Nietzsche’s Aesthetics

Nietzsche’s first book was entitled The Birth of Tragedy out of the Spirit of Music (1872), and one of his very last works was called The Case of Wagner: A Musician’s Problem (1888). As this simple fact indicates, reflection on art (and especially, on music and drama) is an abiding and central feature of Nietzsche’s thought. Indeed, very nearly all of his works address aesthetic questions at least in passing. Some of these questions are familiar from the philosophical tradition: e.g., how should we explain the effect tragedy has on us? What is the relation of aesthetic value to other kinds of value? Is aesthetic appreciation disinterested and autonomous? What is the appropriate way to respond to Plato’s notorious condemnation of “imitative” art? Other questions are less familiar (though, also not entirely without precedent): e.g., what do artistic products say about the “health” or “sickness” of the culture or person who produces or values them? Can one make a work of art out of oneself and one’s life? Still other questions, which garner a good deal of attention from aestheticians today, do not interest Nietzsche much or at all: e.g., are estimations of aesthetic value objective or merely subjective? What distinguishes works of art from objects that aren’t works of art? Is reliance on testimony acceptable in judging the aesthetic merit of a work? On these and similar questions, Nietzsche has little to say.

This entry will be concerned with Nietzsche’s contributions to aesthetics, construed somewhat narrowly as the philosophical discipline dealing with questions about art and aesthetic value. It will largely bracket Nietzsche’s views on the application of aesthetic concepts and norms to life as they surface, e.g., in his account of self-styling or self-creation. While this topic is of immense importance, it has been dealt with in considerable detail elsewhere (see the entry on Friedrich Nietzsche, §4). The entry is generally organized thematically, rather than chronologically. But, it will begin with two sections focusing on Nietzsche’s first book, The Birth of Tragedy, since this work is both his most sustained and systematic treatment of aesthetic questions, and because it sets the stage for the rest of his aesthetic thought. Subsequent sections will deal with some of the themes that surface first in The Birth of Tragedy but continue to be of central importance throughout Nietzsche’s philosophical career.

• 1. Early Influences on Nietzsche’s Aesthetics
  • 1.1 Arthur Schopenhauer
  • 1.2 Richard Wagner and German Romanticism
  • 1.3 Friedrich Schiller and German Classicism
• 2. The Birth of Tragedy
  • 2.1 The Problem of The Birth of Tragedy
  • 2.2 The Metaphysics of The Birth of Tragedy
  • 2.3 Pessimism, Optimism, and the Aesthetic Justification of Existence
• 3. Art and Illusion
• 4. Beauty, Disinterestedness, and Creativity
• 5. Aesthetics and Physiology
• 6. Nietzsche’s Later Theory of Tragedy
• Bibliography
  • Editions of Nietzsche’s Texts
  • Abbreviations of Nietzsche’s Works
  • Other Primary Literature
  • Secondary Literature
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Early Influences on Nietzsche’s Aesthetics

The Birth of Tragedy was first published in 1872, when Nietzsche was a professor of classical philology at the University of Basel. At the time, it was a work of striking originality in both philosophical aesthetics and classical scholarship (although it was not enthusiastically received in either field). Original though it may be in many regards, The Birth was also written under a wide array of influences. Any discussion of Nietzsche’s debut work, and by extension any consideration of his aesthetic thought as a whole, must begin with at least a brief discussion of these influences. What follows is a cursory treatment of three of the most important: Arthur Schopenhauer (1788–1860), Richard Wagner (1813–1883), and Friedrich Schiller (1759–1805). This examination will provide important context for understanding Nietzsche’s programme in aesthetics.

1.1 Arthur Schopenhauer

The best-known philosophical influence on the early Nietzsche is Arthur Schopenhauer, whom Nietzsche first read in 1865. Schopenhauer’s metaphysics, ethics, and aesthetics all had a profound effect on the young philologist. This metaphysics sets out from an acceptance of Kant’s distinction between appearances (or the ‘World as Representation,’ as Schopenhauer styles it) and things-in-themselves. Unlike Kant, however, Schopenhauer offers a positive account of the nature of noumenal reality. The account holds that the inner essence of the world is a single, timeless, quasi-volitional “striving,” or “Will.” Schopenhauer’s basic metaphysical position thus consists of two main theses:

Transcendental Idealism: Space and time are subjective properties of the mind, and not properties of the world as it is in-itself.

Will-Monism: Reality in-itself is a single being that is characterized essentially by quasi-dynamic or conative properties (termed ‘Will’).

Will-Monism, together with a broadly Epicurean theory maintaining that willing is a source of ceaseless suffering, underwrites a key descriptive claim of Schopenhauer’s philosophy: human life necessarily involves more suffering than pleasure or happiness. From this descriptive claim, Schopenhauer infers his major normative thesis, the doctrine of philosophical pessimism: life is not worth living, or, the world’s non-existence would be preferable to its existence (for an excellent in-depth treatment of Schopenhauer’s arguments for pessimism, see Simmons 2024). Inspired by (certain versions of) Christianity and Buddhism, Schopenhauer holds the appropriate response to this pessimistic truth to be “denial of the will to life,” understood as the ascetic repudiation of desire. Schopenhauer’s aesthetics is best understood against the backdrop of this pessimistic ethics and its attendant metaphysics.

For our purposes, the most important claim of Schopenhauer’s aesthetics is that the pleasure we take in art (and beauty more generally) is a disinterested one. When confronted with a beautiful object, Schopenhauer thinks, our consciousness becomes possessed, so to speak, by its purely objective properties, focusing simply on what the object itself is (or the “Platonic idea” it expresses) rather than on its relations to other objects. This means, amongst other things, that aesthetic appreciation ignores the relations the object has to our will, i.e. how it conduces to or impedes the satisfaction of our subjective interests. Schopenhauer puts a peculiar twist on this relatively common modern conception of aesthetic appreciation by conceiving of such enjoyment as a silencing of the will. Since willing, for Schopenhauer, is a—indeed the—source of suffering, aesthetic pleasure constitutes a relief from the burden of our existence. Aesthetic experience, then, resembles and, so to speak, presages salvation from the world and its ills, which is to be attained through asceticism (see, e.g., Shapshay 2024). Though such will-lessness is a feature of all aesthetic appreciation, the negation of the will is overtly thematized in tragedy, and Schopenhauer accordingly reserves particularly high praise for this artform. Tragedy makes “palpable the futility of human striving and the nothingness of this whole existence in a great and striking example, thus revealing the deepest meaning of life; this is why tragedy is acknowledged to be the most sublime form of literature” (SW 3:730–31/WWR 2:651). It is Schopenhauer’s own pessimistic philosophy, then, which constitutes the ultimate content of the tragic genre.

The early Nietzsche took much from Schopenhauer. The Birth of Tragedy appears to operate under the assumption that Schopenhauer’s descriptive claim about suffering is true. Nietzsche also officially endorses Schopenhauer’s basic picture of aesthetic enjoyment as essentially will-less (see, e.g., BT 5). Schopenhauer’s metaphysical distinction between representation and will is also evidently taken on board, as is his theory of music, according to which music, unlike the other arts, is a direct “copy” the noumenal will. Matters may not be quite this straightforward, however. Some scholars have noted divergences between The Birth’s and Schopenhauer’s respective theories of music (Janaway 1998; Vandenabeele 2003). And the question of whether The Birth accepts Schopenhauer’s metaphysics has been a subject of considerable dispute in recent years (see §2.2 below). Whatever should be said about The Birth, Nietzsche’s later aesthetics is clearly set up in opposition to Schopenhauer’s. In works such as Beyond Good and Evil (1886), On the Genealogy of Morals (1887), and Twilight of the Idols (1888), Nietzsche rejects Schopenhauer’s conception of disinterested aesthetic appreciation, as well as his more general attempt to connect aesthetic experience to the ethics of pessimism. Schopenhauer remains an important foil against which Nietzsche formulates his own aesthetic position and, precisely for this reason, his influence is never entirely absent.

1.2 Richard Wagner and German Romanticism

While Schopenhauer’s influence on the early Nietzsche was crucial, it would be misleading to suggest that it was entirely overriding. Of perhaps equal importance was the influence of the composer and librettist Richard Wagner (1813–1883). Nietzsche knew and was on friendly, even intimate, terms with Wagner during the planning and construction of the Festspielhaus in Bayreuth. During this period (roughly 1869–1876), Nietzsche was profoundly impressed not only with Wagner’s artistic achievements and plans, but also with Wagner’s attempts to develop a theoretical framework for his artistic project. By the time the two had become acquainted, Wagner was himself a convert to Schopenhauer’s philosophy, and was especially taken with Schopenhauer’s theory of music (Wagner would expound a somewhat idiosyncratic version of this theory in Beethoven [1870]). Yet, Wagner’s aesthetic thought—contained in a voluminous corpus of difficult theoretical writings produced over the course of four decades—was quite protean, and owes at least as much to the older tradition of German Romanticism as it does to Schopenhauer. Two elements of Wagner’s philosophy are worth emphasizing here: his conception of the “total work of art”, and his vision of a “new mythology.”

With ancient Greek drama as his model, Wagner advocated, and hoped himself to (re)create, “total,” “complete,” or “collected” works of art (Gesamtkunstwerke). Greek drama, and Wagner’s own Musikdrama, are supposed to be “collected” in the sense that they constitute a synthesis of distinct artforms—music, poetry, mime, dance, etc. (see 1850, 186–87). Yet they are also “collected” in another, more social sense: Greek dramas were, and Wagner’s own Musikdramen would be, religious festivals where the whole community could gather and share in a common experience of profound significance. Though present in the earlier Romantic tradition, the idea that aesthetic experience should not be coolly critical, but instead something almost sacramental, is an especially pronounced and consistent theme in Wagner’s prose writings. This thought had a decisive influence on the early Nietzsche. One of his main aims in The Birth of Tragedy is to take seriously the fact that Greek tragedies were performed as part of religious festivals, and thus to show that the modern tendency to view them as “mere” literature is badly misguided.

The need for an artform that can perform this sort of sacramental role arises from what Wagner, sounding a common refrain of post-Kantian thought, takes to be a chief malady of modernity. Modern culture has become increasingly specialized, solipsistic, and crudely materialistic. As a result, we find ourselves profoundly alienated—from one another, from nature, even from ourselves. Adding to the insult, art itself has become commodified and serves the purpose of mere pleasant diversion, rather than answering to a “true need” (1850, 12). One such need is the need for “unity,” or, as Novalis famously put it, “the drive to be at home everywhere” (Werke, 491). Wagner believed that art could answer this need by serving as a vessel for a new mythology. By the time he was writing, this was an established theme in Romantic thought—one which was given special prominence by the Schlegel brothers, Schelling, and others. The idea was roughly that mythologies provide a synoptic worldview which, unlike that of philosophy or the natural sciences, speaks directly to the senses and the imagination. Because it does not require any specialist knowledge to be understood, mythology is uniquely capable of speaking to a community as a whole. As Wagner expresses it, “the work of art is the living presentation of religion––but religions are not invented by the artist, they emerge only from the folk (Volk)” (1850, 36).

