Nominalism in Metaphysics

First published Mon Apr 21, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Sam Cowling and Daniel Giberman replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Nominalism is an exclusionary thesis in ontology. It asserts that there are no entities of certain sorts. Precisely which entities it excludes depends on the relevant variety of nominalism, but nominalist theses typically deny the existence of universals or abstract entities. For those who accept nominalism, a central challenge in metaphysics is to make sense of phenomena that anti-nominalist theories explain via universals or abstract entities. For instance, anti-nominalists often rely upon universals to explain similarity, propositions to explain linguistic meaning, and numbers to explain mathematical truth. Nominalists who reject the existence of such entities must therefore find a credible way to explain how things can be similar without sharing universals, have linguistic meaning without expressing propositions, or be truths of mathematics without the existence of any mathematical entities.

Since nominalists seek to provide metaphysical theories without positing universals or abstract entities, the resulting nominalist theories often require distinctive resources and face significant competition in the form of rival anti-nominalist theories. It is also controversial whether the nominalist prohibitions against universals or abstract entities are justifiable. This entry surveys arguments for nominalism, opposing anti-nominalist arguments for the existence of universals or abstract entities, and a variety of nominalist theories that eschew commitment to such entities.

Before proceeding, a note on terminology and scope is needed. Throughout this entry, we use “anti-nominalism” and its cognates to denote theories that accept the existence of universals or abstract entities. The term “anti-nominalism” avoids the historical connotations of the commonly used term “platonism.” The history of nominalism in metaphysics is extensive and resists concise summary except to say that the reality of universals, numbers, propositions, and related entities has long been controversial. This entry sets aside this lengthy history to focus on the contemporary metaphysical debates regarding nominalism. (See the entry on the medieval problem of universals.) Finally, “nominalism about Fs” is typically understood as the thesis that Fs do not exist, and to deny the existence of a category of entities is to adopt a metaphysical position regarding such entities. ‘Nominalism in metaphysics’ might therefore seem a redundant title for this entry since any version of nominalism must be within the realm of metaphysics. Our focus in what follows is, however, with nominalism as a view that informs metaphysical debates regarding universals as well as putative abstracta such as properties, propositions, and types. While we will touch upon certain arguments from the philosophy of mathematics that have been influential in shaping the metaphysical debate over nominalism, and while there is no clear-cut divide between metaphysics and the philosophy of mathematics, our focus is on the status of nominalism in the former rather than the latter.

What is Nominalism in Metaphysics?

Contemporary debates regarding nominalism are troubled by terminological obstacles. Typically, nominalism is understood as one of two theses: (1) nominalism about universals, which denies that such entities exist and holds instead that all entities are particulars or individuals; (2) nominalism about abstract entities, which denies that such entities exist and holds instead that there are only concrete entities. On some views, (2) entails (1) since universals are properly categorized as abstract rather than concrete. For example, some views take universals to be eternal, non-spatiotemporal, necessarily existing entities and therefore categorize universals as abstract rather than concrete (see Bealer 1993 and Jubien 2001). Others reject this view about the location and necessity of universals and instead hold universals to be concrete entities. In light of the resulting complexity, we will, at key points in what follows, separately examine nominalism about universals and nominalism about abstract entities since the debate over these nominalist theses can differ significantly. For instance, a familiar motivation for nominalism about universals is a metaphysical concern about the possibility of entities being wholly shareable by distinct material objects. In contrast, objections against abstract entities like sets or propositions are unlikely to concern shareability. Instead, arguments for nominalism about abstract entities are often motivated by the fact that such entities are alleged to exist outside space or time and are therefore mysterious or unknowable. Despite these differences, nominalist opposition to universals or abstract entities often significantly overlaps.

Since the rejection of abstract entities and the rejection of universals are related but separable concerns, we begin by discussing each of these two strands of nominalism. In each case, we assume that nominalism is a thesis regarding the existence of entities. An alternative approach to understanding nominalism holds it to concern fundamentality rather than existence. On this alternative way of understanding nominalism, it is the denial that universals or abstract entities are fundamental entities. Conversely, anti-nominalism, when so understood, is the thesis that such entities are fundamental. Although matters of fundamentality and metaphysical dependence are highly relevant to the debate over nominalism, we assume here that nominalism is specifically a thesis regarding existence rather than fundamentality. (On fundamentality and ontological disagreement, see Cameron 2008, Schaffer 2009, Imaguire 2018, Schulte 2019, and Declos 2021.)

Alongside the above nominalist theses regarding universals and abstract entities, an influential thesis labelled as “nominalism” is defended by Nelson Goodman and draws upon preceding work in Leonard and Goodman 1940. Goodman’s version of nominalism asserts that all entities are “individuals” in the specific sense of being mereological atoms or constructed via mereology. As Goodman (1956: 25) notes, this version of nominalism is potentially compatible with the existence of certain sets or classes, but rejects any ontology of sets or classes which admits “the composition of more than one entity out of exactly the same entities by membership.” For this reason, Goodman’s nominalism is incompatible with standard versions of set theory which accept the construction or generation of sets in violation of classical extensional mereology (e.g., a hierarchy of pure sets constructed from a single empty or null set). (On this version of nominalism, see Cohnitz and Rossberg 2006, Oliver 1993, Eberle 1970, and Dummett 1956.) Despite receiving less attention than nominalism regarding universals or abstract entities, Goodman’s nominalism is comprehensive in its development and historically influential, receiving attention in Lewis 1991 (38–41).

This entry largely leaves aside discussion of views that find fault with both nominalism and anti-nominalism on metaontological grounds. For instance, we will not examine the relationship of nominalism with views like those of Carnap (1950) that reject the standard interpretation of ontological claims like “Numbers exist” or “There are no universals” assumed by most nominalists and anti-nominalists. For metaontological challenges to the standard conception of the debate over nominalism, see Balaguer 1998, Chalmers 2009, and Thomasson 2005.

1.1 Nominalism as the Rejection of Universals

Nominalism about universals is the thesis that there are no universals (see Armstrong 1978). While this sounds simple enough, the notion of a universal is complicated. To begin, we can introduce a separate notion of a qualitative nature, where such natures, if they exist, are responsible for the world’s qualitative variation and sameness. Consider, for example, a red apple and a green avocado. If there are qualitative natures, then the apple and the avocado have distinct color-relevant qualitative natures, one relevant to redness and one relevant to greenness. They also enjoy distinct texture-relevant qualitative natures, one relevant to smoothness and the other to bumpiness. Further examples are easy to generate, and, if there are qualitative natures, then there is potentially one for every possible qualitative classification.

Suppose that there are such entities as qualitative natures. Then the apple and the avocado each has a color-relevant one. Moreover, the apple’s color-relevant qualitative nature is numerically distinct from the avocado’s. Now consider a second apple of exactly the same shade of red as the first apple. By stipulation, the first apple’s color-relevant qualitative nature is qualitatively identical to the second apple’s color-relevant qualitative nature, insofar as both apples resemble exactly in color. But is the first apple’s color-relevant qualitative nature also numerically identical to that of the second apple? Or are qualitative natures the kind of entity that cannot be in more than one spatial location or “inhere” in more than one object at the same time?

