1. Hereafter, references to The Montessori Series (24 volumes, Montessori-Pierson Publishing, published starting in 2007), will simply refer to the volume and page number in that series. If necessary to avoid confusion, the abbreviation, MS, might prefix this.

2. The term “normal” here distinguishes this pedagogy from the medicalized approach to children she had engaged in as co-director of the orthophrenic school.

3. An earlier text, La antropologia pedagogica (Montessori 1903) was based on a lecture given to philosophy students and shows her early interest in bridging this gap. Many thanks to Emma Perrone for this reference and other important details about Montessori’s early life.

4. Regarding Hegel, who’s notion of Spirit as a historical force likely influenced Montessori either directly or through her professor Labriola, see Gimbel and Emerson 2009 (e.g., p. 42). Regarding Schopenhauer, who’s idea of the “will to live” and notion that the “assimilation” of “lower grades of objectification” gives rise to “a higher Idea which prevails over…the less developed” (Schopenhauer 1818 [1891: 188–90]), see discussion of Schopenhauer in Moretti 2021: 50, 240–1). Regarding Nietzsche, with whose notion of the Übermensch she resonated but who’s egoism she rejected, see, e.g., Simons 1988, and for the shared influence of Nietzsche on Montessori and Ellen Key, see Pironi 2010: 5, 9–11.

5. In the same collection, Montessori offers extensive reflections about the philosophy of technology, the dangers that human beings face as a result of having mastered new energies and developed new technologies, pointing out—in ways that anticipate contemporary discussions of the Anthropocene—that our technological development has brought about a new “geological epoch” and warning of the possibility of a “universal cataclysm” and the danger that if human beings use those “energies… for the purposes of destroying themselves, they will soon attain that goal” (10:20). At the same time, Montessori is not a pessimist about technological progress; consistent with her broader, quasi-Nietzschean emphasis on increasing perfection, she sees this new epoch as one in which, potentially, “new, higher, more perfect forms of life” can appear (10:20).