The Birth of Tragedy’s debt to this Wagnerian vision is unmistakable. But Nietzsche would soon become disillusioned, and by the time of his last writings his attitude toward Wagner is overwhelmingly, even irrationally hostile. Whether this means Nietzsche jettisoned his early Wagnerian ideals, or whether he only felt Wagner, the man and the artist, failed to live up to them, is difficult to say (see Gemes 2022, 33). What is certain is that Wagner and his art would remain central concerns of Nietzsche’s for the duration of his career—so much so that he would devote two full books to criticizing Wagner in 1888 (The Case of Wagner and Nietzsche contra Wagner).

The influence of German Romanticism on the early Nietzsche came from other quarters too. Of particular importance is A.W. Schlegel, whose Lectures on Dramatic Art and Literature (Schlegel VKL) Nietzsche read carefully prior to writing The Birth of Tragedy (see NF 1869: 1[85]–1[105]). Schlegel’s conception of the tragic chorus and his interpretation of Greek mythology influenced Nietzsche’s presentation in The Birth, and many of Nietzsche’s notorious broadsides against Euripides are prefigured in the Lectures (though both are likely drawing on an older critical tradition as well). Also of importance was the poet Friedrich Hölderlin (1770–1843), a favorite of Nietzsche’s as a schoolboy and one possible source for his famous distinction between the Apollonian and the Dionysian (Young 2013, 96–98). Studies of Nietzsche’s intellectual and personal connections to Wagner include Köhler 1998; Young 2010, 105–34, 2014, 131–40; and Scruton 2014. For recent treatments of Nietzsche and the wider romantic tradition, see Williamson 2004, 234–84, Ameriks 2012, and Gemes 2023.

1.3 Friedrich Schiller and German Classicism

A third critical influence on Nietzsche’s early aesthetics was the German poet, dramatist, historian, and philosopher Friedrich Schiller. That Nietzsche felt an affinity with Schiller at this period of his career is hardly surprising—Schiller was generally recognized as a “German Shakespeare”, a consummate master of the artform that most interested the young philology profressor; Schiller’s theoretical works were amongst the most important sources of inspiration for the younger Romantic generation that had in turn inspired Wagner’s thought; and Schopenhauer and German pessimists also often enlisted Schiller as a key predecessor (Beiser 2018). Above all, the period of artistic collaboration between Schiller and Goethe, the extraordinary era of Weimar Classicism, seemed to hint at the true creative potential of the “German spirit”—potential which Nietzsche thought was being squandered on staid academic specialism and crude, militaristic nationalism.

Like his successors in the Romantic tradition, Schiller thought that the ancient world was characterized by a now-lost sense of unity and harmony. This issue is thematized in his influential treatises On the Aesthetic Education of Man in a Series of Letters (1795) and On Naïve and Sentimental Poetry (1795/6). In the latter, Schiller distinguishes between two novel types of aesthetic response to nature and art, the titular naïve and sentimental. Cultures like Homeric and Classical Greece typically produce works of naïve art. Such art expresses their easy oneness with themselves and nature, a state in which the human being “operates as an undivided sensuous unity, as a harmonizing whole” (NA 20:436). Sentimental art, by contrast, expresses our longing for this bygone time when “we were happy and perfect” (NA 20:427). In other words, it presents such harmony, not as a fact, but as an ideal, and is thus the art proper to the modern world, in which the two sides of our nature—reason and feeling—have been divided and set against one another. The distinction between naïve and sentimental seems not only to have been the inspiration for the slightly later distinction between Classical and Romantic art (see Eckermann 1837 [1981, 379–80]), but possibly also for Nietzsche’s Apollonian-Dionysian duality (Kalar 2008; cf. BT 2–3; NF 1870: 7[126]). Crucially, however, Nietzsche does not see the ancient world as purely “naïve.” The Greeks’ naïveté was not a natural endowment, but an achievement—a coping mechanism developed in response to a world of unspeakable cruelty (see e.g. letter to Rohde 16 July, 1872 [SB 1872: 239]). Moreover, Nietzsche finds a degree of sentimentality already characteristic of the Greek outlook, in particular of the Dionysian mysteries (BT 2/KSA 1:33).

Thus, while Nietzsche never accepted Schiller’s conception of the Greeks wholesale, that conception significantly influenced his interpretation of the “Apollonian” element of Greek culture. This influence is evident in other ways as well. In the Aesthetic Letters, Schiller develops an influential notion of “beautiful semblance” (schöner Schein) (see esp. NA 20:398–405). Such semblances are distinctive types of illusions produced by works of fine art: they are paradigmatically non-deceptive and enjoyed for their own sake. The phrase ‘beautiful semblance’ plays on the double meaning of the German word Schein, which can signify both “semblance,” “illusion,” “appearance,” as well as “gleam,” “brilliance,” “radiance.” Schiller’s point is that aesthetic appreciation involves taking joy in the mere look of things without being concerned with what they are, though also without confusing appearance and reality. We recognize, for example, that the appearance of three-dimensionality on the flat surface of the canvas is a mere illusion, and this is part of what we enjoy. Nietzsche would make this sense of beautiful semblance central to his account of both Apollonian art and culture in The Birth of Tragedy (Stoll 2019).

Between 1792 and 1803, Schiller also wrote extensively about tragedy. His essay “On the Use of the Chorus in Tragedy,” prefigures a central claim of The Birth—that the tragic chorus is essential to the proper experience of tragedy. The chorus, he argues, allows the spectators of a tragedy to adopt a “distanced” perspective on the drama and to view it as an idealized product of the poet’s imagination rather than a crude imitation of reality (see Stoll 2022 for further discussion of this view). In both his lectures on Sophocles and in The Birth of Tragedy itself, Nietzsche explicitly endorses Schiller’s account of the chorus (KGA II.3, 25–27; BT 7/KSA 1:54–55). Nor could he ignore Schiller’s remark in a letter to Goethe that “I have always had a certain faith in the opera—that tragedy would develop out of it into a nobler form, just as it did from the choruses of the ancient Bacchic festivals” (NA 29:179; cf. NF 1871: 9[83]). Of Schiller’s account of tragic pleasure, however, he is more critical. In essays such as “On the Ground of the Enjoyment in Tragic Objects” and “On the Sublime,” Schiller argues that the pleasure we take in tragedy is a form of the sublime. Tragic heroes, he suggests, paradigmatically sacrifice their well-being or even their lives for the sake of some higher principle (the Antigone of Sophocles’ eponymous play is a good example). And this somehow makes the audience aware of a similar power in themselves, which Schiller takes to be the Kantian faculty of transcendental freedom. It is this awareness that constitutes our pleasure in tragedy. Schiller’s strategy is thus to apply to tragedy Kant’s notion of the “dynamically sublime,” according to which a “counter-purposive” object can give us a feeling of ennoblement by stimulating awareness of the power of our moral faculties. In The Birth, Nietzsche does suggest that tragic pleasure is a species of the sublime (BT 7/KSA 1:57), though he explicitly refuses an explanation in terms of “the morally sublime” (BT 24; for comment, see Raymond 2014).

As with his attitude toward Schopenhauer and Wagner, Nietzsche’s feelings toward Schiller would sour in his later years. During these years there is little explicit engagement with Schiller, and when his name is mentioned, he is dismissed as a “moral trumpeter” (TI “Skirmishes” 1). However, a number of scholars have made the case that elements of Schiller’s thought, and the broader German Classicist tradition to which it belongs, continue to exercise considerable influence on Nietzsche beyond The Birth of Tragedy (see Martin 1996; Bishop & Stephenson 2005; Katsafanas 2011; Stoll 2019; and Lichtenstein 2019). Noteworthy is that Nietzsche’s emphasis on the importance of artistic Schein would continue into his later works, as would his positively valanced use the term ‘naïve’ in reference to members of the ancient nobility (GM I.10/KSA 5:272, GM II.7/KSA 5:304).

2. The Birth of Tragedy

2.1 The Problem of The Birth of Tragedy

The Birth of Tragedy is, in the first instance, an attempt to offer a philosophical theory of the nature and value of tragedy, and in this sense it belongs to a tradition stretching from Aristotle’s Poetics to Hegel’s Aesthetics lectures and beyond. Two questions have tended to orient this tradition: (1) in what does the value of the experience of tragedy consist (if indeed it is valuable at all)? (2) what explains the pleasure we take in watching tragedies? (1) owes its urgency to Plato’s argument in Republic X that tragedy corrupts its viewers. (2) is motivated by the familiar but paradoxical fact that the pleasure we get from tragedy depends on emotional responses—pity, fear, anxiety, and so forth—that are intrinsically unpleasant. Predictably, The Birth does attempt to answer both questions ((1) is a constant theme; for (2) see esp. BT 22/KSA 1:141–44, BT 24/KSA 1:152–53). But, surprisingly enough, neither is really its main animating problem. Nietzsche’s chief goal in the book is rather to suggest that there is a profound existential problem facing humanity, and to argue that tragedy (or, more specifically, Attic tragedy and its supposed reincarnation in the Wagnerian Musikdrama) is the only way of solving it. His answers to (1) and (2) then fall out of this more general argument, rather than constituting his philosophical starting point.

What, then, is that problem? The natural suggestion is to locate it in Schopenhauer’s pessimism (e.g. Young 1992, 26–9; Young 2006, 14–15; Soll 1990, 1998; Came 2005). Schopenhauer’s pessimism combines the descriptive thesis that life necessarily involves more suffering than happiness, with the normative thesis that life is therefore not worth living, or that non-existence is preferable to existence. That this is Nietzsche’s main concern is strongly suggested by his repeated references to the so-called “wisdom of Silenus” (BT 3/ KSA 1:35, BT 4/KSA 1:39–41, BT 7/KSA 1:57, BT 24/KSA 1:151). This “wisdom”—which is reported in a fragment of a lost dialogue of Aristotle’s (see F 44 R³ [Aristotle CW, 2401–2]), and alluded to in Sophocles (see Oedipus at Colonus, 1211)—is that “the best of all things for you is entirely unattainable: never to have been born, not to be, to be nothing. But the second best is for you—to die soon” (BT 3/KSA 1:35). Nietzsche, on this story, accepts the descriptive thesis of pessimism, and he also believes the Greeks of the 6^th and 5^th centuries BC recognized its truth. The question, then, is how to respond to the “terrors and horrors of existence” (BT 3/KSA 1:35); the best answer is contained in Greek tragedy (specifically, the tragedies of Aeschylus and Sophocles). One might suppose that another, perhaps preferable, way to phrase the problem would be in terms of how to overcome the “terror and horror of existence,” or how to accept the descriptive thesis of pessimism while rejecting Silenus’ (and Schopenhauer’s) verdict on the value of human life. But, for reasons canvassed below (see §2.3), some scholars believe that The Birth remains committed in some sense to Schopenhauer’s negative verdict on the value of life. What is important for now is simply that, on the present proposal, Nietzsche views suffering—in particular, its predominance and inextricability—as the main problem facing us.

