacerraf (“What Numbers Could Not Be” (1965) and “Mathematical Truth” (1973)), dominated the landscape. Much of the action in the seventies and eighties was focused on the nominalism-platonism debate with no lack of clever work all around (neo-logicism; structuralism; indispensability arguments; nominalistic approaches; etc.).

2.3 The Relevance of History

Another motivation to look at the practice comes from philosophical issues that emerged from taking seriously the history of mathematics. One important precursor of PMP is Imre Lakatos’ Proofs and Refutations (1976). In his rational reconstruction of a historical case study from combinatorial topology (Euler’s theorem on polyhedra), Lakatos emphasized the quasi-empirical nature of the development of mathematics in which previously accepted arguments and results could be refuted by counterexamples by yielding new, more general theorems. This challenged the view of mathematics as a static body of a priori knowledge held in place by an unshakable foundation in a Euclidean axiomatic style. Moreover, it opened new topics of investigation, such as the nature of mathematical rigor and the process of mathematical discovery, the role of fruitful definitions, and the explanatory value of mathematical theories.

Lakatos rejects the separation of the contexts of discovery and justification, and puts forward a view of mathematics as dynamic, tentative, and fallible. This perspective on mathematics was deeply influenced by George Polya’s (1945) writings on heuristics. Lakatos also raised some very broad questions about mathematics and its development: how does mathematics grow? What is progress in mathematics? These topics were the focus, among other contributions, of the collection Breger and Grosholz 2000.

Lakatos’ work had an impact in the work of many scholars who count as major contributors to PMP. See Gillies 2023 for a discussion of several contributions along the lines of a historical approach to the philosophy of mathematics that reveal the influence of Lakatos’ approach. Gillies’ discussion includes some of the most active philosophers in PMP.

Lakatos’ account was also criticized, and it is not clear how it could be extended to contemporary mathematics (Feferman 1978). Moreover, his sample was very narrow: one case from topology and one case from real analysis (on Cauchy). To repeat, many studies in the history of mathematics have provided ample material for analysis by philosophers of mathematical practice but some areas of investigation have seen a convergence of perspectives coming from different approaches. We are thinking for instance of the diagrammatic reasoning in Euclid’s Elements as developed by Manders (2008), who was coming from a philosophical perspective, and Netz (1999), who merged cognitive and historical motivations.

2.4 Alternative Foundations

Beyond the impasses the foundational schools encountered, we can identify both global and local challenges to the set-theoretic foundationalist picture of mathematics. Global challenges derive from the development of category theory as an alternative foundation of mathematics as well as from the recent program in homotopy type theory. Local challenges, which we discuss in the next section, derived from what some consider a change in the nature of proofs, due to technological advancements. Thus, the ultimate nature of the set-theoretic foundation of mathematics is not only challenged by the mathematics of the past but also by more recent developments in mathematics.

Set theory is generally understood to provide the standard foundational apparatus for mathematics. Still, there are ongoing debates on the acceptability of some axioms. The status of the Axiom of Choice and of the Continuum Hypothesis as well as the use of Large Cardinal Axioms remain topics of debate that are significant for the practice of set theory. Interesting questions for the philosophy of mathematical practice here concern the rationale for the choice of new axioms (see for instance Maddy 2011) and the intertwined nature of philosophical motivation and mathematical developments that is characteristic of the attempts to overcome the incompleteness of set theory. See Rittberg 2020 for an overview of two recent programs, those of Woodin and Hamkins, and further references.

With the advent and increasing popularity of category theory, the special role of set theory has been challenged. Category theory offers an alternative perspective on mathematics, one that does not seem to be in need of an account of mathematical objects, such as sets and numbers. Looking at mathematics from the perspective of category theory thus naturally leads to new philosophical questions. Here we need to distinguish two questions: 1) Can category theory claim to be a foundations of mathematics on a par, or even with better features, than set theory? The debate on this topic has been quite lively. 2) Does category theory display novel and interesting features (independently of its possible role as a foundations of mathematics) which can be of relevance to PMP? The answer to the latter question should be an unequivocal Yes both on account of the role that category theory plays in the formulations of important mathematical theories as well as on account of the attention that philosophers of mathematical practice have displayed towards it. Further readings in the history and philosophy of category theory include (Awodey 2008, 1996; Krömer 2007; Landry 2017; Landry and Marquis 2005; Marquis 2009; McLarty 2005, 2008, 1992). For a general overview, see Marquis 2023.

Of course, challenges to set theory as foundations of mathematics in the constructivist tradition have been countless, but we cannot survey them here (however, see the section below for some comments on homotopy type theory). Once again, attention to mathematical practice is essential in this area as one would like to know how much of classical mathematics can be given a constructivist or computational meaning. An excellent, if now outdated, reference in this area remains Beeson 1985; for more recent work see Bridges et al. 2023.

2.5 Technological Developments

Local challenges to the foundationalist picture came from technological advancements that led to rethink the nature of mathematical proofs. For instance, the existence of computer-assisted proofs has put pressure on the idea that proofs should be the kind of arguments that a single mathematician could survey.

When Kenneth Appel and Wolfgang Haken (1977) announced a computer-assisted proof of the 4-color conjecture, this brought to the forefront a novel aspect of the way in which mathematics proceeds. The conjecture states that all planar maps can be colored with only four colors in such a way that no two adjacent regions share the same color. It entered the agenda of mathematicians in the mid-19th century, but a genuine proof was first published after more than a century. Appel and Haken’s proof raised much ado in both the mathematical and the philosophical community. Being beyond the reach of flash-and-blood mathematicians, it challenged the very nature of mathematical proofs and questioned the a priori status of mathematical knowledge (Detlefsen and Luker 1980; Tymoczko 1979). For a defense of the a priori nature of computer-assisted proofs, see (Burge 1998; Duede and Davey 2026).

Another development that is worth mentioning is one related to Interactive Theorem Provers (ITP). These are computer tools supposed to help mathematicians in creating formal counterparts of their proofs. They are gaining traction among some mathematicians, but their use is still limited. However, some think that in the not so distant future, their use will be much more common, at least in some areas of mathematics (Avigad 2018b; Buzzard 2022; Avigad 2024). For a philosophical discussion, see (De Toffoli 2024).

The use of ITPs is also linked to alternative foundations of mathematics. As a matter of fact, in the last part of his career, Vladimir Voevodsky contributed to the effort of developing homotopy type theory (HoTT) as a new foundational framework for mathematics that could be more readily integrated into ITPs (Voevodsky 2014 – see Other Internet Resources). Voevodsky’s main motivation in developing and promoting ITPs was related to worries related to the correctness of published mathematical results. For a useful set of contributions on different foundations approaches such as set theory and homotopy type theory see Centrone, Kant, and Sarikaya 2019.

ITPs have been used to check the correctness of traditional proofs. Moreover, they have also been deployed to check the correctness of computer-assisted proofs, whose epistemological status remains somewhat borderline. One of the first major achievements in the formalization of mathematics is George Gothier’s formalization of a proof of the 4-color Theorem in 2005. Another major achievement is the formalization of Tom Hales’ proof of the Kepler Conjecture, which extensively used automated computations, by him and a group of collaborators (Hales et al. 2017).