This final question is helpful for understanding the debate over universals: can a single qualitative nature be in more than one location (or inhere in more than one object or enjoy more than one instance) at the same time? If one answers affirmatively, then one likely accepts universals. If one answers negatively, then the resulting view will likely fall into one of two further camps. First, if one accepts the presupposition that there are qualitative natures but denies that they can be in more than one location or object or instance at a time, one likely rejects universals while accepting what are usually called tropes. A trope is a particular (i.e., non-universal) qualitative nature. That is, the whole qualitative nature is not in multiple places or shared by multiple disjoint individuals at the same time. For most theorists, tropes are specific to their location, or even to their bearer (Williams 1953, Campbell 1990, Maurin 2002, and Fisher 2020; see the entry on tropes). Others allow wholly multi-located tropes (Ehring 2011), or shared tropes, so long as one of the sharing bearers is a part of the other, as when an apple and its skin share a redness trope (Giberman 2022b). Alternatively, if one denies the presupposition that there are any qualitative natures, one likely rejects both universals and tropes and instead accepts what we will call strict nominalism about properties. Strict nominalists deny that any kind of special metaphysical posits are needed to explain the world’s qualitative variety. Instead, strict nominalism holds that the phenomenon of qualitative variety is reducible to facts about entities other than qualitative natures, for example, to material objects, sets of material objects, mereological sums of material objects, or linguistic-cognitive facts (see Quine 1948, Sellars 1963, Lewis 1983, Effingham 2020).

When nominalism is understood as the rejection of universals, it is regularly assumed that trope theory (and, of course, strict nominalism) qualify as nominalist views. Since universals are wholly shareable entities (the whole universal may be shared by disjoint bearers), the case for nominalism about universals is often premised upon this controversial feature. Arguments against nominalism about universals frequently concern distinctive properties relevant to their putative shareability that are ascribed to them by competing accounts of universals—e.g., their alleged lack of spatiotemporal location or the alleged possibility of being wholly located in multiple places at the same time. Nominalists about universals often seek to avoid these commitments when assigning entities the general theoretical role of “property.” Nominalism-friendly candidates for that role include tropes; sets, pluralities, or fusions of tropes; and sets, pluralities, or fusions of material objects. Such entities are compatible with nominalism about universals, since they avoid commitment to the existence of wholly multiply located or non-spatial qualitative natures. They are, however, potentially incompatible with nominalism about abstract entities depending upon the assumed understanding of “abstract entity.” For example, theories that accept nominalism regarding universals in part by identifying properties with sets of tropes risk violating nominalism about abstract entities by virtue of accepting the existence of sets, which are standardly categorized as abstract entities (see, e.g., Ehring 2011).

Despite the unwelcome complexity, understanding the debate over nominalism and universals requires carefully distinguishing universals from non-universals (or ‘particulars’), without identifying the concept of a universal with the concept of a qualitative nature. This leaves open the difficult question of what features distinguish universals from non-universals. Various proposals have been advanced. Universals have been claimed to be distinctive insofar as they are predicable (i.e., they can be true or false of something: Carmichael 2010), multiply located (i.e., they can be wholly located in distinct regions of space at the same time: Armstrong 1978, Lewis 1986: 83, Giberman 2022a), multiply instantiable (i.e., they can be had by distinct entities: Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 2003), subject to the principle of the identity of indiscernibles (Wisdom 1934, Williams 1986, Ehring 2004, 2011), being the fundamental explanans of qualitative similarity (Armstrong 1978) or serving as the semantic value of qualitative predication (van Inwagen 2004). Despite these theoretical options for distinguishing universals from particulars, there is no consensus as to which, if any, of the suggested distinguishing criteria of universality listed above is the correct one. For instance, while some posit universals and assert that they are multiply located, rival theories of universals hold that they are ante rem entities that lack any spatiotemporal location whatsoever. This has led some philosophers to doubt that there is any such criterion (Ramsey 1925, MacBride 2005).

In summary, precisely characterizing nominalism about universals is controversial, since the precise characterization of universals is controversial. Clarity can be gained by focusing on the concept of qualitative nature, when understood as a concept neutral between theories that accept universals and theories that accept tropes. As we have also seen, nominalism regarding universals may sometimes be used in the “strict” sense above, according to which there are no such entities as qualitative natures regardless of whether they are universals, tropes, or various constructions from such entities. There are many interesting versions of strict nominalism in the literature, including some that have been newly developed or recently defended. Section 4 surveys several nominalist strategies for addressing the metaphysics of qualitative natures.

1.2 Nominalism as the Rejection of Abstract Entities

In their influential discussion of nominalism, Quine and Goodman (1947: 105) begin as follows: “We do not believe in abstract entities. No one supposes that abstract entities—classes, relations, properties, etc.—exist in space-time; but we mean more than this. We renounce them altogether.” While the respective views of Quine and Goodman would subsequently change, this early discussion helped popularize a conception of nominalism that is not tied to the rejection of universals but instead to the more general rejection of abstract entities where this category is usually taken to include numbers, classes, properties, propositions, and several other kinds of entities such as linguistic types, biological kinds, and fictional characters. Although Quine and Goodman explicitly refuse to provide a positive argument against abstract entities in their paper, ontological suspicions regarding such entities are regularly encountered: abstract entities seem markedly unlike ordinary concrete entities, and, in the case of classes or numbers, a commitment to their existence is a commitment to infinitely many imperceptible entities outside space and perhaps outside time. Overviews of the case for nominalism and metaphysical worries about abstract entities can be found in Burgess and Rosen 1997 (3–66), Szabó 2003, Cowling 2017, and Liggins 2023. Also see the entry on abstract objects.

The abstract-concrete distinction that separates entities and structures the debate over this version of nominalism is often held to be an exclusive and exhaustive distinction that partitions all of reality (see Hale 1988 and Grossman 1992: 7). Mathematical entities like the number seven or the Pythagorean theorem serve as paradigm examples of abstract entities and ordinary objects like tables and tap shoes are paradigm examples of concrete entities. In turn, entities are often assumed to have their abstract or concrete status permanently and necessarily (see Melia 2008a: 146, but cf. Williamson 2010 and Linsky and Zalta 1996). Although the concept of an abstract (or concrete) entity can be adopted as a primitive notion, philosophers have more usually sought to provide an analysis of what it is for an entity to be abstract (or concrete). And, given the assumed exclusiveness and exhaustiveness of the distinction, an analysis of either the concept abstract entity or concrete entity would suffice for defining the complementary concept. (On alleged features of the abstract-concrete distinction, see Cowling 2017: 70–74.)

Lewis (1986: 81–86) summarizes several approaches for understanding the abstract-concrete distinction and applies each to his modal realist theory of possible worlds. His influential discussion makes evident that there are a considerable variety of non-equivalent conceptions of the abstract-concrete distinction. Of these, two have been especially influential and warrant brief summary.

According to the spatiotemporal approach, the distinction between abstract and concrete entities should be understood in terms of spatial or spatiotemporal location: abstract entities lack locations, while concrete entities have them. With regard to our paradigm examples, this approach renders a plausible verdict: numbers do not seem to be anywhere (even if inscriptions that name them are), and pieces of furniture surely seem to be located in spacetime. As we move beyond paradigm cases, tough questions multiply quickly. Are spacetime regions located at themselves, or are they abstract? Is the set that has Obama as a member, {Obama}, located where Obama is or nowhere at all? What of views on which universals are wholly located where they are instantiated? And, when we turn to more controversial cases, it is far from clear that this approach offers any useful guidance. For instance, while Hamlet and Hamlet do not seem to have spatial locations, they do seem to have come into existence around 1600. Might they have temporal but not spatial locations? And what would that fact mean for their status as abstract or concrete entities? Additional challenges for this approach revolve around the case of souls or deities that are purported to exist outside space or time. On most views, such entities are not plausibly included in the category of abstract entity, especially given relationships they are thought to bear to concrete reality. (On spatial and spatiotemporal approaches, see Hale 1988, Lowe 1995, and Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 2003.)