A competing proposal instead views lack of meaning—in particular, the lack of meaning-conferring cultural institutions—as the main problem to which Nietzsche addresses himself, and not suffering per se (Gemes & Sykes 2014, 2015; cf. Tanner 2000, 8). Gemes and Sykes, e.g., read Nietzsche’s project in The Birth as inspired more by Wagner and the Romantic tradition than by Schopenhauer (Gemes & Sykes 2014, 100–101). As noted above, that tradition saw modernity as characterized by a kind of “homelessness”—a growing sense that we no longer have a place of “belonging” in the world. On this reading, Nietzsche is animated mainly by the same sorts of concerns. And his aim in The Birth is to show how the tragic festival can help us regain our lost sense of belonging by providing our culture with an overarching, unifying “mythic” worldview. Thus, remarking critically on the contemporary state of German culture, Nietzsche says that “without myth, every culture forfeits its healthy, creative natural power; only a horizon encircled by myth brings a whole cultural movement to a unity” (BT 23/KSA 1:145).

There is ample evidence in the text that Nietzsche is concerned both with the problem of suffering and the problem of modern cultural fragmentation. One need not place exclusive emphasis on either problem, and they can even be seen as interrelated (see Huddleston 2019, 13–14). The feeling that one’s life lacks some sought for place of belonging may itself be the cause of great psychological suffering. On the other hand, the ordinary suffering endemic to life might be easier to bear if one feels that we are “in it together,” so to speak, and this may prompt one to seek such meaning. It is possible to see an even tighter and more general connection between the two problems. For, arguably, Schopenhauer’s pessimistic conclusion only follows from his thesis that life is inescapably full of suffering together with his rejection of traditional narratives about its meaning. The Christian, for example, may admit that suffering is a problem, but still conclude that life is worth living insofar as it achieves something of value (e.g., an atonement for original sin). The Birth of Tragedy might then be read as occupied neither with the problem of suffering nor with the problem of meaning as such, but with the problem of meaningless suffering (Came 2022, 44–45). Even if the two issues can be seen as related in this way, there is still a question of emphasis. For, it may make a difference to our interpretation of The Birth whether we see Nietzsche’s main interests as stemming from the Schopenhauerian question about the justification of suffering, or from the Romantic concern with cultural flourishing.

2.2 The Metaphysics of The Birth of Tragedy

The most famous aspect of The Birth of Tragedy is without doubt Nietzsche’s distinction between the “Apollonian” and the “Dionysian.” These terms are first introduced (BT 1, 2) as names for two “art drives” (Kunsttriebe) which are originally operative in nature, and then derivatively associated with distinct artistic paradigms. The paradigmatically representational arts that deal in “forms” (painting, sculpture, epic poetry) are associated with Apollo, whereas the paradigmatically non-representational, or more typically “expressive” arts (music and lyric poetry) are associated with Dionysus. One of Nietzsche’s main contentions in The Birth is that Greek tragedy is a unique hybrid artform that combines and unifies the Apollonian and Dionysian impulses. The former is manifested in the dramatic dialogue and action, while the latter finds expression in the musical accompaniment of the chorus.

Yet, in many places throughout the book, Nietzsche appears to accord the Apollonian/Dionysian duality a quite distinct, if distantly related, significance. In this second sense, ‘Apollonian’ and ‘Dionysian’ are ways of referring to two metaphysical sides of the world à la Schopenhauer. The merely apparent world of spatiotemporally discrete individuals, governed by causal laws, is associated with Apollo, whereas the non-spatiotemporal monistic reality underlying the appearances is associated with Dionysus. The clear impression is that Nietzsche thus commits himself to Schopenhauer’s Transcendental Idealism and Will-Monism, that his “Apollo and Dionysus are … simply Representation and Will in Greek costume” (Nussbaum 1999, 358).

Commentators divide over the question of how seriously Nietzsche intends the metaphysical associations his key terms sometimes carry, and indeed whether The Birth advances any metaphysical doctrine at all. The orthodox reading has been that “The Birth incorporates without modification Schopenhauer’s metaphysics” (Young 1992, 26; cf. Young 2006, 14; Silk & Stern 1981, 291; Geuss 2012; Soll 1998, 103; Clark 2015). This was, indeed, the view of Nietzsche’s closest friend and intellectual confidant at the time, Erwin Rohde (see Rohde 1872), and the evidence for it is clear and straightforward. Nietzsche calls Apollo the god of the principii individuationis (principle of individuation)—a scholastic term Schopenhauer uses to refer to space, time, and causality qua merely subjective principles of the mind (BT 1/KSA 1:28). Nietzsche repeatedly refers to a “primordial unity” (das Ur-Eine), “will” (Wille), or “world-will” (Weltwille) that he associates with Dionysus and which he apparently takes to transcend the empirical order (BT 1/KSA 1:24, 30, BT 3/KSA 1:37–38, BT 4/KSA 1:38–39, BT 5/KSA 1:43–44, BT 17/KSA 1:109, 112, BT 18/KSA 1:115, BT 21/KSA 1:135, BT 22/KSA 1:141). Closely paraphrasing a passage from The World as Will and Representation (SW 2:497–98/WWR 1:447), Nietzsche tells the reader that,

The tremendous courage and wisdom of Kant and Schopenhauer has achieved the most difficult victory, victory over the optimism which lies hidden in the essence of logic… . While the latter believed in the possibility of knowing and fathoming [die Erkennbarkeit und Ergründlichkeit] all riddles of the world … and treated space, time and causality as entirely unconditioned laws of the most universal validity, Kant revealed how these laws really only serve to raise mere appearance, the work of Maya, to the level of the sole and highest reality and to put it in place of the innermost and true essence of things, and in this way to make actual knowledge [Erkenntniss] of this essence impossible, i.e., as Schopenhauer puts it, to lull the dreamer ever deeper asleep. (BT 18/KSA 1:118)

The Birth of Tragedy seems, moreover, to endorse Schopenhauer’s theory of music (BT 5/KSA 1:46–7; BT 16/KSA 1:46–7, 104–7), according to which music is a direct “copy” of the noumenal Will. And, finally, this theory along with the metaphysical picture on which it relies appear to be directly implicated in Nietzsche’s account of tragedy’s ultimate lesson:

It is only out of the spirit of music that we understand a joy in the annihilation of the individual. For, the individual examples of such annihilation only make clear to us the eternal phenomenon of Dionysian art, which brings to expression the will in its omnipotence behind, so to speak, the principio individuationis, eternal life beyond all appearances and in spite of all annihilation. The metaphysical joy in tragedy is a translation of the instinctive unconscious Dionysian wisdom into the language of the image. (BT 16/KSA 1:108)

For all the idiosyncrasies of Nietzsche’s mode of expression, such passages do seem to suggest a straightforward acceptance and deployment of Schopenhauer’s core metaphysical ideas.

This received, metaphysical reading of The Birth is by no means the consensus view, however. Indeed, the general trajectory of recent scholarship has been toward rejecting it (Staten 1990, 187–216; Poellner 1998; Han-Pile 2006; Porter 2000; Gardner 2013, 603–6; Gemes & Sykes 2014; Mulhall 2014, 261–63; Daniels 2013, 69–71). The most plausible versions of this reading admit that The Birth contains numerous metaphysical claims, but hold that these are put forward in a self-consciously fictional register.

There are three key pieces of evidence for these anti-metaphysical readings of The Birth. The first is an early notebook entry (composed sometime between October 1867 and April 1868) entitled “On Schopenhauer” (see FS 3.352–61/WEN 1–8). This entry presents four criticisms of Schopenhauer’s identification of the thing-in-itself with the Will, and seems to conclude with a wholesale rejection of Schopenhauer’s metaphysics. One of the main points is that Schopenhauer’s adherence to Kant’s thesis that the world in-itself is unknowable vitiates his attempt to offer any positive account of its nature. If Nietzsche rejected the metaphysics of Will possibly as early as 1867, then he could not, it is supposed, have seriously intended to revive it in 1872.

The second piece of evidence is the following, surprising passage from The Birth of Tragedy itself:

It is an eternal phenomenon: the voracious will always finds a means, through an illusion that it spreads over things, to chain its creatures to life and to compel them to live on. One is captivated by the Socratic lust for knowledge and the delusion [Wahn] of being able to heal the eternal wound of existence through it; another is ensnared by art’s seductive veil of beauty that flutters before his eyes; and yet another by the metaphysical solace that eternal life flows on indestructibly beneath the whirl of appearances. (BT 18/KSA 1:115, emphasis added)

Note that the description of the “metaphysical solace” sounds remarkably close to the Schopenhauerian view that there is some single willing being underlying the apparent world of individuation. The passage appears to assert in no uncertain terms that this is only an illusion; it is presented as on a par with the “Apollonian” illusion that “makes human existence seem more beautiful than it really is” (Han-Pile 2006, 382), and the Socratic view, which Nietzsche rejects, that we can end human suffering by coming to understand its causes (BT 15/KSA 1:97–102).

The third datum for non-metaphysical readings is Nietzsche’s valorization throughout The Birth of “myth.” A major theme of Nietzsche’s early work, as noted above, is that shared mythologies are essential for the flourishing of a culture: Nietzsche’s emphasis on the importance of myth is not as such evidence against a metaphysical interpretation of the book, since the fact that he valorizes myth does not on its own show that he views his metaphysics as a myth. However, it does provide a plausible rationale for the otherwise baffling BT 18 (our second piece of evidence). The idea is that, in those places of The Birth where Nietzsche appears to advance a grand metaphysical theory, he is really trying to supply late 19^th-century German culture with the sort of myth that he thinks it needs to flourish. His confession in §18 that that “theory” is an illusion is an indication to the reader that this is what is going on. The most developed version of this reading in found in Gemes & Sykes 2014, 2015.

How can proponents of the more orthodox metaphysical reading respond to these apparently compelling pieces of evidence? With respect to the first, some have suggested that, while Nietzsche did reject Schopenhauer’s identification of the thing-in-itself with the Will on the grounds that the former is completely unknowable, he still cleaved for a time to the basic dichotomy between a monistic Will and a spatiotemporal realm of discrete individuals. On this revised Schopenhauerian reading, the Will itself is degraded to the status of an appearance, but an appearance that “provides a deeper account of the world than its description in terms of material bodies… . ‘Will’ is, then, … a description of penultimate rather than ultimate reality” (Young 2010, 92; cf. Ridley 2007, 26). Julian Young has suggested that this sort of view in fact represents the position of the later Schopenhauer himself (2010, 92; 2005, 96–98), thus making The Birth’s metaphysical picture still genuinely Schopenhauerian. (Whether the later Schopenhauer actually degrades the Will to the status of an appearance in this way is, of course, controversial (see, e.g., Janaway 1999, 162–63; Özen 2021, 261–63).)