The use of technology in mathematics is continuing to grow, and new AI tools are already posing new philosophical challenges. See, for example, the contribution in the Special Issue of the Bulletin of the American Mathematical Society dedicated to the topic (Fraser et al. 2024).

Another area of interest, which has been aided by technological developments, is experimental mathematics. The Handbook in the History and Philosophy of Mathematical Practice (Sriraman 2024) contains many articles devoted this topic – see, among others (Carter 2024a; Sørensen 2024).

2.6 Ecumenical and Anti-Foundationalist PMP

Not all philosophers of mathematical practice share the same attitude towards more foundationalist traditions. We propose to make a distinction between an ecumenical stance, adopted by philosophers of mathematical practice who see their work as complementary to foundational endeavors, and an anti-foundationalist stance, taken up by those who position themselves in straight opposition to them.

Early authors working on what came to be called the philosophy of mathematical practice prefaced their studies with an explicit and often polemical rejection of what they considered to be the received view. For example, Lakatos (1976) explicitly argued against a ‘deductivist’ view of mathematics, while Tymoczko (1986) and Aspray and Kitcher (1988) saw in foundationalist approaches their primary target. To emphasize the radical nature of their view, the latter presented themselves as part of the “maverick tradition” in philosophy of mathematics.

In addition to creating an ideological rift within the philosophy of mathematics, this narrative also ignored the fact that philosophers within the foundationalist tradition itself had begun to criticize foundationalist approaches (Putnam 1967; Quine 1951) and to pursue new questions related to contemporary mathematics (Maddy 1996).

The ecumenical stance does not oppose foundational efforts. It considers them to be valuable contributions to the philosophy of mathematics while at the same time recognizing that there are other important questions to be addressed. This stance is well-exemplified in the volume “The Philosophy of Mathematical Practice” (Mancosu 2008b). On the contrary, the anti-foundationalist stance directly opposes foundationalist efforts. A contribution adopting this stance is Corfield 2003. Even within the analytic framework, one can perceive anti-foundationalist features in the work of Maddy (1997), at least to the extent that her naturalism rejects a philosophy-first approach and she embraces a methodology that sits uncomfortably with the traditional foundationalist programs.

While the ecumenical stance sees the developments in the philosophy of mathematics as an extension of the topics and the perspectives which fall under the purview of philosophy of mathematics, the anti-foundationalist stance sees it as an irreconcilable split between different approaches and traditions. The latter is made explicit in the “brief and biased history” of philosophy of mathematics by Aspray and Kitcher (1988), who identify two traditions that are centered around two general research programs: (1) the mainstream, which started with Frege and is centered around questions regarding the foundations of mathematics; and (2) a much less developed, maverick tradition that began with Lakatos. Philosophical topics within the latter tradition deal with current or historical mathematical practices and include the growth of mathematical knowledge, the nature of mathematical progress, the criteria for evaluating mathematical ideas and theories, and the nature of mathematical explanation.

On the relation between these two traditions, Aspray and Kitcher find no consensus among philosophers of mathematics. Some, such as Parsons, Steiner and Maddy, suggest that they are compatible, while others, such as Lakatos and Kitcher, have argued on the basis of the methodology of mathematics, that there is no a priori foundation of mathematics (thus concluding that the Fregean tradition leads to a dead end). The question whether philosophy of mathematics should be concerned with identifying foundations of mathematics is singled out as provoking “the clearest divisions in the volume” that they edited.

A philosopher who explicitly opposes research on the foundations of mathematics is Carlo Cellucci (2006, 32), who speaks of the “rejection” of the dominant view in the philosophy of mathematics that considers the justification of mathematics, rather than mathematical discovery, as its main problem. He rejects more ecumenical approaches as being an extension of mainstream philosophy of mathematics, but not as a proper alternative.

In a similar vein, David Corfield sees himself as continuing the Lakatos tradition in philosophy of mathematics and he clearly takes a side with regard to the question regarding its relation to foundationalist philosophy of mathematics. He speaks of dismantling the “foundationalist filter” that has held back philosophers from taking seriously past and contemporary mathematics, because of their inability of providing novel contributions to the foundationalist questions, and he presents his discussion as a head-on confrontation of such “erroneous beliefs” (Corfield 2003, 5). Reactions have been mixed: Unsurprisingly, Corfield’s “anti-foundationalist manifesto” has irked some philosophers (Paseau 2005, 195), while for others that are more sympathetic to the general approach “Corfield’s project is not nearly as radical as he would have us think” (Arana 2007, 83).

In the next section, we include a brief survey of what we consider to be among the most important topics that have been investigated within PMP. They all fall under the umbrella heading of epistemic virtues in mathematics.

3. Epistemic Virtues in Mathematics

At first, it might seem strange to appeal, in reference to mathematics, to a notion like virtue, which is traditionally associated with ethics or moral theory. Aristotle famously discussed moral and intellectual virtues, the former to be fostered through the development, by means of training, of the appropriate character traits and the latter through teaching and experience for developing the appropriate intellectual traits. The bearers of such virtues are human subjects and/or their actions although much recent work in virtue theory (Hursthouse and Pettigrove 2023) has also considered extensions to groups (e.g., a just jury, a fair-minded committee) and institutions (honesty and generosity might be predicated of some such entities). Moreover, in connection with intellectual virtues, groups and institutions might display open-mindedness, originality, etc. It is thus not surprising that talk of moral and intellectual virtues can be applied to the more specific agents involved in scientific activities: we can certainly speak of honesty, courage, justice (the area of epistemic injustice is an important area of contemporary epistemology; see Fricker 2009; Turri, Alfano, and Greco 2021), practical wisdom, understanding, open-mindedness etc. By now the original surprise originated by bringing together virtues with a scientific area such as mathematics might appear to weaken. However, things are more complex. Indeed, it is not clear that intellectual and moral virtues display the same features in all areas of human activity (and thus also in mathematical activity) as opposed to receiving specific inflections in different areas. For instance, one could reasonably think of the opposite of certain virtues as vices. And now we encounter the paradoxical situation that certain virtues might turn out to obstruct, in some circumstances, the telos of the discipline whereas certain vices might promote the telos.

Consider the intellectual virtue of rigor in mathematics. The word “rigor” suffers from the process/product ambiguity we already discussed: it may mean that a mathematician proceeds rigorously in her investigation or that a product of the mathematical activity (e.g., a theorem or a theory) is rigorous. We embrace this ambiguity here because in general when speaking about mathematics we have to consider both the activities of the mathematicians as well as the products of their activities. So, rigor would seem a quintessential positive virtue in mathematics, both when attributed to the agent doing mathematics as well as to the product of that activity. And yet it turns out that rigor can be an obstructive virtue: the mathematicians of the seventeenth century (starting from Descartes and Fermat on to Leibniz and Newton) had to abandon the rigor characteristic of Greek mathematics, for it had become detrimental to the progress of the discipline. It also appears that certain vices can be productive with respect to the end-goals of the discipline. Cases of mathematical environments driven by lack of intellectual humility, epistemic injustice, and sheer aggressiveness have been known to stimulate the epistemic exposure of a mathematical community to a vast range of new mathematics. A famous case is that of the Gelfand seminar in Moscow (Tanswell and Kidd 2021; Gerovitch 2016) but it is by no means unique.