According to a competing causal approach, the distinction between abstract and concrete entities should be understood in terms of causal interaction: abstract entities do not causally interact with anything, but concrete entities do (or at least can). Tables and chairs are created, destroyed, reflect photons, and stub toes; numbers do none of these things. Like the spatiotemporal approach, the causal approach faces difficult questions when we seek answers regarding the abstract/concrete status of non-paradigm cases. If musical works and works of fiction are created by humans, then how could they be abstract entities given this causal approach? If properties are abstract entities, then how can properties like being fragile occupy causal roles in our theories? Could there be what Forrest (1982) calls an epiphenomenalon, a concrete entity which essentially stands in no causal relations whatsoever? Some of these questions clearly require us to provide a fully-fledged theory of causal interaction, but others seem to suggest that the abstract-concrete division is not ultimately a causal one. (See entry on objects.)

Alternative approaches for analyzing the abstract-concrete distinction draw upon the above features—e.g., by taking abstract entities to be essentially non-spatiotemporal—or require altogether different resources—e.g., by holding abstract entities to lack certain kinds of qualitative or intrinsic properties (see Cowling 2017: 74–92, and Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 2003: 46–52). There remains no uncontroversial way to draw the abstract-concrete distinction, but the consequences of nominalism regarding abstract entities depend directly upon the correct account of the distinction. For example, if abstract entities are held to be distinctively non-spatiotemporal, nominalism proves equivalent to the thesis that reality is entirely spatiotemporal.

As Quine and Goodman’s remark above makes clear, the truth of nominalism about abstract entities promises to have a significant impact on a wide range of metaphysical projects. For instance, if there are no such things as linguistic types and there are only specific concrete inscriptions, how can we provide general theories of semantics or syntax? After all, our talk about the word “moose” and its meaning appear to be about the type “moose”, not any specific token. This worry points toward difficult questions about what exactly types are and whether they are abstract rather than concrete. (On types, see Wetzel 2009, Dodd 2000, and entry on types and tokens.) If nominalism about abstract entities does require that we do without types, how can we truthfully speak of the common housecat, the Nanaimo Bar, or the foxtrot? Similar issues have been raised regarding a broad variety of entities, each of which have been alleged to be abstract rather than concrete: numbers, sets, functions, directions, propositions, meanings, properties, kinds, possibilities, possible worlds, fictional works, fictional characters, musical works, events, states of affairs, and many more besides.

If the just-listed entities are indeed abstract, then nominalism about abstract entities would seem to be of profound philosophical significance. Aesthetic theories cannot truly ascribe properties to fictional or musical works. Ethical theories cannot evaluate the moral properties of events, states of affairs, or types of events. Epistemological theories cannot correctly describe our justification for believing propositions or accurately enumerate possibilities involving skeptical scenarios. And so on across philosophy. To be sure, some philosophers are content to assume anti-nominalism and other philosophers hold the fate of their preferred theories to be somehow independent of the debate over abstract entities. But most nominalists take the nonexistence of abstract entities to have far-reaching implications for the kinds of theories we can reasonably accept. Precisely which theories are ruled out by nominalism will, as noted above, depend upon the correct account of the abstract-concrete distinction.

Since the abstract-concrete distinction is controversial, nominalists who rely upon it to formulate their metaphysical theories face an important challenge. They must provide a principled defense for drawing the abstract-concrete distinction in the first place. This is because it is open to metaphysicians to reject the distinction as a mandatory commitment and deny that it usefully or accurately categorizes entities. For example, in evaluating the view that ordinary objects are set-theoretic constructions, Sider (2013: 287) asserts that the abstract-concrete distinction is not a mandatory theoretical commitment but is instead eliminable if it proves to be theoretically useless or unhelpfully obscure. If our balance of evidence suggests we are best served to dispense with this distinction, nominalists would seem to be obliged to abandon their central thesis or instead to reformulate it, perhaps as a series of specific prohibitions against positing numbers, properties, propositions, and so on.

2. Arguments for Nominalism in Metaphysics

Why accept nominalism and thereby reject the existence of universals or abstract entities? In this section, we consider the case for each version of nominalism, beginning with the case of nominalism about abstract entities. According to Goodman and Quine (1943: 105), their commitment to this form of nominalism “is based on a philosophical intuition that cannot be justified by appeal to anything more ultimate.” Few philosophers have been content to accept this foundationalist rationale for nominalism about abstract entities. (Quine and Goodman subsequently revised their increasingly divergent views on nominalism. See Goodman 1956 and Quine 2008.) In place of a dogmatic insistence on the truth of nominalism, a range of arguments have been mounted that either identify significant problems with anti-nominalism or purport to show that nominalist alternatives are ultimately preferable.

2.1 Causal Arguments for Nominalism

Perhaps the most influential arguments in defense of nominalism are those premised upon the allegedly non-causal nature of paradigmatic abstract entities like numbers and sets. The locus classicus is Benacerraf 1973, which poses an epistemic challenge for anti-nominalist theories: to account for justified beliefs about mathematical entities in the absence of causal interaction between believers and mathematical entities. This challenge stems from the apparently non-causal nature of abstract entities and an allegedly causal dimension of epistemic justification. As Benacerraf remarks, “a typical ‘standard’ account (at least in the case of number theory or set theory) will depict truth conditions in terms of conditions on objects whose nature, as normally conceived, places them beyond the reach of the better understood means of human cognition (e.g., sense perception and the like)” (p. 668). Benacerraf’s initial presentation of the epistemic argument remains influential; however, Field (1980, 1989) offers an alternative formulation and defense of the causal-epistemic argument in support of nominalism. Field’s version of the argument is premised, not upon a causal constraint on justification, but on an allegedly insurmountable problem for anti-nominalists: to explain plausibly the justified mathematical beliefs we take mathematicians and others to possess in the absence of a causal relationship between epistemic agents and mathematical reality. (On causal-epistemic arguments, see Cheyne 1998, Nutting 2020, Liggins 2010, Sjölin Wirling forthcoming.)

Causal-epistemic arguments hinge upon whether anti-nominalists can account for our knowledge of abstract entities if such entities are indeed non-causal and therefore not epistemically accessible through ordinary means. Subsequent discussions of anti-nominalist epistemology have sought to provide a credible account of our awareness of abstract entities and our justified beliefs regarding them (see Chudnoff 2012, Bengson 2015, Lewis 1986: 108–115, and Clarke-Doane 2017). As some have noted, a parallel issue arises if we assume causal interaction is necessary for semantic relations like reference between speakers and abstract entities like numbers. This parallel causal-semantic version of the above argument against abstract entities is more usually mentioned than defended, however (see Jubien 1977, Lear 1977, and Davies 2019).

A different causation-based argument for nominalism relies upon a metaphysical thesis, sometimes called the Eleatic Principle or Alexander’s Dictum, according to which entities must stand in causal relations or be causally active in order to exist (see Oddie 1982 and Colyvan 1998). Granted this controversial thesis as well as the essentially non-causal nature of abstract entities, nominalism would seem to follow. Versions of anti-nominalism that claim fictional characters, musical works, types, and other apparently created entities are abstract are significantly less likely to grant that abstract entities are essentially non-causal, given the causal character of creation. Anti-nominalist views about these kinds of entities are diverse, however, with some asserting they are abstract yet, unlike mathematical entities, nevertheless able to stand in causal relations (see Caplan and Matheson 2006, Mag Uidhir 2013, and Friedell 2020).