With respect to the second piece of evidence, it might be noted that what Nietzsche specifically refers to as an illusion in BT 18 is the “metaphysical solace,” and it may not be correct to identify this “solace” with the book’s metaphysics per se. Young (2006), e.g., reads the passage from BT 18 as claiming, not that the Schopenhauerian metaphysics of will is an illusion; it is rather the idea we get from Dionysian tragedy—that life is worth living in spite of its terrors—that is the illusion (15–16). It might also be observed that, interpreted as a straightforward rejection of that metaphysics, there is something especially peculiar about the passage from BT 18. Suppose that by ‘the metaphysical solace’ Nietzsche really does mean ‘the idea that there is a single metaphysical Will underlying all appearances.’ Read straightforwardly, then, the passage claims that the metaphysical Will creates the illusion of its own existence (this peculiarity is noted by Paul de Man (1979, 99–102) though he takes it as evidence that BT aims to metatextually call its own claims into question). This bizarre result would seem to suggest that we need a more nuanced reading of the passage.

There are not many direct attempts on behalf of orthodox readers to rebut the third piece of evidence (and, in general, there has been to date very little effort at developing a metaphysical reading of The Birth that countenances the above evidence). As noted already, however, the emphasis on the need for myth is not itself evidence that The Birth’s metaphysics is itself such a myth. This theme lends credence to the anti-metaphysical hypothesis only together with the other pieces of evidence. If proponents of the orthodoxy have convincing explanations for these countervailing texts, then perhaps they do not need to deal with directly with the issue of myth. (For a discussion of the role of myth in The Birth, which finds it compatible with taking the book’s metaphysical commitments seriously, see Young 2010, 130–31.)

2.3 Pessimism, Optimism, and the Aesthetic Justification of Existence

Interpreters diverge over the question of The Birth’s commitment to Schopenhauer’s pessimism just as they do over its commitment to his metaphysics. One natural view, supported especially by some of Nietzsche’s retrospective comments about The Birth, holds that the book contains a “complete rejection of the normative ethics of pessimism” (Nussbaum 1999, 362; cf. Kaufmann 1974, 131; Schacht 2001; Soll 1998, 100–101; Ridley 2019, 318–19). A competing view maintains that Nietzsche in fact “endorsed Schopenhauer’s inference from the pain and purposelessness of human existence to its worthlessness” (Young 1992, 26; cf. Young 2006, 15–16; Geuss 2012, 47, 61; Huddleston 2019, 15, 19). Predictably, decisive textual evidence in favor of either reading proves elusive. To be clear, the disagreement is not over whether Nietzsche accepts the descriptive pessimistic thesis that suffering is life’s fundamental constituent—it is generally agreed that the early Nietzsche is pessimistic in this sense. Rather, the disagreement concerns his answer to the normative question of whether life is, or is not, deserving of negation, whether it would be better not to be.

At first blush, the non-pessimistic reading is bound to appear the most plausible. This reading can rely on Nietzsche’s own later remarks about The Birth. Writing in 1888, for example, Nietzsche says that the book aimed to explain “how the Greeks got over pessimism—with what means they overcame it … tragedy is precisely a proof of the fact that the Greeks were not pessimists” (EH “Books,” BT:1). This sort of remark resonates with much of what Nietzsche says in The Birth itself. “The arts generally,” he claims there, “make life possible and worth living” (BT 1/KSA 1:27–28, emphasis added); or again, “art … alone is capable of turning those thoughts of disgust with the horror or absurdity of existence into representations with which one can live” (BT 7/KSA 1:57). And, of course, there is Nietzsche’s overriding claim in the book that “only as an aesthetic phenomenon is [sic] existence and the world eternally justified” (BT 5/KSA 1:47; cf. BT 24/KSA 1:152). If they are genuinely justified, it would seem that Schopenhauer’s verdict—that they ought not to be—cannot be correct.

Yet, The Birth does not speak unequivocally in favor of this “optimistic” reading. For example, Nietzsche also says that tragedy contains “a profound and pessimistic worldview,” and communicates to us “the conception of individuation as the primordial ground of evil, … the hope that the spell of individuation may be broken” (BT 10/KSA 1:73). That suffering arises from the pursuit of one’s individual interests and that salvation lies in freeing oneself from these interests by piercing the “veil” of individuation is, of course, precisely Schopenhauer’s position. This Schopenhauerian interpretation of tragedy is especially prominent in Nietzsche’s 1870 lecture course on The Tragedy of Sophocles, where he states bluntly “life appeared no longer as worth living. Tragedy is pessimistic” (KGA II.3, 10) and that Sophocles’ “teaching is unconditional submission and resignation” (KGA II.3, 27). Elsewhere he straightforwardly identifies “the content of the tragic myth” with “the wisdom of Silenus” (BT 24/KSA 1:151)—the view that the best thing for human beings is never to have been born. And, after telling us that tragedy aims at transfiguration, he clarifies that what it transfigures is “least of all the ‘reality’ of this world of appearance, for it says to us precisely: ‘Look! Look closely! This is your life! This is the hour hand on the clock of your existence!” (ibid.). These seem odd ways, to put it mildly, of expressing the idea that life is, in spite of it all, justified and worth living. Proponents of a pessimistic reading can also point to evidence that Nietzsche thinks both Apollonian art and tragedy “justify” existence only by means of illusions (e.g., BT 18/KSA 1:115–16). For if, as this may suggest, art helps us affirm life only by deceiving us about its quality, “this implies that in the fullness of knowledge one would not affirm life as worth living. It implies, more briefly, that life is not worth living” (Young 1992, 48).

There are, at least in principle, two distinct questions here: did Nietzsche endorse Schopenhauer’s verdict about the value of life? And, what does he think tragedy tells us (or what does he think it told the Greeks) about the value of life? It is possible that Nietzsche thought tragedy is life-affirming, but himself endorsed Schopenhauer’s life-denying stance. If this is right, however, Nietzsche’s position is highly unstable. Clearly, The Birth aims not only to describe the normative outlook contained in Greek tragedy, but also to, in some sense, advocate for it, and would therefore be committed to recommending an attitude toward life Nietzsche himself believes is unwarranted.

The evidence regarding Nietzsche’s attitude toward pessimism is therefore equivocal. How we are best to interpret it depends to a significant degree on how we interpret The Birth’s major thesis that tragedy offers an “aesthetic justification” of existence. The thesis appears to be that tragedy somehow encourages us to see the world—and the inescapable presence in it of suffering, struggle, death, etc.—from a god’s-eye perspective. From this perspective, the world as whole appears a terrible, but glorious spectacle, and our lives—short and tormented though they may be—have an aesthetic significance insofar as they occupy an integral place in this aesthetically valuable whole, like shadows in a beautiful painting or dissonances in a magnificent piece of music:

We may assume of ourselves that we are already images and artistic projections for [the world’s] true creator and have our highest dignity in our significance as works of art—for only as an aesthetic phenomenon is existence and the world eternally justified. At the same time, our consciousness of this significance of ours hardly differs from that which painted soldiers on a canvas have of the battle depicted on it. (BT 5/KSA 1:47)

Precisely the tragic myth has to convince us that the ugly and disharmonic is an artistic game, which the will, in the eternal fullness of its pleasure [Lust], plays with itself. This primordial phenomenon of Dionysian art, difficult to grasp, is made directly understandable and comprehended immediately only in the miraculous significance of musical dissonance: just as music in general, placed next to the world, can give us a concept of what is to be understood by the justification of the world as an aesthetic phenomenon. The pleasure caused by the tragic myth has the same home as the pleasurable sensation of dissonance in music. (BT 24/KSA 1:152)

In this respect, then, the lesson Nietzsche thinks tragedy teaches us closely resembles Leibniz’s response to the problem of evil (1697 [1989, 153]; on analogies between Nietzsche’s project and traditional projects in philosophical theodicy, see esp. Came 2004, 2005, 2022; May 2011). The mechanism by which Nietzsche thinks tragedy communicates this lesson is obscure. However, the basic idea relies on his idea that Greek spectators identified, not with the characters on the stage, but with the tragic chorus, and from this perspective experienced the drama as a mere ephemeral “vision” (BT 8). And just as the chorus-audience relates to the spectacle on the stage, so too does the primal unity relate to the empirical world as a whole. The analogy, then, intimates to the audience something of their metaphysical-cum-aesthetic significance (BT 8, 10).

Naturally, given the deep interpretive issues surrounding the status of The Birth’s metaphysics (see §2.2 above), not all agree that Nietzsche intends such talk of a “world-artist” literally. And, it might be suspected that whether one takes Nietzsche to be a pessimist or not depends on what one thinks about the intended status of the metaphysical picture the aesthetic justification of existence apparently encodes. If this picture is intended to be true, then it would seem that tragedy is supposed to show us that life really is justified. If, conversely, the metaphysics is not so intended, then it would appear that the so-called metaphysical solace is merely an illusion. In fact, these issues can come apart. It is possible, for instance, that Nietzsche is claiming that when watching a tragedy we catch a glimpse of what the world would look like from a god’s-eye perspective, even if nothing really occupies that perspective. The question, then, is only whether the world would manifest aesthetic value if seen in this way, and not whether there is any being to whom it does manifest such value. Conversely, not all proponents of the metaphysical interpretation of The Birth conclude that Nietzsche believes life is genuinely justified. Young, for example, argues that the fact

that pain and death are indispensable to life as an entertainment for the primordial unity … does nothing at all to justify life to those who—like Christians in the Roman arena—have the misfortune to have to be parts of the entertainment… . To the question of whether life as a human individual is worth living, The Birth replies with the same ‘No’ as does Schopenhauer. (2006, 24)

Evidently, much depends here on how we understand the status of the world’s alleged aesthetic value. If that value consists merely in the fact that it happens to please the “primordial unity,” then this sort of reading seems plausible. If, on the other hand, that value is supposed to be of a non-agent relative sort, then the reading might be resisted.

A further question, though one which is less often thematized, concerns the relation between the aesthetic justification of existence and what Nietzsche frequently calls “the metaphysical solace [Trost]”—something with which, he argues, “every true tragedy leaves us” (BT 7/KSA 1:56). It is natural to suppose that this solace consists precisely in the idea that existence is aesthetically justified. However, some characterisations of the metaphysical solace seem to differ substantively from this idea. Nietzsche describes the “metaphysical joy in the tragic” as rooted in the recognition that “the hero … is ultimately only appearance, and the eternal life of the will is untouched by his annihilation” (BT 16/KSA 1:108). The “metaphysical solace” lies in the thought “that under the whirl of appearances eternal life flows on indestructibly” (BT 18/KSA 1:115). Though each seems to depend on The Birth’s metaphysics, the idea that the world is justified as an aesthetic spectacle and the idea that there is something in us which survives death would appear to be quite distinct thoughts. The former idea might incline us to an overall optimistic reading of the text, if we assume that such a justification could be a genuine one, whereas the latter, which suggests that redemption from this life will be found in some metaphysical beyond, would incline toward a more pessimistic interpretation.