Thus far, we have discussed aspects of moral and intellectual virtues that apply to mathematicians and communities of mathematicians as agents who are the bearers of the ascription of such virtues (Aberdein, Rittberg, and Tanswell 2021; Tanswell 2017). While we think that this is an extremely interesting part of the story, our interest here is in epistemic virtues as they apply to the products of mathematical activities. Mathematicians prove theorems, create theories, provide definitions, make conjectures, and do many more things in their work. The products of these activities (proofs, theories, definitions, conjectures, etc.) have objective features that mathematicians themselves have characterized through reference to epistemic virtues. And it is the task of philosophers of mathematics to try to make sense of the objective properties that justify the ascription of such virtues to the relevant mathematical products/objects.

In “The Philosophy of Mathematical Practice”, Mancosu wrote:

If mathematicians cared only about the truth of certain results, it would be hard to understand why after discovering a certain mathematical truth they often go ahead to prove the result in several different ways. This happens because different proofs or different presentations of entire mathematical areas (complex analysis etc.) have different epistemic virtues. Explanation is among the most important virtues that mathematicians seek. Very often the proof of a mathematical result convinces us that the result is true but does not tell us why it is true. Alternative proofs, or alternative formulations of entire theories, are often given with this explanatory aim in mind. (2008a, 15)

But explanatoriness is only one of the epistemic virtues that can be applied to the products of a mathematical activity (in this case proofs and theories). Another very important virtue is purity of methods, namely the idea that the proof of a certain mathematical statement should appeal only to concepts that appear in the statement itself and not make appeal to “remote” or “foreign” concepts. The notion of purity has played an important role in the history of mathematics – consider, for instance, the elimination of geometrical intuition from the development of analysis in the 19th century – and in a way it underlies all the investigations concerning issues of conservativity in contemporary proof theory. That purity is often cherished in mathematical practice is made obvious by the fact that Selberg was awarded the Fields Medal (the equivalent of the Nobel Prize in mathematics) for, among other things, the elementary proof of the prime number theorem (already demonstrated with analytical tools in the late 19th century).

Alongside purity and explanatoriness, two further epistemic virtues are particularly important in mathematical practice: rigor and visualizability. Mathematical rigor ensures the reliability of mathematical results and distinguishes genuine proofs from mere persuasive arguments. Yet, rigor is not a fixed notion – it evolves with mathematical methods and technologies. Visualizability concerns instead the cognitive accessibility of mathematical reasoning: the capacity to grasp a proof, concept, or structure through visual or spatial representations such as different kinds of diagrams. Far from being in tension with rigor, visualizability often supports our understanding of proofs.

The list of epistemic virtues could be easily added to: depth, simplicity, ontological parsimony, epistemic economy, rigor, fruitfulness, beauty, generalizability, etc. (Morris 2024). Rather than try to address all of them we will consider here purity of methods, explanation, rigor, and visualizability which are arguably the areas in which progress has been more substantial. For the other epistemic virtues, we will limit ourselves to some bibliographical references.

3.1 Purity of Methods

Purity of methods refers to a cluster of issues which emerge in mathematical practice and whose analysis leads to several issues of great philosophical relevance. It is not uncommon in mathematics to see efforts leading to the request that a certain problem (or theorem) should be solved (resp. proved) using only conceptual resources that belong to the mathematical discipline in which the problem (or theorem) is stated or only through conceptual resources that are somehow already mentioned or are implicit in the statement of the problem (resp. theorem). Examples abound but typical instances of the former type of purity are Bolzano’s (1817 [1996]) analytic proof of the intermediate value theorem which eschewed any appeal to geometry or mechanics in favor of a purely analytic proof or the number theoretic proof of Jacobi’s four square theorem which was first proved by Jacobi using elliptic integrals and only later received an elementary number theoretic proof (Arana 2024). The type of purity that is relevant to Bolzano’s proof has been called geographical purity. Mathematical disciplines can be compared to countries on a map (whose boundaries can change with time) and the request is that one should not go beyond the (conceptual) boundaries of the discipline to find a solution or a proof for a certain problem or theorem. In the case of Bolzano’s intermediate value theorem, geometry and analysis were seen by Bolzano as two different mathematical disciplines with the principles of analysis not dependent on those of geometry (by contrast, Bolzano considered geometry as an applied area of analysis). Hence a purely analytic proof of the intermediate value theorem (or any other theorem of analysis) should not appeal to principles of geometry which are “foreign” to the disciplinary area to which the theorem belongs. Same reasoning for the use of transcendental techniques (elliptic integrals, complex analysis, Fourier series, etc.) that were deployed in Jacobi’s original proof of the four-square theorem (i.e., “the number of representations of n as a sum of four squares is 8 times the sum of the positive divisors of n that are not divisible by 4”). Elementary number theory as a discipline has its own disciplinary boundaries which concern properties of the integers and concepts from complex analysis, integrals, etc. are foreign to it. But the statement of Jacobi’s four-square theorem is a statement about elementary properties of the integers. Hence the request for a proof of the theorem that only uses concepts from elementary number theory. Such a proof was given by Jacobi himself in 1834 (seven years after he had published his “transcendental” proof) by “translating” the transcendental proof into a number theoretic proof; later, other mathematicians gave other number-theoretic proofs that were not mere translations of Jacobi’s original proof; see Arana 2024. Engel (1987) brings the request for purity in number theory clearly to the fore:

Number theory deals with the properties of integers, so one should actually demand that it prove all of its theorems without leaving the realm of integers. But there is still a long way to go before she can do that. A good number of apparently extremely simple theorems have hitherto only been able to be proved with the use of an enormous apparatus of transcendent means, of theorems from the theory of elliptic functions, and the like. (cited in Arana 2024, 20)

The cases just discussed concern purity with respect to disciplinary boundaries. There are however issues of purity that emerge even within a given disciplinary area. For instance, one might focus on what is mentioned in a problem or theorem one is interested in and request that the concepts deployed in the solution or proof do not go beyond those mentioned in the problem or theorem at hand. Hilbert gives voice to such request in his discussion of Desargues’ theorem in projective geometry:

This theorem gives us an opportunity now to discuss an important issue. The content [Inhalt] of Desargues’ theorem belongs completely to planar geometry; for its proof we needed to use space. Therefore we are for the first time in a position to put into practice a critique of means of proof. In modern mathematics such criticism is raised very often, where the aim is to preserve the purity of method [die Reinheit der Methode], i.e. to prove theorems if possible using means that are suggested by the content of the theorem. (Hilbert 2004 cited in Arana and Mancosu 2012, 315–316)

While Hilbert’s discussion concerns alternative proofs of the plane version of Desargues’ theorem in projective geometry, the request for purity here addresses finer boundary lines than mere disciplinary ones, namely the legitimacy of using spatial concepts or metric concepts for proving a statement which only appeals to plane projective concepts. One often refers to this phenomenon as topical purity.