2.2 Other Arguments for Nominalism

Other arguments against abstract entities seek to show that nominalist theories are stronger, better justified, or otherwise more virtuous than anti-nominalist competitors. These arguments are dependent upon the specific content of nominalist and anti-nominalist rivals, but the most familiar arguments are premised upon ontological parsimony—roughly speaking, nominalists believe in fewer entities than anti-nominalists and hold that, other things being equal, we ought to prefer simpler theories to less simple alternatives. This parsimony-driven defense of nominalism assumes that parsimony is a theoretical virtue, which makes belief in certain theories better justified (see Parsons 1976, Nolan 1999, and Bricker 2020). For this line of argument to succeed, dispensing with ontological commitment to abstract entities must not require excessive theoretical vices like undue complexity in formulation, additional primitive notions, or other significant theoretical costs. Additionally, as Melia (2008b) notes, the option of dispensing with abstract entities is only one way to secure ontological simplicity. For example, an alternative would be to dispense with concrete entities and develop a Pythagorean metaphysics of exclusively abstract entities. This illustrates how the evaluation of theories occurs in a complex and interconnected way where additional virtues like conservativeness—roughly, conformity with extant commitments—play an under-recognized role.

Another family of arguments sometimes held to favor nominalism about abstract entities stems from worries about indeterminacy or non-uniqueness that result from positing abstract entities in our mathematical, semantic, or metaphysical theories. As Benacerraf (1965) argues, some anti-nominalist accounts of mathematics face a serious challenge: how to choose from among incompatible yet equally plausible candidate reductions of arithmetical notions like natural number to set theory. For example, should we accept the account that identifies the number two with the set {{0}} in one sequence or with {0,{0}} in a different yet equally viable sequence? Roughly speaking, anti-nominalists seem required to either privilege a unique set-theoretic reduction without principled reasons or instead accept that certain theoretical notions like natural number are surprisingly indeterminate in meaning. As subsequent commentators have noted, a parallel non-uniqueness problem arises when providing a theory of propositions or properties in terms of set theory. Additional versions of the problem have been alleged to arise when anti-nominalists accept ontologically rich conceptions of properties (see Moore 1999, Caplan and Tillman 2013, Melia 1992). In addition, Field (1980: ii) suggests that worries about the “desirability of eliminating certain sorts of ‘arbitrariness’ or ‘conventional choice’” are quite general and serve as important motivations for nominalism. The non-uniqueness problem has prompted the development of certain structuralist approaches to the philosophy of mathematics. While some of these are nominalist in character, other anti-nominalist versions hold structures to be abstract entities (see Chihara 2004, Shapiro 1997, Resnik 1981, Hellman 1989, and the entry on structuralism in the philosophy of mathematics).

Despite the fact that some philosophers hold our thought and talk about possibilities to require a commitment to possibilities as abstract entities, modal considerations have also been used to support the case for nominalism. For example, Humeans about modality reject necessary connections between distinct entities, and, for most anti-nominalists, commitment to properties, propositions, or mathematical entities specifically require such connections. (On Humeanism, see Lewis 1986, Wilson 2015, Nolan 1996.) For instance, on a standard anti-nominalist view, the truth of certain claims about individuals and properties is analyzed in terms of the instantiation of properties. For instance, if May is human, then, according to the proposed anti-nominalist analysis, May must instantiate being human. Such an analysis, in turn, entails additional claims about properties—e.g., that, if May is human, then May instantiates the property having some property or other and that being human instantiates the property being a property. Anti-nominalist analyses of this sort often connect properties with propositions. So, in our present example, if May is human, then the proposition that May is human must exist and instantiate the property being true. Necessary connections among properties and propositions are standard features of these kinds of metaphysical analyses and, for this reason, a commitment to Humeanism is in tension with those theories committed to abstract entities that stand in such metaphysically necessary relationships.

Modality-based arguments against anti-nominalist theories have also been advanced with weaker assumptions and without a dependence upon Humeanism. For instance, Dorr (2008) notes that anti-nominalists are obliged to accept a vast number of “brute necessities” if abstract entities are to play their required theoretical role. (Unlike Humeanism, this stricture against brute necessities is potentially consistent with necessary connections between entities.) A prohibition against admitting brute necessities into our theories has therefore been cited as a reason to reject anti-nominalism. Brute necessities also play a key role in an argument Lewis (1986: 174–191) offers against certain anti-nominalist theories of possible worlds—views he describes as forms of “magical ersatzism.” Whether Lewis’s argument against magical ersatzism can be deployed against some or perhaps all other abstract entities remains unclear, but van Inwagen (1986) discusses the application of this modality-driven argument to the case of sets (see Nolan 2020 and Himelright 2023). An additional modal challenge for anti-nominalism arises in explaining the distinctive necessary existence of abstract entities–e.g., precisely why they are necessary rather than contingent beings. See Rosen 2002 on whether anti-nominalism is more plausibly viewed as a contingent or necessary thesis.

Immediately after their bold proclamation that the justification of nominalism requires no further support, Quine and Goodman suggest that the case for nominalism can be “fortified” by other considerations. Specifically, they say that “what seems to be the most natural principle for abstracting classes or properties leads to paradoxes” and “[e]scape from these paradoxes can apparently be effected only by recourse to alternative rules whose artificiality and arbitrariness arouse suspicion that we are lost in a world of make-believe” (1943: 105). This remark makes salient the threat of paradox that looms in the development of formal theories regarding mathematical entities like classes as well as properties, propositions, and others (see entry on Russell’s Paradox). Nominalist alternatives to set theory premised upon mereology are notable responses to such paradoxes (for discussion, see entry on Stanisław Leśniewski). In addition to the worry that specific theories regarding abstract entities like classes or properties might succumb to paradox, there is the further worry that the interaction of certain independently plausible anti-nominalist theories might lead to paradox—e.g., Kaplan’s Paradox, which involves set theory and its interaction with the metaphysics of propositions and possibilities (Kaplan 1995). While worries about paradox might militate against specific theories of sets, properties, propositions, and so on, there is little compelling evidence that it is the abstractness of the relevant entities that makes them endemically or unavoidably paradoxical. Nor is the formal character of the relevant theories plausibly thought to be the unique source of difficulty. For instance, F.H. Bradley’s influential regress argument threatens to show that certain conceptions of properties, facts, or states of affairs yield vicious, infinite explanatory regresses, but Bradley-style arguments have been deployed against anti-nominalist theories that are largely informal in their presentation and development (see Bradley 1893 and the entry on Bradley’s regress). It seems, then, the allegedly “fortifying” considerations mentioned by Quine and Goodman do little to constitute a general case against the existence of abstract entities.

3. Arguments against Nominalism in Metaphysics

Arguments for anti-nominalism purport to establish the existence of abstract entities or universals. In doing so, they raise (at least) two kinds of questions. The first kind of question concerns ontological commitments—roughly, whether numbers, universals, fictional works, and so on exist. The second kind of question concerns categoreal commitments—roughly, whether or not the relevant entities are correctly categorized as abstract rather than concrete. We considered the latter issue in Section One and noted the controversy about how to distinguish between abstract and concrete entities. (A parallel issue was also seen to arise for nominalism regarding universals in distinguishing universals from particulars.) Since answers to these ontological and categoreal questions are separable, nominalists can reject anti-nominalist alternatives in either of two ways: they can deny the ontological component, which asserts that entities of a certain sort exist, or they can deny the categoreal component, according to which the relevant entities are abstract or universal. This section sets aside potential categoreal disagreements and surveys arguments offered in defense of the existence of abstract entities and universals.

There are many ways to partition the field of anti-nominalist arguments. One way to do so begins by dividing semantic anti-nominalist arguments, which proceed on the basis of facts about meaning and reference, from alethic anti-nominalism arguments, which are premised upon the truth of claims that apparently involve abstract entities. A direct semantic argument for anti-nominalism asserts that sentences like ‘Seven is an even number’ is meaningful and that terms like “the Pythagorean Theorem”, “Superman”, or “Piano Sonata in B Minor” refer to or express abstract entities and, given these semantic facts, the existence of abstract entities follows as a consequence. Such arguments have the virtue of not presupposing specific claims about, say, mathematics, but nevertheless depend upon the relevant semantic theses about reference or meaning and their connection to ontology. More frequently, however, anti-nominalists develop their case for abstract entities on alethic grounds by observing the acceptability and apparent truth of the following kinds of claims:

(1)
Seven is a prime number.
(2)
The Pythagorean Theorem is more familiar than its converse.
(3)
Superman was created after Liszt’s Piano Sonata in B Minor.