One interesting way of mediating between pessimistic and non-pessimistic interpretations of the early Nietzsche is proposed by Wolt (2025), who draws special attention to affinities with the views of Nietzsche’s older colleague and friend, the cultural historian Jacob Burckhardt (1818–1897). According to this proposal, Nietzsche is genuinely pessimistic inasmuch as he takes life in its typical form to be intrinsically bad, and thus rejects a broadly Christian view according to which every life has an innate positive worth. Yet this pessimistic thesis allows that certain exceptional lives may still achieve a value that makes them worth living. Though Wolt does not develop this interpretation specifically with an eye to Nietzsche’s theory of tragedy, it is not difficult to see how it might apply. Tragedy may be pessimistic insofar as it shows us the lamentable character of life as it typically occurs, but optimistic insofar as it hints at a way in which life could attain value.

3. Art and Illusion

Nietzsche’s aesthetic thought is centrally, if often only obliquely, engaged with Plato’s. In the Genealogy, Nietzsche dubs Plato “the greatest enemy of art Europe has yet produced” (GM III.25), referring, of course, to Republic X’s attack on the imitative or illusory nature of much art, which accordingly appeals to “a part of us that is far from reason” (603a). This engagement is hardly surprising given that the main target of Plato’s censure is Greek tragedy, the very artform which centrally occupied Nietzsche in his first philosophical work, and which would, to a greater or lesser extent, continue to occupy him through his final writings (see §6 below). What is more surprising are Nietzsche’s reasons for disagreeing with the Republic’s verdict: he does not typically deny the central charge that art is false; he instead questions the value Plato (and most of the rest of us, for that matter) place on the truth. This central theme of Nietzsche’s thought is evident already in The Birth’s valorization of Apollonian semblance, and denigration of “Alexandrian” culture—Nietzsche’s term of abuse for a society which accords the highest value to scholarship and science instead of to art. Shortly before The Birth, Nietzsche had written: “my philosophy is inverted Platonism: the further something is from true being, the more beautiful, the better it is. Living in semblance [Schein] as the goal” (NF 1870: 7[156]). Much later in his career, he continues to speak approvingly of art as a “cult of the untrue” and “the good will to semblance” (GS 107), in which “the lie sanctifies itself, in which the will to illusion [Täuschung] has the good conscience on its side” (GM III.25). And in notes from his final productive year, he writes: “the truth is ugly: we have art so that we do not perish from the truth” (NF 1888: 16[40]). Nietzsche is opposed, in short, both to Plato’s condemnation of artistic illusion, and to theories, like Schopenhauer’s or Schelling’s, that try to make art into the source of some deep, metaphysical truth. Art is false, and it is valuable (at least in part) because of its falsity.

There are several basic interpretive questions to ask here: (1) in what sense is art “false” according to Nietzsche? (2) Why does he think artistic falsity is valuable? And (3) how does this valorization cohere with his own views about the value of truthfulness? In approaching these questions, it is useful to keep in mind a simple distinction drawn by Stoll (2019, 332–33). Art might be representationally false, say, by attributing properties to the things it represents that they do not possess, or by expressing, implicitly or explicitly, false propositions. In contrast, art might be mimetically false because it is illusory, “fake,” non-genuine, merely resembles without really being what it depicts. In the first sense, ‘false’ is being used roughly in the way it typically is in, e.g., epistemology. In the second sense, it is being used in the way it is when we speak of a “false friend” or “false teeth.” These senses clearly come apart; an object like a set of false teeth has no representational or propositional content, and a portrait painting might capture its subject’s likeness with tremendous accuracy while (and perhaps for that very reason) creating a powerful illusion.

The prevailing tendency is to see Nietzsche as claiming that art is representationally false, and specifically as misrepresenting the undesirable or unaffirmable aspects of life. The following remarks seem to capture his position his well: “the role of art is to supply a (dishonest) fantasy that is to replace a reality that one cannot face” (Ridley 2007, 140); “art must represent life as beautiful, as affirmable, precisely because life is not beautiful” (Young 1992, 134); “artistic representation falsifies its object by depicting it as other than it is” (Came 2013, 220; cf. May 1999, 29–36; Janaway 2014). Assuming that Nietzsche is best interpreted in something like this manner, there are still several different ways art might be taken to be misrepresentational. First, and most straightforwardly, art might misrepresent what it overtly depicts. For example, a portrait painter might idealize some of her subject’s features, remove certain blemishes, and so forth. Second, art might misrepresent “life” or the “world” in some more general way, say, by implicitly or explicitly expressing false propositions about it, or otherwise suggesting a non-veridical outlook of some sort. For example, while Macbeth is on one level about specific members of the medieval Scottish nobility, perhaps its “real” message is that traitors meet a sorry end, and this message is not (without exception) true. Along similar lines, but much more generally, Nietzsche sometimes suggests that the world “in itself” simply lacks “beauty” and “order” (e.g. GS 109, 299). So, perhaps he thinks that art misrepresents the world simply to the extent that it represents things beautifully. Third, art might misrepresent by being fictional, in the sense of representing things which do not exist, rather than distorting what does exist. Greek art, for example, is preoccupied with mythical stories about non-existent gods, heroes, monsters, and so forth. And, presumably, Nietzsche would consider Christian art—with its various narratives about saints, prophets, miracles, and the like—false in just the same way.

If one or more of the above types of misrepresentation best capture Nietzsche’s conception of artistic falsity, then it is natural to suppose that the value of such falsehoods lies primarily in their content. A key facet of Nietzsche’s thought is the idea that it can be better, from a pragmatic perspective, to hold false beliefs than to hold true beliefs (BGE 3). We might then suspect that the value of artistic misrepresentations is rooted in the fact that their content is nonetheless “life-promoting.” Thus, for example, Gemes and Sykes have argued that tragedy fosters “the belief in a unity which underlies the apparent world, and offers the myth that in death, the individual will find redemption and reunification with the reality beneath appearance” (2014, 93). While the later Nietzsche may prefer less Schopenhauerian myths, he may still retain the basic structure of this conception of the value of artistic falsehood.

There are several problems, both philosophical and textual, with the above sort of view. One philosophical problem with the kind of aesthetic beautification Nietzsche sometimes seems to have in mind is that it arguably conflates representing something as beautiful with representing it beautifully (cf. Huddleston 2022, 125). So, the portraitist might depict her subject as more beautiful than he is, and thus misrepresent him. But, it is far from clear that Homer’s Iliad—or Malick’s The Thin Red Line, for that matter—misrepresent war as beautiful simply in virtue of being beautiful stories about war. Relatedly, we do not often infer that properties attributed to objects by works of art are properties those objects actually possess. If Nietzsche’s conception of artistic falsity depends on the assumption that we are deceived by it, then he is assuming art appreciators to be far more gullible than they typically are (though, for a reading according to which Nietzsche does not need this assumption, see Reginster 2014, 15–23).

The above sort of reading also raises interpretive puzzles. For one, as Aaron Ridley observes (2013, 421), whether a work of art is misrepresentational in any of the above senses seems to be a purely contingent matter. But, Nietzsche appears to think that art is necessarily false, or at least that art and falsity are very intimately related. Second, Nietzsche himself often appears opposed to precisely the conception of aesthetic beautification it is tempting to attribute to him (cf. Young 1992, 42–43). He suggests approvingly that “art also brings much that is ugly, hard, and questionable about life to appearance” (TI “Skirmishes” 24) and claims that “the good, strong will of the older Hellene” was characterized by a “longing for the ugly” (ASC 4). Finally, it is unclear how Nietzsche’s insistence on the value of artistic falsity coheres with his broader normative commitments. Specifically, and as Ridley (2007) in particular has argued (cf. Reginster 2014, 25–29), the suggestion that art supplies us with life-affirming fictions seems to conflict with Nietzsche’s conception of life-affirmation as requiring “that one does not want to have anything differently … not merely to endure what is necessary, still less to conceal it … but to love it” (EH “Clever” 10). There is a broader question here about the extent of Nietzsche’s commitment to the ideal truthfulness (see Janaway 2024, for an exploration of many of the difficult issues involved). But the idea that the need to conceal certain difficult facts about reality from oneself expresses a kind of contemptible cowardice is a consistent theme in Nietzsche’s later works (e.g., BGE 39, 227; A 54; EH Preface 3, “Books” BT:2). Nietzsche’s apparent suggestion that we need art precisely to conceal such facts from ourselves evidently conflicts with that idea.

There are a number of potential responses to this last difficulty. One is to suggest that Nietzsche fails to entirely resolve it (Ridley 2007, 123–27), or leaves it unresolved specifically to call attention to what he takes to be genuine tensions in our values (Janaway 2014, 51–56). Another proposal holds that his view develops away from the idea that art should be in any sense false (Reginster 2014). More ecumenically, one might suggest that Nietzsche sees art and truthfulness as competing “regulative ideals” which have to be appropriately balanced against one another (Anderson 2005, 203–11), or that art is permitted to misrepresent, but only those aspects of life that we cannot change or otherwise accept (Ridley 2007, 80–83; 2013, 422–23). According to these sorts of readings, Nietzsche may advocate maximal honesty while still recognizing that life-affirmation might ultimately require some degree of falsification. One problem for this suggestion is that Nietzsche appears to insist that it is precisely the necessary aspects of existence we must acknowledge and affirm (EH “Clever” 10; cf. NF 1888: 16[32]).

A contrasting approach to Nietzsche’s views on artistic falsity is developed by Stoll (2019; cf. Page 2024). According to this approach, Nietzsche’s primary interest is in mimetic falsity, in the fact emphasized by Plato that much art is centrally occupied with imitating, with producing semblances or simulacra of the things it depicts. It was, recall, this sense of falsity that was at issue in Schiller’s conception of Schein (see §1.3 above), which had been important for Nietzsche since early in his career. Nietzsche can thus consistently say that art is false while denying that it should falsely beautify things; its falsity is a function of the medium not the representational content. Divorced as it is from the content of specific works, this account of artistic falsehood can arguably make good sense of the tight connection Nietzsche seems to see between art and illusion (though certain artforms, such as music or architecture, may still pose problems). It also suggests that the aim of art is not to instil in us a set of false, but useful beliefs. Instead, art glorifies or celebrates illusion and falsity themselves, inviting us to reconsider our—mostly negative and, Nietzsche thinks, unhealthy—attitude toward them. Stoll argues that this interpretation allows us to locate the underlying consistency between Nietzsche’s ideal of uncompromising honesty and his valorization of art in a way that does not require the balancing approach suggested by Ridley and Anderson (Stoll 2019, 339–42).