The above examples are hopefully clear enough to bring out the kind of mathematical practice from which a philosophical analysis of purity emerges. In addition to the study of specific cases of purity in mathematical practice, philosophers of mathematical practice have addressed the following questions: what are the epistemic virtues of purity and those of impurity, respectively (on impurity as an epistemic virtue see Lehet 2021a; Ryan 2021; Blue 2025)? Is it in general true that impurity leads to shorter proofs? How does purity relate to explanation? What is the proper notion of “content” of a statement needed to articulate a fruitful notion of purity? Should one look for more than one notion of “content” depending on different notions of purity? How does one articulate the major varieties of purity found in mathematical practice? For instance, Arana (2024) articulates the distinction corresponding to the examples we mentioned above by distinguishing “geographical” and “topical purity”, but other notions of purity are also brought to the fore in his book: “elemental” and “syntactic” purity, among others. The notion of “elemental” purity can be formulated as follows: the proof of a theorem is elementally pure if it only draws on what is more elementary than the theorem itself. But “more elementary” can be cashed out either in cognitive or metaphysical terms and this leads to issues in epistemology and metaphysics. This is not the place to enter into details but hopefully what has been said is sufficient to provide a sense of the area. The reader with find an up-to-date investigation of the topic in Arana 2024. Among other recent contributions see: Arana 2023; Arana and Mancosu 2012; Arana and Stafford 2023; Detlefsen 2008; Detlefsen and Arana 2011; Ferraro and Panza 2012; Giovannini, Haeusler, and Lassalle Casanave 2024; Hallett 2008.

3.2 Mathematical Explanation

Just like purity of methods, the topic of mathematical explanation finds its roots in scientific and mathematical practice. On the one hand, mathematics is often appealed to in explanations provided in the natural or social sciences and this raises the question of the exact role of mathematics in the economy of such explanations. On the other hand, within mathematics one often distinguishes, for instance, between explanatory versus non explanatory theories or proofs. Of the many new areas studied in the philosophy of mathematical practice, mathematical explanation is arguably the one that has witnessed the most impressive development. Here we will limit ourselves to a presentation of some of the major areas of work and some essential bibliography. For a more comprehensive overview see (Mancosu, Poggiolesi, and Pincock 2023; Pincock 2023).

Mathematics plays a central role in our scientific picture of the world. How the connection between mathematics and the world is to be accounted for remains one of the most challenging problems in philosophy of science, philosophy of mathematics, and general philosophy. A very important aspect of this problem is that of accounting for the explanatory role mathematics seems to play in the account of physical phenomena. Consider the following example from evolutionary biology introduced in Baker 2005 and discussed extensively in the philosophical literature. It has to do with the life-cycle of the so-called ‘periodical’ cicada. It turns out that three species of such cicadas:

…share the same unusual life-cycle. In each species the nymphal stage remains in the soil for a lengthy period, then the adult cicada emerges after 13 years or 17 years depending on the geographical area. Even more strikingly, this emergence is synchronized among the members of a cicada species in any given area. The adults all emerge within the same few days, they mate, die a few weeks later and then the cycle repeats itself. (Baker 2005, 229)

Several questions have been raised about this specific type of life cycle but one of them is why such periods are prime. One explanation appeals to the biological claim that cicadas that minimize intersection with other cicadas’ and predators’ life cycles have an evolutionary advantage over those that do not. The mathematical component of the explanation complements the biological claim by pointing out that prime periods minimize intersection. Baker concludes that:

The explanation makes use of specific ecological facts, general biological laws, and number theoretic result. My claim is that the purely mathematical component [prime periods minimize intersection (compared to non-prime periods)] is both essential to the overall explanation and genuinely explanatory on its own right. In particular it explains why prime periods are evolutionarily advantageous in this case. (2005, 233)

While not everyone agrees as to the role of mathematics in the above explanation, or whether it is an explanation, it is clear that one of the reasons why philosophers are especially interested in such explanations is that they appear to be counterexamples to the claim that all explanations in the natural sciences must be causal. The dominant accounts of scientific explanation in the natural sciences have been causal accounts: to provide an explanation of a scientific fact is to provide its cause or the mechanism yielding the fact. In the last two decades there have been major contributions in the study of non-causal explanations in the sciences (for a recent volume devoted to the issue see Reutlinger and Saatsi 2018). And since many of the non-causal explanations that have been discussed in the literature are mathematical explanations, this area of philosophy of science is fueled by concerns related to the nature of scientific explanation.

There are two major areas in which the discussion of whether mathematics can play an explanatory role in science makes itself felt. The first concerns issues of modeling and idealization in science and more generally, as pointed out above, the nature of scientific explanation. The second, concerns the nominalism-platonism debate. By and large the former area is a major concern to philosophers of science. The latter is the preoccupation of those philosophers of mathematics primarily concerned with issues of mathematical ontology. In the latter area one of the major focal points of the discussion have been on so-called ‘enhanced indispensability arguments’–for general accounts, see (Colyvan 2001, 2024; Panza and Sereni 2016; Paseau and Baker 2023). There is actually a variety of classical indispensability arguments but the general structure of the argument runs as follows. One begins with the premise that mathematics is indispensable for our best science. But, second premise, we ought to believe our best theories. Thus, we ought to be committed to the kind of entities that our best theories quantify over. In general this is an argument in favor of Platonism, as our best science quantifies over mathematical entities. Several versions of the indispensability argument rely on a holistic conception of scientific theories according to which the ontological commitments of the theory is determined by looking at all the existential claims implied by the theory. However, no attention is paid to how the different parts of the theory might be responsible for different posits and to the different roles that the latter might play. Baker (2005) offers a version of the indispensability argument that does not depend on holism. Baker starts from a debate between Colyvan (2001, 2002) and Melia (2000, 2002) that saw both authors agreeing that the prospects for a successful platonist use of the indispensability argument rests on examples from scientific practice in which the postulation of mathematical objects results in an increase of those theoretical virtues which are provided by the postulation of theoretical entities. Both authors agree that among such theoretical virtues is explanatory power. Such explanations give a new twist to the indispensability argument. The argument now runs as follows.

  1. There are genuinely mathematical explanations of empirical phenomena
  2. We ought to be committed to the theoretical posits postulated by such explanations; thus,
  3. We ought to be committed to the entities postulated by the mathematics in question.

Baker (2005) provided the example of the prime period of the cicadas already introduced above, in an attempt to argue that in this particular case the role of the mathematics involved was clearly explanatory and not merely descriptive and thus that this type of explanation was exactly of the sort needed for an enhanced indispensability argument. The discussion since then has developed in many directions including attempts to characterize descriptive and explanatory roles of mathematics in the natural sciences, the discussion of many more cases of mathematical explanations (in physics, biology, medicine and the social sciences), the validity of the enhanced indispensability argument, the nature of inferences to the best explanation, and other issues. To provide the reader with a sense of the growth of the secondary literature in this area, it is enough to note that more than twenty articles discuss Baker’s cicada example directly.