Alethic arguments proceed from the truth of sentences like (1)–(3) plus an additional principle that links the truth of these claims to the existence of the abstract entities that are their apparent subject matter. A variety of principles have been proposed to play this linking role and thereby support the anti-nominalist conclusion. We will briefly note three broad approaches to providing such a principle, which we will group as Fregean, truthmaker-based, and Quinean.

The Fregean approach invokes a thesis about the linguistic category of terms like “seven”, “The Pythagorean Theorem”, and “Superman” in sentences like (1)–(3) and notes that in such cases these expressions function as singular terms. So, given the truth of such claims, the existence of the number seven, the Pythagorean Theorem, and Superman is held to follow. This broad approach, inspired by Frege (1884), takes questions about the existence of entities to be properly answered by determining whether they are the referents of singular terms in true sentences. Discussing the argument for the existence of numbers in Frege 1884, Hale (1996: 438) summarizes this argument schema as follows: “statements of the kind in question… are to be regarded as involving expressions… functioning as singular terms; thus, since the function of a singular term is precisely to effect reference to an object, the truth of those statements requires the existence of the objects to which the expressions refer.” The existence of the number seven is therefore a consequence of the truth of (1) and the linguistic category of the term “seven” as it occurs within (1). Importantly, this approach holds that the notion of object is conceptually connected with the semantics and syntax of certain expressions and that truth is a guide to ontological fact. (On Fregean arguments for abstract entities, see Wright 1983, Rosen 1993, and MacBride 2003.)

Truthmaker-based approaches discern the ontological consequences of sentences like (1)–(3) by asking what entity (or entities) serve as their truthmaker(s). On this approach, the truthmaking relation is a distinctive one that holds between sentences or propositions, on the one hand, and entities like facts, states of affairs, or objects on the other. (On truthmaker theory, see Armstrong 2004 and the entry on truthmakers. On truthmaking and nominalism, see Armstrong 1997: 115, Melia 2005, and Asay 2020: 175–197.) The extraction of ontological commitments via truthmaker theory crucially depends upon the details of the relevant theory of truthmakers and truthmaking rather than the semantics or syntax of claims like (1)–(3). For instance, some truthmaker theorists hold the sentence ‘Socrates is a human’ has as its truthmaker a fact or state of affairs involving Socrates and the property being human. Contrasting truthmaker approaches instead hold that neither facts, states of affairs, or properties are required by the truth of ‘Socrates is human’; it requires instead tropes or perhaps only the existence of Socrates as he actually is as a truthmaker. Along with differing general approaches to truthmaking, the precise truthmaker posited for a sentence is regularly a matter of controversy. The truthmaker approach for defending anti-nominalism will hold that, without abstract entities like seven, the Pythagorean Theorem, and Superman, we cannot plausibly account for the truth of claims like (1)–(3). If, however, truthmaker theorists can supply an account of truthmaking that identifies viable, nominalist-friendly truthmakers for claims like (1)–(3), nominalists are in a position to resist a truthmaker-based argument for anti-nominalism.

The Quinean approach supplements the truth of claims (1)–(3) with a criterion of ontological commitment, which provides a method for determining what entities must exist if such claims are true. Roughly speaking, the Quinean criterion takes the ontological commitments of a sentence to be the values of the variables that fall within the scope of the quantifiers of the sentence when translated into first-order logic as part of a theory. Where truthmaker-based arguments depend upon a background theory of truthmaking, arguments of this sort hinge upon a distinctive role for quantifiers and variables as means of discerning the commitments of theories (see Quine 1948 and the relevant sections of the entry on ontological commitment). For instance, the sentence “Socrates is human” would be translated as “∃x Socratizes(x) & Is-Human(x)” and thus any theory in which “Socrates is human” occurs is ontologically committed to something that is Socrates by virtue of the variable bound by the existential quantifier ranging over a domain that includes such an entity. The Quinean criterion for ontological commitment provides a highly specific answer to questions regarding the ontological commitments of sentences; however, the Quinean criterion leaves open which theories to accept as well as the proper regimentation of theories and their constituent sentences. As we will see below, some nominalist responses to Quinean arguments proceed by denying that claims like (1)–(3) are properly regimented in ways that require quantification over putatively abstract entities.

In developing arguments for anti-nominalism, Quine’s criterion of ontological commitment is widely adopted; however, Quine pairs his deployment of the criterion with a more general commitment to the thesis of ontological naturalism, according to which our best, mature scientific theories are the proper arbiters of what sentences we ought to accept. In turn, these theories are our best guides to what exists. The conjunction of Quine’s criterion and ontological naturalism along with the apparent indispensability of mathematical entities for our best physical theories is the basis of what is often-called the Quine-Putnam indispensability argument for mathematical realism. This argument has been the subject of intense interest in the philosophy of mathematics (see Quine 1970, Putnam 1971, Colyvan 2001 and entry on Indispensability Arguments in the Philosophy of Mathematics). Many who reject ontological naturalism nevertheless rely upon Quine’s criterion in order to determine what the ontological commitments of true sentences might be. Quine’s criterion is therefore a premise in various arguments for different kinds of abstract entities. For instance, Quine’s criterion would seem to suggest that, despite the fact that (3) is not part of any scientific theory, its truth requires the existence of fictional characters and musical works provided that one accepts that (3) ought to regimented in a manner that requires quantification over entities that have the property of being Superman or being Liszt’s Piano Sonata in B Minor.

The arguments above proceed from the truth of claims that apparently express or refer to abstract entities. Other anti-nominalist arguments focus on the explanatory role of abstract entities or universals as theoretical posits. Explanatory or abductive arguments for anti-nominalism aim to show that theories committed to the existence of abstract entities provide the best or perhaps the only viable explanations of certain phenomena. Generally speaking, anti-nominalist theories enjoy an advantage in simplicity of formulation even if they require the existence of abstract entities. In contrast, nominalist theories often seek to replace or translate claims like (1)–(3) into claims that make no reference to (and therefore require no quantification over) abstract entities. Focus on explanatory considerations in ontology has brought questions about theoretical virtues and their correct application to the forefront of metaphysical debate, while raising broader concerns about the (dis)analogies between metaphysical posits like properties or propositions and scientific posits like electrons or genes. (On theoretical virtues, see Schindler 2018 and Nolan 1999.)

Explanatory anti-nominalist arguments are wide-ranging. For example, arguments for the existence of propositions allege that theories without such entities are incapable of suitably explaining semantic phenomena like meaning, linguistic practices like translation, or cognitive phenomena like belief and doubt (see Church 1951). Parallel arguments for anti-nominalist views about possible worlds hold that we cannot satisfactorily explain our modal reasoning or the content of our counterfactual thought and talk without positing such entities. Additional arguments hold that our best theories of laws of nature require commitment to universals and relations among universals, which some hold to be abstract entities (see, e.g., Armstrong 1982 and Tooley 1977). Other anti-nominalist arguments in the philosophy of art claim that we cannot account for the phenomena of musical appreciation or authentic performance without commitment to the existence of musical works (see Dodd 2000). In advancing an argument for properties, propositions, and other entities, the remarks of Church (1951: 104) are representative of explanatory anti-nominalist efforts: “To those who find forbidding the array of abstract entities and principles concerning them which is here proposed, I would say that the problems which give rise to [an anti-nominalist theory] are difficult and a simpler theory is not known to be possible.” Although propositions, properties, and possible worlds are familiar posits of philosophical theories, the breadth and power of explanatory anti-nominalist arguments is significantly increased if the pervasive reference to and theorizing about entities like linguistic types, biological kinds, and chemical properties like malleability is best understood as abstract discourse. On such a view, our commitments to abstract entities are exceptionally broad in scope. (For a remarkable catalogue of the deployment of types in various contexts, see Wetzel 2009: 3–21.)