Whether this solves the textual problem depends to some degree on how we think of the positive value art accords to falsity. If to value something positively is to be inclined to pursue or promote it, then it might seem the answer is “No.” Yet, not all positive valuing is like this for Nietzsche. He thinks, for example, that it is possible for the nobleperson to have “reverence” (Ehrfurcht) and even “love” for an enemy whom they aim to defeat (GM I.10). To suggest that it is better for us to be positively disposed to illusion might, but need not be to say that it is better for us to cleave to benighted self-conceptions.

4. Beauty, Disinterestedness, and Creativity

One of the more significant developments Nietzsche’s aesthetics undergoes in the time between The Birth and his later works concerns the idea of disinterested aesthetic appreciation. While the early Nietzsche apparently accepts some version of the thesis that aesthetic pleasure is disinterested, he consistently rejects it by at least 1886 (e.g., BGE 33; though, for a dissenting view according to which Nietzsche’s later aesthetics is still wedded to a broadly Schopenhauerian version of aesthetic disinterest, see (Denham 2014)). The best-known discussion of this issue in the later works comes in GM III.6, where it is connected with an intriguing, albeit obscure, criticism of aestheticians—Kant and Schopenhauer are singled out in particular—who take their cue “purely from the standpoint of the ‘spectator’ [vom ‘Zuschauer’ aus]” (KSA 5:346).

There are a few obvious questions to be had here. First, what is Nietzsche’s criticism of the notion of aesthetic disinterest? This notion has meant different things to different philosophers, and how extensive and successful his criticism is will depend in part on how he understands the notion. Second, how is this criticism related to his apparent preference for an aesthetics that focuses on “the experiences of the artist (the creator)” rather than on those of the spectator? Schopenhauer, after all, believes that the creative genius is someone uniquely capable of attaining a state of pure, will-less cognition (SW 3:430–31/WWR 2:393–94); it is not immediately obvious that looking at the artist will cast suspicion on disinterestedness. Perhaps Nietzsche’s point is that Schopenhauer only reads his faulty theory of aesthetic spectatorship into the creative process. If this is right, then we may still wonder why we should prefer an aesthetics of the creator. Answers to these obvious questions may depend on answers to some more subtle questions. For instance, what precisely would we be looking at in considering “the experiences of the artist?” Artists’ own judgments of what is beautiful/aesthetically valuable? The nature of the creative process? Something else entirely? Nietzsche faults Kant and Schopenhauer for “envisioning the aesthetic problem” from the spectator’s point of view. What is this “aesthetic problem?” It is plausible to suppose that he has in mind the question of the nature of the beautiful (Ridley 2011), but Nietzsche does not explicitly say.

Zangwill (2013) provides one plausible set of answers to these sorts of questions. On his reading, Nietzsche’s objection to Kantian aesthetics concerns more its emphasis on the universality of judgements of taste than their disinterestedness (though, of course, the two issues are not unrelated for Kant). More specifically, Nietzsche’s main target, on this reading, is the idea that beauty is universally available. Nietzsche need not be read as claiming that no beauty is so available, only that “some beauty, higher beauty, can be grasped only by a select few” (Zangwill 2013, 84). This yields one potential way of understanding the objection to aesthetic disinterest and its connection with the spectator. The thought would be that there are some types or instances of beauty which are best or only accessible through “enhanced ecstatic experiences” (ibid., 90), not through dispassionate reflection. And if it is specifically artists who are capable of such experiences, or who are most saliently aware of having had such experiences, then there is reason to find fault with an aesthetics that focuses solely on the experience of the artistic laity. This account, of course, raises questions of its own. Why, for example, should the “select few” capable of grasping higher beauty be identified with artists? And why should disinterested aesthetic experience itself not also be the province of a select few? Even if Kant is right that I can only legitimately require agreement from everyone if my aesthetic judgment is disinterested, it might still be the case that, as a matter of fact, most are unable to judge disinterestedly. Schopenhauer, for one, appears to think that the capacity for genuine will-less cognition is exceedingly rare.

Note that Zangwill’s approach treats ‘experiences of the artist’ and ‘the aesthetic problem’ as referring to judgements or perceptions of beauty. A more radical interpretation finds Nietzsche critical of the very idea that the aesthetic state is to be construed in such “passive” terms to begin with. On this view, “the significance of art is to be found less in its products than in the creative activity by which they are produced” (Reginster 2014, 25; cf. Soll 1998, 108ff.). Here, the problem with a spectator’s aesthetics is that it locates aesthetic value in the wrong place—works of art, or the experiences they cause—or at least fails to see that such value can be located elsewhere as well (cf. Huddleston 2020, 5). In its most extreme version, the view is that beautiful objects are “only by-products, and their beauty is merely a reflection of a … beauty that is, in the first place and most authentically, the artist’s own” (Ridley 2011, 321).

What, if anything, can be said in favor of such a view, and how is it connected with Nietzsche’s criticism of disinterestedness? One suggestion is that the spectator’s standpoint cannot account for the artist’s motivation to create a work (Soll 1998, 108; Reginster 2014, 24). This is particularly problematic if the genius is conceived along Schopenhauerian lines—as someone possessing a heightened ability for perceiving nature in the purely intellectual, will-less manner, supposedly characteristic of all aesthetic enjoyment. The question is why, having achieved this state themselves, the artist should be motivated to make it available to others in the form of an artwork. One might of course wonder what this psychological question has to do with the question of the nature of beauty. After all, it is hardly clear that a successful theory of beauty has also to explain what motivates artistic creation. A potential response, here, would be that Nietzsche operates under the general assumption, shared with Schopenhauer, that the state from which the artist creates is the same as the state that their work aims to produce (Young 1992, 120). If conceiving the latter in terms of disinterestedness cannot explain the possibility of the former, such a theory would then need to be rejected. (For a critical assessment of the argument here, see (ibid., 121–25).)

In addition to its critical reflections on earlier aesthetic theories, GM III.6 also gives us some indication of Nietzsche’s own positive account of beauty or positive aesthetic value. The section quotes approvingly a claim from Stendhal’s Rome, Naples et Florence (1817) that “the beautiful is a promise of happiness,” and Stendhal is said to constitute, in contrast to Kant and Schopenhauer, a “genuine spectator.” One important question, here, is whether the fact that Stendhal is called a “spectator” means that Nietzsche regards even his definition of beauty as in some sense deficient (Ridley 2011). Most, however, take Nietzsche to be adopting Stendhal’s definition. What, then, is the import of this definition? In his later works, Nietzsche often associates the experience of beauty with the feeling of power and with erotic arousal. A particularly developed interpretation focusing on these associations is (Reginster 2014; cf. Soll 1998; Ridley 2011, 319–25). Reginster’s reading takes inspiration from Nehamas’s recent theory of beauty (2007). According to this theory, to find something beautiful is not to experience or judge it to be of positive value—aesthetic experience is not a “verdict.” To find something beautiful is rather to be impelled to continue engaging with it, to get to know it better. The version of this theory that Reginster locates in Nietzsche holds similarly that to find something beautiful is, not to find oneself in a state of passive enjoyment, but to be impelled by it toward “new artistic creation” (2014, 31). This sort of account offers a way of making sense of Nietzsche’s somewhat surprising approval (TI “Skirmishes” 22–23) of Plato’s definition of love in the Symposium as “reproduction and birth in beauty” (206e). Here, one might think too of the way in which we speak both of artistic geniuses as “inspired,” and of their works as “inspiring.” It also promises to cast further light on Nietzsche’s dissatisfaction with conceptions of aesthetic pleasure as disinterested. If we assume that activity is inherently interested, and if to find something beautiful is to be impelled by it to some kind of activity, then it would seem appreciation of the beautiful could not be disinterested. (For another sophisticated account of Nietzsche’s conception of beauty that emphasizes the dimension of erotic arousal, see Leiter 2018, and for a compelling proposal connecting it to Nietzsche’s remarks about glorification and praise, Fox 2020.)

Not all of Nietzsche’s remarks about beauty and aesthetic value sit naturally with these functional sorts of definition. Especially in his discussions of self-creation, though in other contexts as well, he seems to operate with a more traditional understanding of beauty as harmony or unity amongst diversity. He likens beauty to “order, division, form” (GS 109), to the imposition of a coherent style (GS 290), and this imposition is described as involving the ability “to become master over the chaos that one is; to compel one’s chaos to become form; to become necessity in form: to become logical, simple, unequivocal, mathematics; to become law” (NF 1888: 14[61]). These very same aesthetic standards are deployed—fairly or not—against Wagner’s alleged stylistic decadence:

With what does every literary décadence distinguish itself? By the fact that life no longer dwells in the whole. The word becomes souvrain and leaps out of the sentence, the sentence reaches out and eclipses the sense of the page, the page wins life at the cost of the whole—the whole is no longer a whole. But that is the image for every style of décadence: every time anarchy of atoms, disintegration of the will. (CW 7)

In these contexts, Nietzsche seems to adopt the conception of beauty, common amongst the eighteenth-century rationalists, as a kind of “perfection” or organic unity (see Hassan 2022, for a particularly sophisticated treatment of Nietzsche on organic unity; cf. Soll 1998, 102–105). Here, beauty (or at least aesthetic value of some kind) seems to be treated as a perfectly objective property of beautiful objects rather than, say, a mere invitation to further activity. This is not to say that these two strands could not in principle be connected. Ridley (2013, 419–20), for example, emphasizes the close connection Nietzsche often draws between creativity and form-giving. If Nietzsche does endorse the above-mentioned Schopenhauerian view that there is a kind of parity between creative activity and the aesthetic experience, he might maintain that seeing an object as “formed chaos” is precisely what incites us to creativity ourselves.

5. Aesthetics and Physiology

In the Genealogy, Nietzsche remarks parenthetically that he will one day write a “Physiology of Aesthetics” (GM III.8), and in The Case of Wagner (published the following year) he refers prospectively to “a chapter of my magnum opus, which carries the title ‘toward a physiology of art’” (CW 7). The plan for this work never came to fruition, though some material appearing under that heading in Nietzsche’s notebooks seems to have been utilized in the writings of his final year, particularly in Twilight of the Idols (cf. NF 1888: 17[9], TI “Skirmishes” 8–11, 19–24). One of the most extreme claims from this period comes in Nietzsche contra Wagner: “Aesthetics is indeed nothing but an applied physiology” (NCW “Objections”). These remarks are largely promissory, and further textual evidence for the shape of the envisioned “physiology of art/aesthetics” is relatively thin. Nevertheless, some scholars have argued that the biological sciences are central to Nietzsche’s mature aesthetic theory.