Lyon and Colyvan 2008 also contains a much-discussed example from evolutionary biology. Why do hive-bee honeycombs have a hexagonal structure? The nature of the question is contrastive: why hexagonal as opposed to, say, any other polygonal figure or combination thereof? Part of the explanation depends on evolutionary facts. Bees that use less wax and thus spend less energy have a better chance at evolving via natural selection. The explanation is completed by pointing out that ‘any partition of the plane into regions of equal area has perimeter at least that of the regular hexagonal honeycomb tiling’. Thus, the hexagonal tiling is optimal with respect to dividing the plane into equal areas and minimizing the perimeter. This fact, known as the ‘honeycomb conjecture’ was proved in Hales 2001 (see also Hales 2000). The explanation of the biological fact seems to depend essentially on a mathematical fact. Just like the cicada example, this case has been extensively discussed in the literature.

Let us now move to explanations within mathematics. Much mathematical activity is driven by factors other than justificatory aims such as establishing the truth of a mathematical fact. In many cases, mere knowledge that something is the case will be considered unsatisfactory and this will lead mathematicians to probe the situation further to look for better explanations of the facts. This might take the form of, just to give a few examples, providing alternative proofs for known results, giving an account for surprising analogies, or recasting an entire area of mathematics on a new basis in the pursuit of a more satisfactory ‘explanatory’ account of the area.

An interesting case is that of Gregory Brumfiel, a real algebraic geometer. In his book “Partially ordered rings and semi-algebraic geometry” (1979), Brumfiel contrasts different methods for proving theorems about real closed fields. One method of proof consists in using a so-called transfer principle which allows one to infer the truth of a sentence for all real closed fields from its being true in one real closed field, say the real numbers. Despite the fact that the transfer principle is a very efficient tool, Brumfiel does not make any use of it, and he is very clear about this.

In this book we absolutely and unequivocally refuse to give proofs of this second type [the one relying on the transfer principle]. Every result is proved uniformly for all real closed ground fields. Our philosophical objection to transcendental proofs [those relying on the transfer principle] is that they may logically prove a result but they do not explain it, except for the special case of real numbers. (Brumfiel 1979, 166)

Brumfiel prefers a third proof method which aims at giving non transcendental proofs of purely algebraic results. This does not mean that he restricts himself to just elementary methods; he does use stronger tools but it is crucial that they apply uniformly to all real closed fields. For an analysis of Brumfiel’s explanatory program see (Hafner and Mancosu 2008).

The above example is one in which an entire area of mathematics is organized favoring certain proofs (which, according to the author, possess explanatory virtue) over others (which lack explanatory virtue). One could easily provide myriads of statements by mathematicians contrasting explanatory and non-explanatory proofs of the same theorem or explanatory talk applied other aspects of mathematics that do not reduce to proofs. We will only provide one more example taken from a book by Mordell where dissatisfaction for the lack of explanatoriness of certain Euclidean proofs is at stake:

Even when a proof has been mastered, there may be a feeling of dissatisfaction with it, though it may be strictly logical and convincing; such as, for example, the proof of a proposition in Euclid. The reader may feel that something is missing. The argument may have been presented in such a way as to throw no light on the why and wherefore of the procedure or on the origin of the proof or why it succeeds. (1959, 11)

This sense of dissatisfaction will often lead to a search for a more satisfactory proof. Mathematicians appeal to this phenomenon often enough. While early work in the area (see Sandborg 1997 and Hafner and Mancosu 2005) had attempted to sample the variety of mathematical explanations and the extent of their recognition in mathematical practice by limited search tools, a combination of experimental philosophy (Pease, Aberdein, and Martin 2019) and application of AI using large language models (D’Alessandro forthcoming; Meja-Ramos et al. 2019) have recently been deployed to map in more systematical ways the extent of explanatory talk both in the making of mathematics (the ‘back’ of mathematics) as well as in the final outcome of such research (the ‘front’ of mathematics).

Mathematical explanations of mathematical facts have a distinguished pedigree as they are already singled out by Aristotle in his distinction between ‘proof of the fact’ and ‘proof of the reasoned fact’. The distinction played a role in the development of the philosophy of mathematics and is still at the core of the accounts of philosophy of mathematics propounded by Bolzano and Cournot, two major philosophers of mathematics in the nineteenth century. They construe the central problem of philosophy of mathematics as that of accounting for the distinction between explanatory and nonexplanatory demonstrations. In the case of Bolzano this takes the form of a theory of Grund (ground) and Folge (consequence). Kitcher (1975) was the first to read Bolzano as articulating a theory of mathematical explanation. In the case of Cournot this is spelled out in terms of the opposition between “ordre logique” and “ordre rationnel” (see Cournot 1851; Mancosu 1999). In Bolzano’s case, the aim of providing a reconstruction of parts of analysis and geometry, so that the exposition would use only “explanatory” proofs, also led to major mathematical results, such as his purely analytic proof of the intermediate value theorem. There is another tradition of thinking of explanation in mathematics that includes Mill, Lakatos, Russell and Gödel. These authors are motivated by a conception of mathematics (and/or its foundations) as hypothetico-deductive in nature and this leads them to construe mathematical activity in analogy with how explanatory hypotheses occur in science (see Mancosu 2001 for more details).

There are several accounts on offer of mathematical explanation and it is not possible here to list them all or in any detail. Various classification schemes can also be used to classify such accounts. For instance, Chris Pincock (2023) uses the opposition between monism (mathematical explanations can be reduced to a single explanatory relevance relation) and pluralism (mathematical explanations display a multiplicity of explanatory relevance relations) as the watershed for classifying the major accounts on offer, but other criteria are also possible.

Among the major accounts are those of Steiner (1978), Kitcher (1989), Lange (2017), and Pincock (2015a, 2015b, 2025). A variety of counterfactual accounts have also been proposed in the last decade (by, among others, Reutlinger, Baron, Colyvan, Ripley, and Povich; for a critical survey of the counterfactual accounts see the extended discussion in Chapter 1 of Pincock 2023).

Another point is the relationship between explanation and understanding. While nobody denies that explanation is connected to understanding, some scholars have been trying to characterize explanation in terms of understanding and have developed so-called epistemic accounts of mathematical explanation (see Inglis and Mejía Ramos 2021; Frans and Van Kerkhove 2023; for a critique of such approaches, see Chudnoff and De Toffoli 2025. See also Lehet 2021b; D’Alessandro and Lehet 2024).

3.3 Mathematical Rigor

Rigor is perhaps the most paradigmatic of the epistemic virtues associated with mathematical proof. Proofs should be rigorous. More than that, a putative proof that is not rigorous is not a genuine proof, so proofs must be rigorous. To call a proof rigorous means that it successfully establishes that its conclusion follows from its premises through acceptable deductive steps. Rigorous proofs are contrasted with proof sketches, flawed arguments, and mere plausibility claims. As with other epistemic virtues, rigor admits of a process/product ambiguity: one may say that a mathematician proceeds rigorously, or that a proof or theory is itself rigorous. We will focus on the latter.