4. Nominalist Strategies

Those who accept nominalism about abstract entities and hold that entities like propositions, fictional entities, and numbers would be properly categorized as abstract are in the difficult situation of having to do without them. Nominalists of this kind must therefore find a way to make sense of the apparent meaningfulness and apparent truth of our thought and talk as in claims like (1)–(3) above. This section provides an overview of what can be seen as the positive component of nominalist metaphysical theories.

We divide our survey of nominalist strategies by first considering general strategies—roughly, strategies that are applicable to a variety of domains that apparently concern abstract entities like mathematical entities, propositions, musical works, types, or other kinds. We then consider property-theoretic strategies, which are specifically aimed at accounting for property-theoretic phenomena like similarity, predication, and other matters linked to qualitative natures. Although some general strategies can be applied to the property-theoretic domain, nominalist approaches within metaphysics have often focused specifically on the case of properties. For this reason, a variety of distinctive proposals regarding our thought and talk about properties have been developed. The aim of the remaining two sections is therefore to introduce a very broad range of nominalist theories within metaphysics.

4.1 General Nominalist Strategies

Suppose that we accept nominalism about abstract entities and also hold that some category of entities, Fs, would be properly categorized as abstract. It follows that, on our view, there are no Fs. How, then, can we make sense of the apparent meaningfulness, truth, and usefulness of our thought and talk about Fs? As we noted in Section Three, claims such as (1)–(3) are often used to motivate a commitment to abstract entities. So, if nominalism about abstract entities is to prove an attractive metaphysical position, nominalists are obliged to explain how these claims might be (or merely appear to be) meaningful, true, and useful, given the nonexistence of their ostensible subject matter.

General nominalist strategies seek to provide an account of what we will call “abstract discourse”—roughly, theories or claims such as (1)–(3) that apparently refer to and quantify over entities like numbers, theorems, properties, fictional characters, and so on. Given their commitment to abstract entities, anti-nominalists are well positioned to treat abstract discourse as meaningful, intended literally, true, as well as ontologically committal. In contrast, nominalists must reject some component of the anti-nominalist stance toward abstract discourse. In cataloging various general nominalist strategies, we will leave aside certain approaches that eschew abstract entities, but involve even broader disagreements with anti-nominalists—e.g., idealism, solipsism, and certain forms of skepticism. (On anti-nominalism and idealism, see Hofweber 2016.)

Perhaps the most radical nominalist view of abstract discourse is non-cognitivism, according to which claims like (1)–(3) are without ordinary semantic content. Such a view enjoys little plausibility if we focus solely on the commonalities between abstract discourse and ordinary discourse. This is because (1)–(3) seem unexceptional when compared with parallel claims about concrete entities. There are, however, a range of instrumentalist views regarding our discourse about unobservable entities within scientific theories that, if otherwise defensible, would provide a precedent for accommodating abstract discourse. On these views, claims such as (1)–(3) have no descriptive semantic function and serve instead as “instruments” for systematizing our descriptive claims about concrete entities. Instrumentalist views of this kind have been specifically developed with regard to mathematical discourse and the avoidance of ontological commitment to mathematical entities (see Burgess 1983 and Leng 2010).

For nominalists who accept that abstract discourse has semantic content yet warrants a kind of non-literal construal, a different strategy is to deny that claims like (1)–(3) are typically used to assert their apparent semantic content and instead communicate metaphorical or figurative information. Such views acknowledge merely apparent commitment to numbers or propositions in claims like (1)–(3) but recast them as “representational aids” rather than entities named by singular terms. The taxonomy of strategies that rely on this approach is controversial. Moreover, several views about the content of abstract discourse may turn out to undermine the possibility of literally denying the existence of abstract entities, since attempts to assert the thesis of nominalism would be surreptitiously non-literal. Figuralist and fictionalist approaches of this sort, which seek to explain the representational contribution of abstract discourse as broadly metaphorical, remain actively debated. (For discussion, see Yablo 2002a, 2002b, 2005, and the entries on fictionalism and fictionalism in the philosophy of mathematics.)

For nominalists who grant that abstract discourse is meaningful and intended literally, a remaining alternative is to deny its truth. This strategy sets nominalism about abstract entities in apparent conflict with common sense, since nominalists must plausibly explain away the robust intuition that at least some claims like (1)–(3) are true.

An influential strategy for nominalists who take abstract discourse to be meaningful and intended literally is to hold that our alethic intuitions about claims like (1)–(3) are best explained in parallel to our intuitions that Sherlock Holmes is a detective or that Garfield is a cat. All such claims are false simpliciter yet true according to familiar and contextually salient fictions. (See, e.g., Field 1980 on mathematical entities and Rosen 1990 on possible worlds.) Although it is not true that Sherlock Holmes is a detective, the following claim is held to be true: according to the Sherlock Holmes stories, Sherlock Holmes is a detective. Once made explicit, speakers are inclined to recognize the distinction between these kinds of claims and the corresponding difference in their truth values. Moreover, for nominalists who accept this sort of fictionalist approach, the denial of claims like (1)–(3) can be paired with the claim that there are contextually salient “fictions” like arithmetic, property theory, or realism about propositions, any of which can be used to explain our apparent confidence in the truth of (1)–(3). Furthermore, the development and adoption of these fictions is explained by their expedience or value in reasoning about concrete entities. For instance, the development of a robust fiction regarding numbers or about a plurality of abstract possible worlds is of value precisely because it allows us to speak and reason in concise or powerful ways about a world of exclusively concrete entities.

In developing general nominalist strategies, efforts to provide “paraphrases” of abstract discourse play a significant but controversial role. For example, some nominalists have proposed that we ought to reject the following sort of claim as false given its ontological commitment to the number two:

(4)
Two is the number of solar gas giants.

At the same time, the nominalist who pursues this paraphrase strategy holds the following sentence, (5), to be true and lacking the ontological commitment of (4) to the abstract entity, the number two:

(5)
There is a solar gas giant x and a solar gas giant y and x is distinct from y and every solar gas giant is either identical to x or identical to y.

The final component of this paraphrase strategy holds that our ontological commitments are determined by nominalist-friendly sentences like (5) that serve as “replacements” of claims like (4). Importantly, if (4) and its replacement (5) are supposed to be synonymous, it is unclear how only one could be true or why the nominalist is obliged to accept only the ontological commitments of (5) rather than (4). If, however, the proffered replacement for (4) need not be synonymous, the nominalist who pursues this strategy must explain precisely why it is a satisfactory replacement that obviates the ontological commitments of (4). For these and other reasons, the role of paraphrase in ontological debates, especially those regarding abstract entities, remains a controversial topic in nominalist metaphysics (see Alston 1958, Keller 2015, von Solodkoff 2014, Melia 2000).

