The Evolution of Altruism

The very idea that biological altruism can come about through natural selection may initially seem puzzling. One way of characterizing natural selection, after all, is in terms of “selfish genes”: natural selection occurs when a variant of a gene (an allele) at a given locus tends to cause a modification of a bodily or behavioral trait (a phenotypic trait) in a way that, in the overall environment, tends to cause that variant of the gene to increase its relative frequency in the next generation; this then increases the representation of the associated trait modification as well. Typically this happens when the phenotypic modification is one that causes the organism to have greater reproductive success: if, in the overall context, allele A causes its carrier to have a trait T that causes the organism to have more offspring than other organisms in the population who carry rival allele A* and display alternative trait T*, then A will be inherited and carried by more organisms in succeeding generations; and that means that T will likewise be displayed by more organisms (Dawkins, 1989). But how do we get from “selfish genes” increasing their representation in the gene pool, via improving the reproductive success of their carriers, to such things as cooperation and biological altruism? It turns out there are many ways.

To take one interesting example, consider social insect colonies, and in particular, the Hymenoptera (bees, ants and wasps). In these colonies we find such an extreme degree of cooperation—division of labor (queen, workers, soldiers, etc.), food-sharing, information sharing—that it is tempting to view the entire colony as a single functioning organism. Indeed, in the case of stinging worker honey bees, there is not only cooperative labor but also, when necessary, the ultimate sacrifice in defense of the hive (at least where the invader is a mammal, stinging of which proves fatal to the bee as the barbed sting is torn out upon being deposited in the victim). How can such striking cooperation and self-sacrifice be explained in evolutionary terms?

One important fact to notice is that the colony is one large family: typically, the workers are sisters—daughters of the queen. Return to the idea of “selfish genes” described above: what ultimately increases an allele’s representation in the gene pool is its having some phenotypic effect that causes copies of that allele to be in more organisms in succeeding generations. That normally happens when the phenotypic effect causes the organism to have greater reproductive success, but it can equally happen if it causes the organism’s close kin to have greater reproductive success: for close kin are likely to carry copies of that same allele, which means that greater reproductive success for kin likewise propagates copies of the allele. So while an allele that causes an organism to engage in sex more often may thereby spread, so might an allele that causes an organism to help a sibling to reproduce (as by aiding survival); either way, that allele will be helping to propagate copies of itself in the next generation, which in turn means that the helping behavior it causes will likewise spread over time (Dawkins 1989, 171–77).

This mechanism of “kin selection” can explain how worker bees evolved such apparently ‘selfless’ traits, focused on aiding the queen’s survival and reproduction. In fact, the situation is even more interesting and extreme: workers have evolved to serve the queen’s reproduction at the complete expense of their own, as they are sterile. This extreme biological altruism, however, may be explained by the same principles, with the addition of the fact that due to a genetic peculiarity of the Hymenoptera (their haplodiploidy), sisters are more closely related to each other genetically than they would be to their own offspring.^[12] This means that natural selection will actually favor worker traits that help their mother reproduce (thus making more sisters, who are especially likely to carry copies of the gene for that same trait, making it spread), over traits in workers aimed at personal reproduction. This could explain how worker sterility evolved, as traits focused on helping the queen took precedence over personal reproduction, and it explains how even suicidal behavior could have been selected for as propagating the genes that cause it (Dawkins 1989, 174–75). (It is worth noting, however, that the theory of kin selection and inclusive fitness is highly complex and has received renewed critical scrutiny in recent years. For a recent special collection of articles on the topic see Royal Society Open Science on Inclusive Fitness).

This is only one example of one way in which biological altruism can evolve: there are others, which are not restricted to kin and are explained using game-theoretic or group dynamic models (again, see the entry on biological altruism for details). The crucial point is just that any kind of genetically-based trait can evolve if it happens to have the right kind of feedback effect on the genes that influence it. This brings us, then, to the sort of trait we are more interested in: a disposition for psychological altruism, as defined above.

Again, while it may initially seem puzzling that evolution should give rise to psychological altruism, rather than merely to selfishness, there is nothing paradoxical about it: a genetically-based disposition for psychological altruism will evolve just in case such a trait, in the relevant circumstances, promotes the propagation of the genes that bring it about (and does so more effectively than alternative traits produced by rival alleles). And this can again happen in various ways.

The basic idea is that psychological altruistic dispositions can evolve as proximate mechanisms or “modules” for promoting the biological advantages relevant to the forms of selection listed above. In some cases, these adaptive psychological mechanisms will involve specifically targeted or conditional altruistic motivations, involving capacities for discrimination to focus benefits on kin or on reciprocators. In other cases, the selection pressures will give rise to less discriminating altruistic sentiments and tendencies as the simplest and most cost-effective mechanisms for promoting adaptive cooperative behaviors in a given environment. If our hominin ancestors tended to live in circumstances where the opportunities for ‘wasting’ altruism in non-fitness-enhancing ways (e.g., on ‘outsiders’) were sufficiently few and far between, then a simple, undiscriminating (though limited) sense of concern and altruism may have promoted fitness at far less cost than more discriminating forms, evolving more readily. One advantage of this hypothesis is that it might help explain some sorts of concern and altruism that are otherwise hard to make sense of in evolutionary terms.

For example, suppose you receive a letter from UNICEF soliciting contributions for health and nutrition programs for children in Darfur, and you are moved to send a check. This is not merely selective altruism toward kin or likely reciprocators, but altruism toward strangers who are in no position to reciprocate, and it might therefore seem puzzling from a purely biological point of view: such ‘indiscriminate altruism’ isn’t biologically adaptive in the way more selective altruism might be; your helping children in Darfur isn’t helping to propagate your own genes, so it may seem mysterious how such a trait could have evolved through natural selection. But a trait that is not presently adaptive may once have been. In the environment in which our hominin ancestors lived, where there was little positive contact with outsiders, even relatively indiscriminate altruism would tend to benefit kin or potential reciprocators, and so might have been a simple adaptive mechanism on the whole.

If so, then your presently non-adaptive altruistic behavior in our current global environment could in principle be an expression of an evolved, indiscriminate altruistic tendency—an adaptation that is largely no longer adaptive, and so would amount to a kind of ‘misfiring’ of formerly adaptive instincts (Dawkins 2006, 220–21; Kitcher 2006b). It would be in this way on a par with our taste for fatty foods—originally evolved for its adaptive effects though it is no longer beneficial in today’s fast food economy—though in the case of altruism the ‘misfiring’ has happier results. Of course, it’s also possible (as discussed in section 2.4) that your altruistic tendency isn’t itself an adaptation at all, but is instead rooted in values that you’ve developed, through moral reflection in your cultural context, independently of specific evolutionary influences. Or it may be some combination of the two.

This area of inquiry remains largely speculative, since it is one thing to develop models for how psychological altruism could in principle evolve, and quite another to show convincingly that a given form of natural selection has in fact played the relevant role in actual human evolutionary history. There may be doubts, for example, about whether there was sufficient pair-wise engagement in iterated prisoner’s dilemma games to explain the evolution of reciprocal altruism according to some of the most familiar game-theoretic models (Kitcher 2006a,b). For the purposes of the main topic of this entry, we can set aside those complications, granting that there is some such evolutionary explanation for how we came to have capacities and dispositions associated with psychological altruism, and return to the larger question of explaining our capacity for robust moral agency.