While mathematicians are generally satisfied with being able to recognize rigorous proofs, the main philosophical challenge around rigor is to provide a clear characterization of it. Historically, rigor has been implemented in different ways. With its axiomatic structure, Euclidean geometry strived for an ideal of rigor where all primitive objects were defined in advance and all propositions were deduced from other propositions, going back to the postulates. A relaxation of this ideal was introduced with the development of the calculus in the 18th century. This relaxation involved the use of unreliable methods, such as those involving infinitesimals and infinite series. This gave rise to a counter-tendency, known as the “rigorization” or “arithmetization” of analysis, which implied, for instance, a ban on intuitive reasoning in analysis (Hahn 1980; Burgess 2015).

Even if we can talk about mathematical rigor before the rigorization of analysis that culminated at the beginning of the 20th century, the problem surrounding mathematical rigor that we face today has clearer contours than its historical counterparts and can only be stated with the aid of modern logic. From the standpoint of logic, rigor guarantees that the premises of an argument logically imply its conclusion. It is through breakthroughs in logic in the 1920s and 30s that the semantic conception of logical implication was linked to syntactic notions of deducibility. Gödel proved his completeness theorem in 1929. By the 1940s, it was widely accepted that any rigorously established modern mathematical result admits a formal derivation from the axioms of set theory.

Through these results, one major aspect of the contemporary problem of rigor can be articulated as a problem about the relationship between informal proofs, which are the common currency among mathematicians, and formal proofs, or derivations in a specific formal system, that are the logicians’ ideal of proof. Or, even more precisely, about the relationship between informal and formal provability (Leitgeb 2009). The question is: how can informal proofs guarantee the existence of formal proofs without being one? That is: how can the perspective of the working mathematicians match that of logicians?

From the perspective of working mathematicians, informal proofs are sufficient to establish a mathematical proposition. This does not mean that mathematicians do not believe that a formal derivation of such a proposition does not exist, but simply that the criteria of acceptability for proofs often do not depend on formal proofs:

In some cases, mathematicians don’t accept a proof because it is formalizable; they accept a proof for other reasons (e.g., visualizations they know to be reliable), and then they infer that it is formalizable. (De Toffoli 2021b, 1787)

That is, correctness is equated to formalizability, but the latter is not used as evidence – it is rather a consequence:

[W]e do not need to invoke formal verification for empirical support. Mathematical disputes over the correctness of a proof generally hinge on the complexity of the argument and the difficulty of filling in the details, not on the correctness of any single, atomic inference. In practice, mathematicians generally expect that if a step in a proof is correct, it can be spelled out in detail, reducing it to inferences that are mathematically immediate. And we have seen enough logic by now to know that such inferences are generally amenable to formalization. (Avigad 2021, 3–4)

Even if formalizability is not often used as support, evidence that formalization is impossible is generally taken as evidence that a result cannot be proven tout court (for a contrary opinion, see Weatherall and Wolfson forthcoming). Consider the independence results; everyone agrees that mathematicians would waste their time trying to prove the Continuum Hypothesis using conventional means. This holds more generally. Evidence of non-formalizability is evidence that something has gone awry:

should it become clear that the implications (of assumptions to conclusion) of an informal proof cannot be replicated by a formal analogue, the status of that informal proof as a successful proof will be rejected. (Azzouni 2009, 14)

And formalizability, or at least partial formalizability, has also been invoked to explain the extraordinary consensus that contemporary mathematicians enjoy. According to Wagner (2022), historically, mathematical consensus on the validity of proof was much less widespread. The current robust agreement is a modern development, consolidating around the turn of the 20th century. Wagner proposes that this modern consensus is best explained not by the ubiquitous use of full formalizations – which are rare – but by formalization acting as a sort of hierarchical court of appeal for resolving disputes.

Let’s take stock. Mathematicians generally accept the perspective of logicians in thinking that a formal counterpart of their informal proof must exist, at least in principle. They also use partial formalizations to resolve disputes. The contemporary philosophical problem of rigor then concerns how to put together these two perspectives on proof: that of the working mathematicians and that offered by logicians. In other words, it is about the connection between traditional, or informal proofs, and derivations in formal systems, or formal proofs.

According to what is often called the “Standard View,” a mathematical proof is rigorous if and only if it can be translated into a formal derivation in some canonical deductive system. This, however, is a family of views rather than a single position (see Burgess and De Toffoli 2022; Hamami 2022; Tanswell 2024). What does it mean exactly, “translated”? Philosophers of mathematical practice have often emphasized the distance between formal and informal proofs, thus challenging the Standard View or at least some of its strict interpretations.

In the last century, the Standard View has been popularized by Bourbaki and was explicitly endorsed by Mac Lane:

A Mathematical proof is rigorous when it is (or could be) written out in the first order predicate language […] In practice, a proof is a sketch, in sufficient detail to make possible a routine translation of this sketch into a formal proof. (Mac Lane 1986, 377)

Hamami (2022) critically assesses the origins of the Standard View and further develops the idea of “routine translation.” In his view, this can be decomposed into a three-stage algorithmic procedure: (i) make the informal argument explicit at a “higher-level,” (ii) unpack those higher-level moves into more basic steps, and (iii) formalize those basic steps in a suitable system.

Recent concrete efforts towards the formalization of mathematics with the aid of Interactive Theorem Provers (e.g., Lean, Coq, Isabelle) align well with the Standard View. Interactive Theorem Provers are software that help mathematicians create formal proofs from their informal arguments. Some of the proponents of these tools are even thinking that mathematical practice is about to face a new rigorization trend driven by emerging technologies that are going to make formalization much easier than before (Avigad 2024; Buzzard 2024; see also De Toffoli 2024; Granville 2024; Harris 2024 for philosophical discussions). The dream of some scholars involved in the formalization of mathematics is to develop reliable auto-formalization systems that combine traditional symbolic methods with neural AI (Wu et al. 2022).

An early proponent of the Standard View is Steiner (1975), who claims that to get to a formal proof we can start from an informal proof and proceed simply by “filling in the gaps.” This strict interpretation of the connection between formal and informal proofs, however, poses some problems with respect to the use of representations and diagrams (De Toffoli and Giardino 2016; Larvor 2012), an issue we turn to in the next section. Burgess (2015) develops a more moderate version of the Standard View.

Some philosophers of mathematical practice felt the need to oppose the Standard View because they thought that it threatened to reduce informal proofs to formal proof (in the same way that, according to some, mathematics was “reduced” to set theory). However, it is not clear whether proponents of the Standard View have this aim in mind. In any case, looking at the practice of mathematics, it is clear that informal proofs achieve much more than the justification of a particular result and cannot be reduced to derivations. This is an aspect that has been highlighted by philosophers of mathematical practice.

It is in this context that, at the turn of the last century, a debate was carried out in a series of papers between Azzouni and Rav. By focusing on different functions of proofs, Rav (1999, 2007) put forward an account according to which proofs cannot be reduced to formal derivations. Contra Rav, Azzouni (2004a, 2006, 2009) argued that proofs indicate derivations.