Burgess and Rosen (1997, 2005) draw an influential distinction among nominalist strategies which is useful for understanding the structure and aims of various approaches. They divide hermeneutic nominalists who hold that “nominalist disbelief in numbers and their ilk is in the fullest sense compatible with belief in current mathematics and science” (p. 7) from revolutionary nominalists who take as their goal “reconstruction or revision: the production of novel mathematical and scientific theories to replace current theories” (p. 6). (On this distinction, see Hellman 2001.) This distinction draws out a key question for would-be nominalists: how can we reconcile the nominalist rejection of abstract entities with the role abstract discourse plays in our best scientific theories? Broadly speaking, Burgess and Rosen’s revolutionary nominalist approaches seek to produce “novel theories by assigning novel meanings to the words of current theories” in order to “permit the nominalist to speak and write just like everyone else while doing mathematics or science” while, at the same time, providing a nominalistic reinterpretation of such claims “while doing philosophy” (p. 6). In contrast, their hermeneutic nominalist does not aim to produce anything novel by way of reconstrual or reinterpretation. Instead, the hermeneutic nominalist claims that nominalist theories are ultimately “an analysis of what really ‘deep down’ words of current theories have meant all along, despite appearances ‘on the surface’.” Producing comprehensive and satisfactory nominalist paraphrases is therefore a way to demonstrate that the apparent commitment of mathematics and science to abstract entities is merely apparent. Each stance takes the production of nominalist theories that avoid ontological commitment to abstract entities as significant; however, they differ over what the aim of these “nominalistic construals” ought to be (Burgess 1998, Leng 2010, Colyvan 2006).

Nominalists who accept what is often called Meinongianism aim to preserve abstract discourse and its truth but reject certain theses regarding language and ontology (see Routley 1980 [2018]: 14; and Priest 2005: vii, 134–155). For those who accept the Quinean view of ontological commitment, the domains of what there is and of what exists are coextensive, so, of necessity, there are no objects that do not exist (see the entry on ontological commitment). In opposition, Meinongians assert that there are objects that do not exist (see Meinong 1904 and Parsons 1980, and the entry on nonexistent objects). When implemented by nominalists, the Meinongian approach permits the positing of nonexistent entities as referents of singular terms and the values of variables and, in turn, upholds the truth of claims like (1)–(3) even while denying that abstract entities actually exist. The Meinongian tradition has received comparatively limited discussion as a specific tool for would-be nominalists. This is perhaps because nonexistent objects are subject to some of the same metaphysical objections as abstract entities.

It also remains contentious how to distinguish Meinongian approaches from other views that reject the Quinean criterion of ontological commitment. (For discussion, see Lewis 1990.) For example, Azzouni (2004, 2010) defends a non-Meinongian version of nominalism premised upon the rejection of Quinean views regarding ontological commitment. On the resulting view, only concrete objects really exist despite the apparent truth of claims within mathematics and fiction and the apparent reference to and quantification over numbers and fictional characters. In developing this view, Azzouni defends a distinction between the “quantifier commitments” and “existential commitments” of a theory. While claims like (1)–(3) are true and have numbers, theorems, and characters among their quantifier commitments, it is a further question whether such entities exist and what, if any, existential commitments and hence ontological consequences such claims have.

Related approaches posit distinct meanings of quantifiers and cognate expressions, only some of which are privileged for the purposes of ontology. So, if our concerns are metaphysical in kind (e.g., when we debate the existence of abstract entities), nominalists hold that claims like (1)–(3) prove false on this privileged interpretation. However, in ordinary contexts, claims like (1)–(3) are true and this is because of a non-ontologically-committing meaning associated with the relevant quantifiers and cognate expressions. Roughly speaking, when (1)–(3) are ordinarily used they incur no metaphysical consequences and are therefore consistent with the truth of nominalism. But, if asserted in metaphysical contexts and thus expressing their privileged, ontologically committal meanings, they are incompatible with nominalism and entail the truth of anti-nominalism (Hofweber 2005, Sider 2011, Dorr 2008, Korman 2015).

Our final general nominalist strategy requires no distinctive semantic machinery and seeks to uphold abstract discourse as meaningful, true, intended literally, and committed to no abstract entities. It is, however, the least specific in content and is closer to a promissory note in theory development or a disposition towards certain metaphysical options. According to what we will call concretism, the nominalist simply holds that, on the final analysis, any of the putatively abstract entities relevant to claims like (1)–(3) will turn out to be a concrete entity. Concretism obviously requires plausibly developing the relevant theories of numbers, properties, musical works, and so on. Generally speaking, however, the prospects for these views are likely to depend upon having a sufficiently expansive ontology of concrete entities or a sufficiently rich ideology of theoretical concepts. For example, modal realists like Lewis (1986) have sought to analyze discourse about possibilities via concrete entities in the form of a vast ontology of concrete, merely possible worlds. Subsequent efforts have sought to show that this ontology of concrete entities is sufficient for also providing a nominalist theory of some mathematical entities in terms of sums and pluralities of concrete entities and, potentially in turn, providing an account of properties and propositions (see Nolan 2002: 151–174). How concretism, when paired with realism about merely possible entities, ultimately compares to anti-nominalism is an open question.

4.2 Nominalist Accounts of Qualitative Natures

The preceding section considered how nominalists about abstract entities might develop theories in the absence of ontological commitment to numbers, propositions, fictionalia, and other putative abstracta. As we have noted, nominalists about universals are more specific in their exclusionary thesis: they reject universals, but they may nevertheless accept that there are properties and, on some views, the properties they posit the existence of are also abstract entities—e.g., tropes or sets of individuals. The debate between defenders of universals and competing theorists of qualitative natures is wide-ranging, but in this section we examine those versions of nominalism that reject qualitative natures altogether. As noted in Section One, we take such views to be versions of what we call “strict nominalism.”

Strict nominalists face an especially broad metaphysical challenge. The reason why is clear: what we will call “property discourse” is immensely wide-ranging. For it is intuitive to suppose that every object either qualitatively resembles or varies from every other. Correspondingly, everything seems to be a potential subject of descriptive classification. By contrast, it is certainly not intuitive to hold that every object is, say, mathematical, non-actual, fictional, or musical. Thus, while not everything is such that our discourse about it prima facie indicates that there are numbers or (mere) possibilities or creative works, plausibly everything is such that our discourse about it indicates that there are qualitative natures.

The key task for the strict nominalist, which will be the focus of this section, is to develop a strategy for explaining property discourse without invoking qualitative natures. The issue at hand concerns not just first-order predicative discourse like “That apple is red”, but also discourse about similarity between objects (“That apple and my house are both red”), explanatory discourse (“I bought the apples because they’re red”), and higher-order discourse about properties themselves (“Red is a color”), which can get increasingly complicated when descriptive designation and gradient similarity are invoked (“The color of Bob’s favorite fruit is more like the color of my most expensive possession than it is like the color of yours”). The challenge of accounting for such discourse has been cited by a variety of pro-qualitative-nature theorists as the basis for assessing the prospects of strict nominalism (see, for example, Jackson 1977, Armstrong 1978, Campbell 1990, and Yi 2018).

Of course, the breadth of the challenge does not by itself tell us whether it can be met, and strict nominalists have generated a rich variety of proposals for how to do so. Below we introduce several species of strict nominalism about properties, each of which eschew commitment to qualitative natures, and then briefly note the complexity involved in pairing them with the general nominalist strategies. The objective will be to supply an introductory glimpse of the issues, rather than an exhaustive guide.

Strict nominalisms about properties include austere, class, predicate, concept, resemblance, metalinguistic, causal, mereological, reistic, second-order, and grounding nominalism. The taxonomy of these positions is complicated, since some occupants of this theoretical space partially overlap and the relevant literature’s terminology is not uniform. The present survey is organized around the guiding question of whether the form of nominalism at hand supplies a stock of entities eligible to populate the extension of predicates like “property”, “feature”, and “attribute” although none of these views accept qualitative natures, understood as sui generis posits required to explain variety and resemblance (e.g. universals, tropes, or constructions therefrom).