Moore (2002, 85–111) sees Nietzsche as part of a post-Darwinian tradition of German thinkers, along e.g. with Ernst Haeckel (1834–1919), aiming for evolutionary explanations of aesthetic experience. A Darwinist interpretation is developed, in particular, in Richardson 2004 (219–70). According to Richardson, Nietzsche believes that evolution selects for a tendency to discriminate between traits associated with fitness and those not so associated, and to find pleasure in the former and displeasure in the latter (236–43; cf. Stern 2020, 58). This reading can explain well Nietzsche’s tendency to associate aesthetic experience with sexuality (e.g., GM III.6; TI “Skirmishes” 22–23), as well as his occasional privileging of human beauty (TI “Skirmishes” 20). It will apparently struggle to explain why we find beautiful a vast array of things—instrumental music, abstract art, non-human animals, landscapes, etc.—that are not humans (cf. Janaway 2007, 190). Nietzsche might suggest that the features we find beautiful in non-human objects are those that remind us in some way of physical human beauty. Such a suggestion might be broadly in the spirit of Burke’s theory that the same general qualities which make for beautiful human bodies (smoothness, relative smallness, etc.) are the qualities which also cause us to find beautiful non-human objects. Alternatively, Nietzsche might appeal, in proto-Freudian fashion, to a sublimation of the sex-drive (e.g., GM III.8; cf. Moore 2002, 106–7). As noted in the previous section, one plausible reading holds that the experience of the beautiful, for Nietzsche as for Plato, involves being spurred toward creativity. Thus, the pleasure taken in a sunset or a Beethoven symphony might be said to be “erotic” to the extent that it puts us in this general sort of state, even if it does not involve arousal or the desire for literal procreation.

A distinct, if potentially related point of contact between physiology and art is Nietzsche’s frequent use of medical concepts when assessing art and artists in his later writings. Art of which he disapproves—especially Wagner’s art—is castigated as “decadent” (décadent) or “degenerate” (entartete), whereas the art of e.g. Raphael, Bizet, or Goethe is celebrated as “healthy,” and a “stimulus to life” (TI “Skirmishes” 24). To call an artist or their work “decadent” might be to make a functional or an expressive claim. Both sorts of claims can be found in the text, and are sometimes made in the same breath—e.g., “is Wagner even a human being? Is he not rather a sickness? … He has made music sick” (CW 5). The claim would appear to be that decadent art, like Wagner’s, is both a “symptom” of the artist’s own degeneration, as well as a kind of “contagion,” and garners rebuke on both grounds. In other contexts, however, Nietzsche suggests a slightly different point. In a well-known passage from The Gay Science, for example, he writes:

Every art, every philosophy, may be viewed as an aid and means of salvation for growing, struggling life: they always presuppose suffering and sufferers. But there are two types of sufferers: those who suffer from the overabundance of life, who want a Dionysian art and likewise a tragic view of and insight into life—and then those who suffer from the impoverishment of life, who seek quiet, stillness, a placid sea, redemption from themselves through art and knowledge. (GS 370)

Here, Nietzsche appears to be sounding a theme that was with him since The Birth of Tragedy—that art is one of humanity’s fundamental means for coping with the suffering endemic to life. Now, however, he comes to think that not all suffering is equal; some suffering is “healthy,” while other suffering is “sick.” Nietzsche clearly signals his approval for art that responds to suffering of the former kind. Note, however, that this need not mean he disapproves of the latter sort of art on functional grounds; such art may be genuinely good for those who need it, and otherwise innocuous. Instead, his objection may be to the fact that such art perforce expresses an evaluative outlook of which he disapproves (cf. Ridley 2007, 124).

In still other contexts, Nietzsche develops this general idea in the direction of what appears to be an unusual form of aesthetic non-cognitivism. After claiming that “aesthetics is irrevocably tied to these biological presuppositions [of ‘ascending’ or ‘declining’ life],” he suggests that “these opposing forms in the optics of values … are ways of seeing, which one cannot get at with reasons and refutations. ... One does not refute a disease of the eye. ... The concepts ‘true’ and ‘untrue,’ it seems to me, have no meaning in optics” (CW Epilogue). The suggestion appears to be that, when we make judgments of the form ‘x is beautiful,’ we are not making truth-apt claims so much as expressing our general (“healthy” or “diseased”) evaluative perspective. It is not obvious, however, that the passage must be read in this irrealist way. The image of the diseased eye, e.g., seems to imply that some such perspectives are wrong or distorted. And the insistence that “reasons and refutations” are out of place in the context of aesthetic disagreement might simply be a way of indicating that they are dialectically ineffective, not that they are conceptually inappropriate.

However one resolves these various unclarities, the important point is that Nietzsche’s idea for a “physiology of aesthetics” may be about looking at art from a diagnostic perspective, rather than investigating its evolutionary origins (though, of course, it is also possible that it be both; see Moore 2002 (165–92) for an interpretation along these lines). Now, much of Nietzsche’s language here—which calls to mind 19^th-century “degeneration theory” and its connections with racism, misogyny, and eugenics—is rather ugly. One might wonder how literally he intends such talk—whether he really believes, e.g., that Wagner’s art is the product of some physiological malady, or whether the notions of health and sickness are being used more metaphorically. The latter option is bound to seem more attractive to contemporary readers, though it should be borne in mind that degeneration theories enjoyed wide acceptance in Nietzsche’s day, and he may well have taken them seriously in a way that we cannot. Discussing this issue in any depth would take us far beyond the ambit of this entry. But, it bears mentioning that Nietzsche, atypically for a nineteenth-century degeneration theorist, often does not treat degeneration as unqualifiedly bad (Gemes 2021). He will even suggest, paradoxically, that “sickness itself can be a stimulus to life” (CW 5).

6. Nietzsche’s Later Theory of Tragedy

Nietzsche never treated tragedy (or any specific artform, for that matter) in as much depth as he treated it in The Birth of Tragedy. Yet, in his mature writings, he would continue to style himself “the first tragic philosopher” (EH “Books” BT:3), and to suggest that we need a tragic outlook on life (GS 370; cf. GS 1, EH “Books” BT:4). Nietzsche’s name remains to a certain degree inextricable from the philosophy of tragedy, given his landmark contribution to this field. It is thus worth asking how, if at all, his position evolved since his first book. We may approach this question by considering Nietzsche’s developing views on the pleasure and value of tragedy. These issues are, of course, distinct. The former question is why we evidently take pleasure in the experience of intrinsically unpleasant emotions (pity, fear, etc.). There may be reasons why tragedy is valuable other than that it causes pleasure, and the reasons for valuing it might not be the same as the reasons it is pleasurable. Nevertheless, it is natural to expect that these two issues would be intimately related, so we shall consider them together.

In The Birth of Tragedy, answers to both questions were apparently rooted in the idea that tragedy provides an “aesthetic justification” of life and a “metaphysical solace” (see §2.3 above). Tragedy is valuable because it gives us (or gave the Greeks, at least) an adequate way of confronting the suffering of life, or a way of conferring meaning on life, or both. Nietzsche’s attempt to resolve the famous paradox of tragic pleasure here is somewhat more obscure. But, it is plausible to think that—like Schiller, Schlegel, Schopenhauer, and others—he means to appeal to the notion of the sublime (see BT 7/KSA 1:57), understood as involving the realization or feeling that there is something in us that transcends the boundaries of empirical reality (see Young 2013, 178–182 for discussion). Alternatively, the suggestion is that “the pleasure produced by the tragic myth has the same home as the pleasurable sensation of dissonance in music” (BT 24/KSA 1:152). The idea would appear to be that tragic pleasure lies in the realization or feeling that our suffering is an integral part of a wider aesthetic whole (Raymond 2014, 71; Hassan 2022, 126). It is natural to suspect that Nietzsche would soon have come to abandon these answers, appealing as they do to a speculative metaphysics.

This suspicion would appear to find confirmation in Nietzsche’s subsequent remarks about tragedy. In The Gay Science, for example, he offers a far more reductive account of the pleasure in tragedy—or at least of the pleasure the Greeks took in it—in terms simply of hearing “good speeches” (GS 80). The explanation resembles Hume’s suggestion that tragic pleasure “proceeds from that very eloquence, with which the melancholy scene is represented” (1757, 190–91), albeit without Hume’s further suggestion that painful emotions thereby undergo a kind of “conversion.” In fact, Nietzsche here denies that negative emotions—pity and fear—are part of the proper response to tragedy at all. Arguably, this account solves the problem of tragic pleasure only at the expense of denying what might seem an obvious fact: that the experience of tragedy is hedonically “ambivalent.”

In Beyond Good and Evil (BGE 229) and the Genealogy (GM II.7), Nietzsche offers a slightly different account. He suggests that “that which constitutes the painful voluptuousness of tragedy is cruelty” (BGE 229). The most straightforward way to understand this claim is that the pleasure we get from witnessing the suffering of the tragic hero is a kind of Schadenfreude. This would explain the pleasure in tragedy, though it does not address what most philosophers have found perplexing about it—the fact that we seem to enjoy the intrinsically unpleasant emotions (e.g. pity) it provokes. Moreover, it seems plainly inadequate from a phenomenological perspective. Typically, a well-written tragedy makes us identify with and feel for the hero, not her tormentors. A different reading, which addresses these concerns, sees Nietzsche as attempting to explain tragic pleasure as a peculiar form of sadomasochism. At this stage of his career, Nietzsche holds that a fundamental feature of human psychology is a tendency to take pleasure is causing suffering, including causing ourselves to suffer. In engaging with the painful experience of tragedy, then, one takes pleasure “in one’s own making-oneself-suffer” (BGE 229). This explanation also seems problematic in at least a couple of ways. For one, even if we agree with Nietzsche’s account of the pleasure of self-directed cruelty, it is unclear why tragic pleasure should count as such an instance. If the point is that in watching a tragedy we willingly undergo an experience that we know will be painful, then it may be noted that there are many such cases which are neither pleasurable nor instances of self-cruelty (e.g., going to the dentist). A second problem arises from the fact that Nietzsche apparently still wants to deny that pity is a genuine response to tragedy; “tragic pity” is merely one of the many “inoffensive names” we use to morally sanitize our enjoyment of cruelty (GM II.7). But, if that is right, then it is unclear why the experience of tragedy is painful to begin with, since the pain is usually thought to be rooted precisely in the experience of emotions like pity.

