Notes to Nishida Kitarō

1. Michiko Yusa gives us a translation of this address in her biography of Nishida (Yusa 2002: 314–18).

2. Nishida’s original model is twofold: First, Richard Dedekind’s infinite system that is mirrored in any of its “proper parts,” which reflect it in their one-to-one correspondence to it but do not contain all of its elements. The set of positive integers, for example, is mirrored in the equivalent set of even integers but that equivalent set does not contain the odd integers. (See Dedekind’s Was sind und was sollen die Zahlen.) Secondly, Josiah Royce’s adaptation of Dedekind in his “self-representative systems,” exemplified by a perfect map that includes a depiction of itself. (See Royce’s Supplementary Essay in The World and the Individual and Maraldo 2017.)

3. Several Japanese interpreters of Nishida relate his predicate logic, if not his entire philosophy, to the nature of the Japanese language, in which “the predicate is predominant and the subject can often be omitted” (Sakabe 2010: 13).

4. Nishida also refers to Husserl’s notions of the field of consciousness (Bewusstseinsfeld) and region (Region), e.g., in NKZ  IV, 210.

5. Nishida’s views find poignant statement in an address of 1943 called “The Principles for a New World Order,” published in NKZ XII, 426–34. See Arisaka 1996.

6. Trans. (modified) by James W. Heisig. Heisig 2015, 37–38.

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John C. Maraldo <jmaraldo@unf.edu>

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