An issue with Azzouni’s view of proofs as indicators of derivations is the over-generation problem (Tanswell 2015). When we formalize an informal proof, we make many non-trivial choices, starting with the choice of a specific formal system – among the many formal proofs we can associate with an informal proof, which one should we choose? This and other issues led Azzouni to refine his account (Azzouni 2017, 2024).

Other critiques of the Standard View can be found in Pelc 2008; Antonutti Marfori 2010; Larvor 2016b; Pawlowski and Zahidi 2024; Weber 2022.

Larvor (2012) opposes the Standard View by offering a programmatic account of informal proofs and arguing that some proofs cannot be translated into formal proofs at all. Larvor’s main idea is that we cannot appeal to formal correctness to explain why mathematicians accept certain informal proofs, and thus that we have to develop other ways to articulate the normative dimension governing a specific mathematical practice. It is with this goal in mind that he puts forward the notion of “permissible (inferential) actions,” adopting a broad conception of inference (not necessarily involving propositions) and a framework from argumentation theory.

Another approach inspired by argumentation theory is Dutilh Novaes’ (2020) account. She argues that proofs are usefully conceived as dialogues between a prover and a skeptic. Her “Prover–Skeptic model” conceptualizes deductive arguments as semi-adversarial interactions where the need for necessary truth-preservation emerges from the need to convince a skeptical opponent, while the requirement for steps to be clear reflects the cooperative goal of producing explanatory persuasion. From this perspective, the features that are often attributed to rigorous proofs arise from the fact that the authors of such proofs have internalized the demands of this critical Skeptic.

The contextual and social dimensions of rigor are also emphasized by Ashton (2021). She notes that judgments of rigor vary across subfields, historical periods, and even pedagogical aims – something that has been observed also by scholars working in mathematical education (Inglis et al. 2013). In her view, rigor is not an invariant relation to formal derivability, but a context-sensitive standard negotiated within specific mathematical practices. In a similar spirit, Aberdein and Ashton (2024) analyze proof as a form of argumentation, emphasizing that proofs aim not merely to track formal validity but also to persuade, explain, and withstand critical scrutiny in social settings.

While the debate on the relationship between formal and informal proofs may seem to be divided into two opposing camps (and it is often framed in this way in the literature), Feferman argues that most of the proposed views are compatible. According to him, the Standard View, or formalizability thesis

is an in principle thesis that has nothing to do with conviction, understanding, or feasibility and it seems […] to be perfectly consistent with the view of the central and methodological virtues of proofs emphasized by the critics. (2012, 385)

In a similar vein, Burgess and De Toffoli (2022) argue that the debate should not be seen as a clash between “formalist” and “anti-formalist” camps but as a mapping of positions across several dimensions: how closely informal proofs must track formal derivations; whether the relevant relation is actual or merely potential; and whether formalization is routine or requires creativity and background knowledge.

Tanswell (2024) also emphasizes the compatibility of different stances by reframing the debate around aims and models of rigor. He argues for rigor pluralism: different models of informal proof illuminate different features and functions of rigor, and no single model is suitable for all contexts. He distinguishes between four models: (i) rigor as formality (the Standard View), (ii) proofs as arguments and dialogues, (iii) the recipe model (proofs as guides to actions/activities), and (iv) rigor as an intellectual virtue – here rigor, like curiosity or intellectual humility, is viewed as a trait of mathematicians rather than an absolute property of proofs. He then evaluates each against multiple aims – including tracking correctness, preserving content, enabling agreement, and accommodating techniques such as diagram use. In this proposal, Hamami’s routine-translation account, inspired by Mac Lane and Bourbaki, excels at correctness (and, to some extent, agreement), but it faces challenges under techniques and content, especially when mathematical reasoning proceeds via diagrammatic or highly field-specific inferential transitions.

A related issue concerns the epistemic value of “absolute rigor.” Paseau (2016) has argued that the pursuit of complete inferential rigor – “atomizing” proofs into the smallest logical steps – fails to deliver the epistemic benefits it promises. Such atomization does not preserve credences, resolve disagreements, or illuminate why an argument succeeds. The value of rigor, he suggests, is not exhausted by decomposability into atomic inferential moves, raising doubts about whether complete formalization is even a defensible epistemic ideal.

More generally, proponents and opponents of the Standard View often acknowledge that informal proofs bring about specific epistemic values, not reducible to values of formal arguments (Avigad 2021; Weatherall and Wolfson forthcoming). This issue is pressing today, as formal proofs are more readily available than ever, thanks to new technologies. Interactive Theorem Provers and AI models are already changing mathematical practice and could also contribute to a re-definition of the problem of rigor.

3.4 Mathematical Diagrams and Visualization

Although traditional philosophy of mathematics tends to dismiss diagrams as mere heuristic tools or potential sources of error, philosophers of mathematical practice emphasize the importance of studying them and other notational devices to gain a better understanding of actual mathematics.

By now, there is a substantial body of work on the topic. Crucially, this work is not limited to the analysis of diagrams in geometry but encompasses different fields from different historical periods and cultures. The philosophical discussions often arise from the analysis of detailed case studies, and the approach is thus bottom-up, in line with the methodology of the philosophy of mathematical practice. The diverse works in this area aim to clarify the precise nature of diagrams, their efficacy, and their justificatory role across diverse mathematical domains and across different mathematical activities.

One overall result that these studies obtained is to establish that mathematical reasoning is intimately linked to the choice of the representations used and that diagrams often fulfill specific epistemic and cognitive functions and thus cannot be trivially replaced by purely linguistic expressions. Studies on diagrams are thus tightly related to works on mathematical notations in general (Grosholz 2007; Krämer 2003; Macbeth 2014; Muntersbjorn 2003; Schlimm 2025).

A central effort in the literature is to establish that diagrams can be highly structured and systematic, particularly in historical contexts that are often criticized for relying on intuition and lacking rigor. In this respect, the work of Manders (2008) on Euclidean diagrams has been path-breaking.

Manders’ analysis of Euclidean geometry provides a foundational framework for understanding how diagrammatic reasoning can be rigorous. He argues that Euclid’s practice relies on an interplay between the textual component (dealing with “exact” properties, such as metric relations) and the diagrammatic component (dealing with “co-exact” properties, such as incidence, connectivity, and ordering relations, which are stable under small perturbations of the diagram). The ability to distinguish between these features controls the inferential use of the diagram.

Drawing on Manders’ work, Larvor (2019) proposes three conditions for diagrammatic proof practices to be rigorous, suggesting these generalize beyond Euclid: (i) they are easy to draw (require no special skill), (ii) the displayed information is not metrical (or non-metrical), and (iii) the inferences can be put into systematic mathematical relation with other inferential practices.

Giaquinto (2011) further develops Manders’ ideas and emphasizes the importance of considering the mathematical context in which diagrammatic inferences are drawn. According to him, while it is legitimate to infer that two lines intersect by inspecting a diagram in Euclidean geometry, this is not so in analysis, precisely because of the different nature of geometric and analytical concepts.

Manders’ analysis also provided the conceptual background for the development of formal diagrammatic systems for Euclidean geometry (Avigad, Dean, and Mumma 2009). Mumma’s (2010, 2019) formal proof system Eu is designed to be faithful to Euclid’s original argumentation structure and shows that diagrams can be integrated into formal systems. Formal diagrammatic systems have also been developed in logic (Shin 2002, 1994) and basic number theory (Jamnik 2001).