In the works written between 1878 and 1887, the impression is strong that Nietzsche is experimenting with various accounts (cf., HH I.103, 166, D 172) of tragic experience without having settled on a considered, developed view (though, see Prince 1998 and Kirwin 2023 for contrasting assessments). Noteworthy too is the fact that in this period Nietzsche makes few claims for the positive value tragedy. Matters change somewhat dramatically in the works of his final productive year, especially Twilight of the Idols. Here, Nietzsche devotes much more sustained attention to the tragic artform and is once again keen to insist on its central importance to his ethical outlook. One question that arises in this connection is whether this renewed focus on tragedy also brings with it a return to The Birth’s substantive doctrines. Young (1992, 136–39) and Ridley (2007, 126–27; 2019), in particular, have argued that it does. Consider, for example, the following suggestive, but characteristically gnomic, passage:

Tragedy is so far from proving something about the Hellenes’ pessimism in Schopenhauer’s sense, that it must rather count as its most decisive refutation and counter instance. Saying Yes to life itself even in its strangest and most difficult problems; the will to life rejoicing of its own inexhaustibility in the sacrifice of its highest types—that is what I called Dionysian, that is what I guessed to be the bridge to the psychology of the tragic poet. Not to be freed of terror and pity, not to purify oneself of a dangerous affect by means of its vehement discharge—this is how Aristotle understood it—: but rather, beyond terror and pity, to be the eternal pleasure of becoming itself,—that pleasure which also includes the pleasure in annihilation… And with this I touch again on that point from which I once began—the Birth of Tragedy was my first revaluation of values. (TI “Ancients” 5)

What is especially surprising here is not Nietzsche’s continued adherence to the Dionysian affirmation of life even at its “strangest and most difficult,” but his apparent reprisal of the idea that such affirmation involves identifying (if only imaginatively) with an inexhaustible “will to life” that takes pleasure in sacrificing its creatures. It is difficult, here, not to hear echoes of The Birth’s “primordial unity” or “world-artist.” What this seems to indicate is that Nietzsche has returned to the idea that tragic experience involves transcending one’s individual existence and identifying with a kind of suprapersonal being—one is supposed to somehow “be the eternal pleasure of becoming itself”—or, at least, that it involves the feeling of such transcendence and identification.

While a reasonable conclusion to draw from the above passage taken in isolation, this suggestion is surprising, given the later Nietzsche’s clear opposition to Schopenhauer’s metaphysics and his ideal of self-transcendence. Those wishing to resist this conclusion might note that the passage concludes a chapter entitled “What I Owe to the Ancients,” in which Nietzsche attempts to summarize the influence that his studies of antiquity have had on his broader thought. It is possible that he here intends only to be recalling rather than reasserting the position of The Birth of Tragedy, and to be emphasizing that some elements of his later thought—his opposition to Schopenhauer’s pessimism, his view that life must be affirmed in spite of its “terror and absurdity”—were already nascent there. There are difficulties that such a reading would need to meet (see Ridley 2019, 321–22), but the impression that the above passage does not exactly capture Nietzsche’s mature view is reinforced by the fact that he elsewhere presents an apparently quite different conception of tragedy:

What does the tragic artist communicate of himself? Is it not precisely the condition without fear in the face of the fearsome and questionable that he shows? … The courage and freedom of feeling before a powerful enemy, before a sublime catastrophe, before a problem that arouses dread—this triumphant condition is what the tragic artist selects, what he glorifies. Before tragedy what is warlike in our soul celebrates its saturnalia; he who is used to suffering, who seeks out suffering, the heroic man, extols his own existence with tragedy. (TI “Skirmishes” 24)

A different reading, which draws on these comments, is developed in Reginster 2014. Recall Reginster’s functional account of aesthetic value (see §4)—to find something beautiful is to be spurred by it to further creative activity. Reginster’s application of this general view to the case of tragedy builds on his influential reading of the will to power as the overcoming of resistances (2006). To will power is to will the overcoming of resistances, and this inevitably brings suffering along with it. Yet, it is also a requirement of great achievements, which often, if not always, require meeting great challenges. Instead of showing us suffering as a reason for withdrawing or turning away from life, the tragic artist invites us to “respond to ‘the terrifying and the questionable’ in our existence as he does—as so many challenges, calls to adventure, or opportunities for overcoming” (2014, 34). This reading has the advantage of not relying on a supraindividual perspective Nietzsche gives us reason to reject, and of connecting his later thoughts on tragedy with his other major philosophical preoccupations (power, self-overcoming, etc.). It does, however, raise further questions about the adequacy of Nietzsche’s position. To say that all achievement requires suffering, in the form of overcoming resistance, is not to say that all suffering also constitutes an occasion for great achievement. Some suffering might be purely and utterly destructive. And, indeed, one might have supposed that the sorts of suffering encountered by tragic heroes are often and paradigmatically of that sort—calamities that come entirely unbidden, undeserved, and by which the hero together with their achievements are undone. One may think here of Oedipus’ exile from Thebes, which plunges the city he once saved into civil war and leads to the death of three of his children. This was a fact that Nietzsche himself had been particularly keen to emphasize early on (KGA II.3, 7–10), but of which he would now apparently have lost sight.

It is difficult not to conclude that, despite his lifelong engagement with the topic, Nietzsche never arrived at a fully satisfactory theory of tragedy, let alone one that he was able to clearly articulate. This is not to devalue his achievements here. Perhaps no philosopher has done as much to emphasize that an understanding of tragedy must be rooted in an understanding of the historical and cultural institutions of the ancient world from which it emerged. Few have seen as keenly the ways in which the tragic resists explanation in terms of traditional moral categories. And even fewer have tried so forcefully to articulate something which many seem inchoately to feel—that tragedy contains the answers to our most profound existential questions. Nietzsche’s thoughts here can at times seem muddled, even quixotic. But they are deep thoughts, and ones which merit serious philosophical consideration.

Bibliography

Editions of Nietzsche’s Texts

The following editions of Nietzsche’s works have been referenced. Translations are the author’s own.

[KGA]

Werke: kritische Gesamtausgabe, 40 volumes, Colli, Montinari, Gerhardt, Miller, Müller-Lauter and Pestalozzi (eds.), Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1967ff.

[KSA]

Sämtliche Werke: kritische Studienausgabe, 15 volumes, Colli and Montinari (eds.), Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1980ff.

[SB]

Sämtliche Briefe: kritische Studienausgabe, edited by Giorgio Colli and Mazzino Montinari. Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1975–84.

[FS]

Frühe Schriften, 5 volumes, Mette and Schlechta (eds.), Munich: C.H. Beck, 1994.

[WEN]

Writings from the Early Notebooks, Nehamas and Geuss (eds.), Löb (trans.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2009.

Abbreviations of Nietzsche’s Works

In citing Nietzsche’s published works, this article follows the North American Nietzsche Society’s system for abbreviations. Abbreviations referring to the titles of individual works are followed by section numbers in Arabic numerals. Where the work in question is divided into chapters or parts across which sections are not numbered consecutively, Roman numerals or abbreviations of chapter titles precede section numbers (e.g. GM III.5 = On the Genealogy of Morals, Third Essay, section 5).

A

The Antichrist: A Curse on Christianity

BGE

Beyond Good and Evil: Prelude to a Philosophy of the Future

BT

The Birth of Tragedy out of the Spirit of Music

CW

The Case of Wagner: A Musician’s Problem

D

Daybreak: Thoughts on the Prejudices of Morality

EH

Ecce Homo: How One Becomes What One is.

GM

On the Genealogy of Morals: A Polemic

GS

The Gay Science

HH

Human, All-Too-Human: A Book for Free Spirits

NCW

Nietzsche contra Wagner: Documents of a Psychologist

TI

Twilight of the Idols: or How One Philosophizes with a Hammer

UM

Untimely Meditations

Z

Thus Spoke Zarathustra: A Book for All and None

Where helpful for locating a particular passage, references have also been given to volume and page number of the KSA. Citations of Nietzsche’s unpublished notes [NF] refer to year, and notebook and fragment numbers as established in the critical edition.

Other Primary Literature

• Aristotle, [CW], The Complete Works of Aristotle, vol. 2, Barnes (ed.), Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1985.
• Eckermann, J.P., 1837 [1981], Gespräche mit Goethe in den letzten Jahren seines Lebens, Bergemann (ed.), Frankfurt a.M.: Insel Verlag. Originally published Leipzig: F.A. Brockhaus.
• Hume, D., 1757, Four Dissertations, London: A. Miller.
• Leibniz, G.W., 1697 [1989], “On the Ultimate Origination of Things” in Philosophical Essays, Ariew and Garber (eds.), Indianapolis: Hackett.
• Novalis, Werke, Schulz (ed.), Munich: C.H. Beck, 2013.
• Plato, 1997, Complete Works, Cooper (ed.), Indianapolis: Hackett.
• Rohde, E., 1872, “Die Geburt der Tragödie aus dem Geiste der Musik (Recension),” Norddeutsche allgemeine Zeitung, 21: 1ff.
• Schiller, F., [NA], 1943–, Schillers Werke. Nationalausgabe, Petersen, Fricke, von Wiese, Blumenthal, et. al. (eds.), 42 volumes, Weimar: Hermann Böhlaus Nachfolger. [NA 1–42]
• Schlegel, A.W., [VKL], Vorlesungen über dramatische Kunst und Literatur, Stuttgart: W. Kohlhammer Verlag, 1966.
• Schopenhauer, A., [SW 1–7], Sämtliche Werke, 7 volumes, Hübscher (ed.), Leipzig: F.A. Brockhaus, 1988.
• ––––, [WWR 1], The World as Will and Representation, volume 1, Norman, Welchman, and Janaway (eds. and trans.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2011.
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• ––––, 1870, Beethoven, Leipzig: E.W. Fritzsch.

Secondary Literature

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• ––––, 2005, “The Aesthetic Justification of Existence,” in Ansell Pearson (ed.), A Companion to Nietzsche, Oxford: Blackwell.
• ––––, 2013, “The Themes of Affirmation and Illusion in The Birth of Tragedy and Beyond,” in Gemes and Richardson (eds.), The Oxford Handbook of Nietzsche, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• ––––, 2022, “Nietzsche as a Christian Thinker,” in Came (ed.), Nietzsche on Morality and the Affirmation of Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Clark, M., 2015, “Deconstructing The Birth of Tragedy,” in Nietzsche on Ethics and Politics, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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• De Man, P., 1979, Allegories of Reading, New Haven: Yale University Press.
• Fox, J., 2020, “Gratitude to Beautiful Objects: On Nietzsche’s Claim that the Beautiful ‘Promises Happiness,’” Journal of Nietzsche Studies, 51(2): 169–87.
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• Gemes, K., 2021, “The Biology of Evil: Nietzsche on Degeneration (Entartung) and Jewification,” Journal of Nietzsche Studies, 51(1): 1–25.
• ––––, 2022, “Nietzsche, Nihilism, and the Paradox of Affirmation,” in Came (ed.), Nietzsche on Morality and the Affirmation of Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Gemes, K. and Sykes, C., 2014, “Nietzsche’s Illusion,” in Came (ed.), Nietzsche on Art and Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• ––––, 2015, “The Culture of Myth and the Myth of Culture,” in Young (ed.), Individual and Community in Nietzsche’s Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Geuss, R., 2012, “The Birth of Tragedy,” in Pippin (ed.), Introductions to Nietzsche, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Han-Pile, B., 2006, “Nietzsche’s Metaphysics in The Birth of Tragedy,” European Journal of Philosophy, 14(3): 373–403.
• Hassan, P., 2022, “Organic Unity and the Heroic: Nietzsche’s Aestheticization of Suffering,” in Came (ed.), Nietzsche on Morality and the Affirmation of Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Huddleston, A., 2019, Nietzsche on the Decadence and Flourishing of Culture, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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