We count five strict nominalisms as furnishing candidate members for the extension of “property”, while still eschewing qualitative natures. These are class, mereological, reistic, causal, and grounding nominalisms, respectively.

Class nominalism holds that the metaphysical structure of class membership is necessary and sufficient to explain the qualitative status of concrete particular objects, like apples and fire engines. (We assume here that “classes” and “sets” can be used interchangeably.) It says that properties are nothing more than classes of their instances, where “instances” of properties are concrete particular objects, not tropes. For example, the class nominalist holds that there is redness, but that it just is the class of red objects, or—on certain versions of the view—the class of metaphysically possible red objects (see Quinton 1957, Lewis 1983).

Other strict nominalisms focus not on classes of ordinary concrete particular objects, but on individual non-ordinary objects. According to mereological nominalism, properties are mereological fusions of their instances with “instances” understood as concrete particular objects, rather than tropes. On such a view, redness is the fusion of all (or all metaphysically possible (red)) stop signs, ripe strawberries, Santa suits, etc. (Zemach 1982, Effingham 2020). According to reistic nominalism, which is based on work by Franz Brentano, qualitative variation is metaphysically governed by spatially overlapping concrete particular objects of a much finer qualitatively classifiable grain than ordinary objects like apples (see Kriegel 2015 and the entry on reism). For example, the view distinguishes the-apple-qua-red from the-apple-qua-round, and holds that the existence of the former (but not the latter) explains that the apple is red.

Causal nominalism is the thesis that the existence and nature of properties is determined by particular concrete objects’ causal profiles (where causal profiles are not reified in any property realist sense), as opposed to those causal profiles being somehow explained by primitive qualitative natures (Whittle 2009; see also Tugby 2013). Precisely what kind of entity this view takes as the extension of “property” is an interesting question. What is clear is that the identity of an arbitrary property is determined by particular concrete objects’ causal profiles.

Grounding nominalism bases the nominalistic project on fundamentality rather than existence, contending that properties are derivative entities grounded in comparatively-more-fundamental concrete particular individuals (see Imaguire 2018 and Schulte 2019). Whether (and in what ways) the view thereby differs substantially from other forms of strict nominalism is an interesting open question. On one precisification, the relevant grounded entities just are qualitative natures, albeit non-fundamental ones, but other conceptually possible versions identify derivative properties with constructions from concrete particular objects.

Among those versions of strict nominalism that do not posit entities that serve as the extension of “property” and similar predicates are austere, predicate, concept, and metalinguistic nominalisms.

The key idea behind austere nominalism—sometimes called ‘ostrich’ nominalism (originally a pejorative jab by Armstrong 1978)—is that no underlying metaphysical structure is needed in order to explain that individuals are qualitatively classifiable, for example, that a stop sign or an apple is red, or that both are (equally) red (see Quine 1948, Devitt 1980, Van Cleve 1994, Parsons 1999, Imaguire 2014). In the standard austere case, this is in part because no metaphysical explanation whatsoever of qualitative classification is thought to be needed.

Predicate and concept nominalism assert that objects warrant qualitative classification just in case—and because—certain predicates or concepts, respectively, apply to them, where the relevant application conditions do not invoke any mind-independent entities that might play the role of a “property” (Searle 1969). The chief difference between these two versions of nominalism is that predicates are linguistic while concepts are mental. But both versions are typically taken to treat the metaphysics of properties as a mind-dependent issue, since predicates and concepts are both mind-dependent. (Note: Searle (1969) says that there are properties; however, he treats this as equivalent to holding that predicates have meanings.)

Metalinguistic nominalism (here following the terminology of Loux 2002) says that discourse seeming to refer to properties is best construed metalinguistically, as being about language itself (Carnap 1934, Sellars 1963). Roughly, an utterance of ‘the apple is red’ says not that the apple has some non-linguistic qualitative status, but rather that it (or perhaps the description ‘the apple’) is related in a certain way to the predicate ‘red.’ One useful upshot is an interesting paraphrase scheme for higher-order talk of properties, whereby, for example, ‘red is a color’ becomes a claim about ‘red’ being a color predicate. Predicate nominalism and metalinguistic nominalism overlap in certain ways, and the former can potentially be construed as a species of the latter although versions of these views (e.g. Searle 1969 and Sellars 1963) differ in significant details.

Resemblance and second-order nominalism are more complicated with respect to whether they provide entities as semantic values of “property.” Resemblance nominalism says that qualitative classification is governed by primitive resemblance facts (even if there is, strictly speaking, no resemblance relation), rather than resemblance being explanatorily dependent on qualitative natures (Rodriguez-Pereyra 2002). Thus the view can be developed to allow for entities that fall under the extension of “property”, namely, classes of concrete particular objects that satisfy the relevant resemblance conditions. Alternatively, since the view makes no special theoretical appeal to such classes, it can also be developed to eschew properties and “property” talk entirely.

Finally, second-order nominalism treats predication as its central concern in the metaphysics of properties and examines it through the lens of second-order quantification into predicate position (Jones 2018, Trueman 2020). (Note: “is” takes its predicative use in locutions like “x is F” throughout this paragraph.) Second-order nominalism says that if some first-order individual x is F (for some predicate “F”), then there is something Y, in the second-order sense of “there is”, such that: (i) x is Y, and (ii) whenever any first order individual z is Y, z is F (Jones 2018). The view is a version of strict nominalism insofar as it eschews qualitative natures, but it may be considered a kind of “nominalist realism”, following Jones 2018, depending on how one reads the existential commitments of second-order quantifiers. It may also count as allowing entities eligible to populate the extensions of some “property”-like higher-order predicates. It is a further question whether any such predicate may be more (or less) metaphysically perspicuous than English predicates like “property” and “attribute.”

As the above survey indicates, the emphasis and details of general nominalist strategies and property-specific versions of nominalism can vary substantially. Assessing the relationships between these kinds of views remains an area of significant further study for nominalists. It is tempting, for instance, to view strict nominalist theories which offer extensions for “property” like classes or mereological sums as well-positioned to pursue the “replacement” of discourse apparently about qualitative natures in ontologically leaner terms. Alternatively, more radical versions of strict nominalism, according to which there are no entities within the extension of “property”, may be easier to reconcile with general nominalist strategies on which much of our qualitative discourse is non-literal or figurative in character. We should be careful not to assume that these positions line up so conveniently, however. Quine, for example, was certainly not a fictionalist, figuralist, or non-cognitivist about qualitative predication, despite being the leading austere nominalist (Quine 1980). Among other things, the prospects for any such views will depend on the posited connections and affinities between the theoretical roles claimed for properties and other putative abstracta like propositions. (On unified conceptions of abstracta, see Zalta 1983 and Fine 1977.)

On the flipside, we should also exercise caution before simply assuming that, say, class or mereological nominalists cannot be or ought not to be, say, fictionalists or figuralists about property discourse. While to our knowledge actual class and mereological nominalists do take talk of “properties” literally to be about classes or fusions of objects, one could develop a version of those metaphysical theses that treated classes or fusions, respectively, rather like fictionalists might treat the concrete materials constitutive of tokens of novels or films—the pages and the celluloid. On this imagined view, property discourse is fictional, and the pertinent materials we distinctively interact with in learning and engaging in the fiction are classes (or fusions) of concrete individual objects.

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Acknowledgments

The authors would like to thank Ben Caplan and an anonymous reviewer for their helpful comments. This entry replaces a previous entry by Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra. The authors gratefully acknowledge Dr. Rodriguez-Pereyra’s support and have used his entry as an instructive guide for compiling the present version.

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Sam Cowling <sam.cowling@denison.edu>
Daniel Giberman <dgiberman@gmail.com>

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