An alternative interpretation of Euclidean diagrams is provided by Panza (2012), who identifies a twofold role for diagrams in Euclid’s plane geometry: a global role (providing identity conditions for abstract geometric objects) and a local role (allowing objects to inherit properties and relations from their concrete diagrammatic representations). This view sees the objects of Euclidean geometry as quasi-concrete, determined by their relation to concrete diagrams.

For other accounts of Euclidean diagrams, see Azzouni 2004b; Catton and Montelle 2012; Macbeth 2010; Larvor 2019.

Scholars have not confined themselves to the study of Euclidean diagrams. They have also considered diagrams in logic (Allwein and Barwise 1996) and contemporary mathematics (Carter 2010, 2018, 2019a; De Toffoli 2017, 2023, forthcoming; De Toffoli and Giardino 2014, 2015; Halimi 2012; Starikova 2012). Moreover, different mathematical cultures have been considered. For example, Netz (1999) studies how diagrams and text interact in Greek mathematics and how the labeling of diagrams might reflect certain cognitive constraints; and Chemla (2018) analyzes diagrams in ancient Chinese mathematics. Chemla demonstrates that interpreting such diagrams often requires a dynamic reading involving navigation between the discursive text and the diagram, and that the diagram itself can formulate a proof of an algorithm’s correctness.

A systematic work on the epistemology of diagrams, in dialogue with research in cognitive science, is Giaquinto 2007. For reviews of the literature, see Giaquinto 2020 and Giardino 2024.

To properly analyze diagrams, researchers have sought to define them precisely and distinguish them from other types of representations.

Stenning (2002), focusing on diagrams in logic, argues that the fundamental distinction between diagrammatic and sentential systems lies in their semantic modality, specifically the difference between direct (diagrammatic) and indirect (sentential) interpretation. Indirect systems interpose an abstract syntax defined on a concatenation relation; directly interpreted systems interpret spatial relations between symbols directly and uniformly. (See also Giardino and Greenberg 2015; Greenberg 2023).

Another characterization of diagrams is proposed by De Toffoli (2023, forthcoming). She considers mathematical diagrams to be elements of notational systems that are either geometric-topological representations (GT) or two-dimensional representations (or both). Crucially, diagrams are distinguished from illustrations by their systematicity – they are representations where both the information carried and the rules for correct use can be (at least potentially) spelled out precisely. See also Carter 2024b, Ch. 3.

Beyond efforts towards a definition of diagrams, scholars have been investigating why they are at times so efficacious aids for reasoning in mathematics. The efficacy of diagrams is often traced to specific cognitive benefits they offer, both in geometry and topology and in non-geometric fields like abstract algebra and category theory.

Carter (2019a) explores whether mathematical diagrams are uniquely fruitful compared to other representations. She introduces the notion of a “faithful representation,” which iconically represents relations, and allows for manipulations that track relations between the represented entities. While she concludes that fruitfulness is not exclusive to diagrams, she highlights two of diagrams’ unique features: the ability to show a relation rather than merely stating it, and two-dimensionality, which allows a single diagram to represent connections to multiple objects efficiently. Carter (2021, 2024b) also develops Shimojima’s (1999) idea that diagrams support “free rides” – that is, thanks to their spatial configuration, they can exhibit properties (such as inclusions) that are not explicit in their linguistic counterpart.

De Toffoli and Giardino (2014, 2015, 2016) show that proofs in topology often rely on envisioning transformations on diagrammatic representations (such as knot diagrams and arrow diagrams for surfaces). This imaginative activity involves performing “epistemic actions” on the representations. In their view, knot diagrams (as well as other types of topological diagrams) are an effective notation because they are dynamic and support specific manipulations.

Shin’s (2002, 2015) work on Peirce’s Existential Graphs highlights that their two-dimensional structure allows for multiple readability – the possibility to carve up and translate the same diagram into several logically equivalent sentences without needing inferential steps. This multiplicity makes the equivalence of different sentences manifest, eliminating the need for complex, unique parsing rules required in linear sentential systems. For a discussion on multiple readability and push back on the idea that it is a property arising only within diagrammatic notations, see Bellucci and Pietarinen 2016.

Whereas some scholars have been stressing the importance of diagrams in different phases of the mathematical activity (Carter 2024b; Giaquinto 2007), others focus on proof and support the stronger but more circumscribed claim that diagrams can be essential for certain proofs (Corfield 2003; De Toffoli 2023, forthcoming).

Studies on diagrams across history (e.g., Euclidean geometry, ancient China) and contemporary mathematics (e.g., geometry, topology, algebra, category theory) converge in sketching a picture of mathematical practice where diagrams play an important role. Diagrams cannot be neglected by a philosophy of mathematics sensitive to actual mathematical practice. Moreover, these studies challenge the derivation-centric view of proof. However, as we discussed above, the use of diagrams in proofs is not incompatible with the Standard View of mathematical rigor, which is an in-principle thesis. Still, it is incompatible with reducing informal proofs to formal derivations.

We have limited ourselves to the discussion of four epistemic virtues: purity, explanation, rigor, and visualizability. But there are several more that have been discussed in the literature, and they interact in interesting ways with these four. A partial list and some major references will have to suffice here: simplicity (Kossak and Ording 2017; Arana and Stafford 2023), beauty (Cellucci 2015; Dutilh Novaes 2019; Giaquinto 2016; Inglis and Aberdein 2015; Lange 2016; Sa et al. 2024; Starikova 2018), epistemic economy (Panza 2016, 2026), depth (see the Special Issue of Philosophia Mathematica (Ernst et al. 2015 – in particular Gray 2015 and Lange 2015), and D’Alessandro 2021), naturalness and fruitfulness as pertains to definitions and concepts (Heuer, Pérez-Escobar and Sarikaya 2025; Morris 2024; Tappenden 2005); transferability, fitness, and motivation as a property of proofs (Easwaran 2009; Morris 2024; Raman-Sundström 2016; Raman-Sundström and Öhman 2018). Other topics narrowly connected to epistemic virtues are mathematical understanding (Avigad 2008, 2010, 2022; D’Alessandro 2023; Folina 2018; Frans 2021; Macbeth 2012; Manders 2012; Hamami and Morris 2024; Tappenden 2005) and mathematical style (see the entry on mathematical style).

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Acknowledgments

We wish to thank Dirk Schlimm for contributing to how we characterized different approaches within PMP in terms of areas, subjects, and methodology, as well as to an initial draft of the first two sections of this entry. In addition we would like to thank Jessica Carter and Marco Panza for written comments on the first draft of this entry. One of the authors was partially supported by the grant: FIS-2023-04053 – HUMATH – Humanizing Mathematical Knowledge: Fallibility, Technology, Know How (PI: De Toffoli) – CUP I53C24003170001.

Copyright © 2026 by
Silvia De Toffoli <silvia.detoffoli@iusspavia.it>
Paolo Mancosu <mancosu@socrates.Berkeley.EDU>

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